Doxastic Voluntarism

First published Tue Oct 1, 2024

Doxastic voluntarism is the thesis that our beliefs are subject to voluntary control. While there’s some controversy as to what “voluntary control” amounts to (see §1.2), it’s often understood as direct control: the ability to bring about a state of affairs “just like that”, without having to do anything else. Most of us have direct control over, for instance, bringing to mind an image of a pine tree. Can one, in like fashion, voluntarily bring it about that one believes a specific proposition? Doxastic voluntarists hold that, at least in some circumstances—such as when the evidence is ambiguous—we can. Doxastic involuntarists, in contrast, maintain that we cannot. Some involuntarists hold that the concept of belief itself precludes the possibility of believing voluntarily. Others hold that the impossibility of voluntary belief is a contingent psychological fact. Historically, the issue of doxastic voluntarism has been connected to how many think about religious commitment: a prominent view of faith is that it is a voluntary decision to believe. Furthermore, the issue of voluntarism has also been viewed as having bearing on fundamental questions in epistemology. For example, are epistemic norms duties to believe in certain ways? Are there practical or moral reasons to believe? If the answer to either question is “yes”, it seems some measure of voluntary doxastic control is required.

In section 1, we expand on the definition of doxastic voluntarism, and survey various kinds of control (e.g., direct, indirect, long-range) and the doxastic attitudes we might control (e.g., outright belief, withholding, credences). In section 2, we discuss a number of historical views on doxastic voluntarism. In section 3, we survey motivations for rejecting doxastic voluntarism. There are two general strategies: arguments that appeal to psychological considerations, and conceptual arguments regarding the nature of belief. In section 4, we survey five approaches to defending voluntarism: those that appeal to epistemic permissivism, doxastic compatibilism, skepticism, one-off considerations, and non-standard views of belief. In section 5, we cover empirical work on doxastic voluntarism. The last two sections discuss two implications of voluntarism. In section 6, we discuss voluntarism’s implications for the ethics of belief, and in section 7, we discuss issues at the intersection of voluntarism and religious faith.

1. What is Doxastic Voluntarism?

1.1 Varieties of Control

As we have said, doxastic voluntarism is the thesis that our beliefs are under our voluntary control, or that we can believe at will (following current conventions, we will use “voluntary” belief and belief “at will” interchangeably). Doxastic voluntarism is an existential claim: the view that at least some of our beliefs are voluntary. Involuntarism, then, is the view that none of our beliefs are voluntary. Thus, it’s a universal claim, and as such, it is quite strong and well-specified. Voluntarism is then a weaker claim, and allows for a spectrum of views: one belief is voluntary to all beliefs are voluntary. This raises what one might call the scope question: which beliefs can we actually control voluntarily? We return to this question in section 4.4. (Almost all contemporary authors reject the view that all beliefs are voluntary, but the view may have historical precedent; see Frederick 2013 and Boespflug 2023.) In this section, we discuss two key aspects of this definition: “voluntary control” and “belief”.

Those working on doxastic voluntarism distinguish various kinds of voluntary control; here, we follow the basic contours of William Alston’s (1988) influential taxonomy. Alston distinguishes four kinds of control. The first variety of control is what Alston calls “basic voluntary control”; this has come to be known in the literature as direct control. If one has direct control over Φ-ing, one has the ability to Φ “right away” or “just like that”, via an uninterrupted voluntary act (Alston 1988: 263); in our terms, direct control implies temporal immediacy and causal basicality. Most humans have direct control over imaging a pink elephant: we can bring such an image to mind right away, via an act of will, merely by deciding to do so.

Alston’s second kind of control is “non-basic immediate control”: the kind of control we have over “opening a door, informing someone that p, or turning on a light” (Alston 1988: 269). While Alston refers to this kind of control as “direct” (1988: 278), many writing on doxastic voluntarism today would categorize it as indirect control, as it requires more than a volition. Rather, some degree of cooperation from the world is required to open a door and turn on the lights: the door must swing properly on its hinges, the electricity must be flowing through the wire. To give a doxastic example, you have non-basic immediate control over your belief about the first word on page 3 of a book you are holding; assuming the world cooperates, you can easily open the book, read the word, and form the relevant belief. Thus, non-basic immediate control allows us to bring about something “just like that”, assuming the external conditions hold. It is immediate in the sense that the end can be achieved “just like that” in a single voluntary act, rather than working toward the end over time, interspersed with actions directed at accompanying goals (Alston 1988: 269).

A third kind of control, according to Alston, is “long range voluntary control”. We have this sort of control over things like learning to play an instrument, getting in shape to run a marathon, lowering our blood pressure, and altering certain of our dispositions. We can set out on an intentional, long-term project to change these things with some hope of success, by performing actions over a longer period of time, interrupted by activity directed at other goals (Alston 1988: 275). In the belief case, it’s plausible that at least sometimes, we can change what we believe over time by changing the evidence we pay attention to, the sources we read, the people we spend time with, and the like. The probability that these long-term intentional projects will be successful varies; in some cases, the likelihood of success may be quite high; however, in other cases, even the most sincerely committed are unlikely to succeed.

This brings us to Alston’s final variety of control, “indirect influence” over belief. The clearest way to distinguish long range control from indirect influence is that the former requires an intention to form a specific belief, and the latter does not. Our beliefs can be influenced unintentionally in a variety of ways: acts that form our character and virtues, sources of evidence that we expose ourselves to, time spent reflecting (or not). All of these, in turn, affect what we believe. For example, I may decide to spend time with relatives that have different political viewpoints; this may have the indirect (and unintentional) consequence of increasing the likelihood that my own political views will change. There are, furthermore, a wide variety of cognitive dispositions one can cultivate that similarly influence belief; pursuing things like open mindedness, curiosity, and careful reflection on evidence can influence one’s beliefs over time, even without an intentional attempt to change one’s attitude toward a particular proposition.

Alston further seems to suggest that influence may also involve an intention to form a target belief (1988: 279). This is perhaps because, in some cases, we may intend to change a belief, but our chance of successfully doing so is low. The classic example is the individual persuaded by Pascal’s Wager, who, nonetheless, is unable to simply decide to adopt theistic belief. Consequently, he follows Pascal’s advice to attend mass and take holy water (1670), but this may nevertheless fail to guarantee the acquisition of theistic belief. This spotty and unreliable long-range jurisdiction may be more accurately described as influence, rather than full-blown control.

1.2 Which Kind of Control?

Which of these kinds of control is important for doxastic voluntarism? It’s widely accepted that we have some degree of indirect control over our beliefs: we can influence, and even in some cases control and change, our beliefs by changing the things we read, the sources we watch, who we hang out with, and what evidence we pay attention to. So many authors take doxastic voluntarism to be a thesis about direct control: the view that beliefs can be brought about immediately, in an uninterrupted intentional act (Audi 2001: 93; Nottelmann 2007: 99; McHugh 2012b; Buckareff 2014; Nottelmann et al. 2023). Direct control is a robust and clear species of control (see Mele 2017), so many authors focus there. The possibility of direct doxastic control, however, is controversial (and in fact, widely rejected by contemporary authors). Many of these authors think even non-basic immediate control isn’t sufficient for doxastic voluntarism.

However, simply because indirect doxastic control is uncontroversial doesn’t force us to equate voluntary believing with exercising direct control. We might instead take doxastic voluntarism to be about the parity of belief and action: that is, we have the same kind of control over our beliefs that we do over our voluntary actions (Steup 2008; Roeber 2019). One benefit of this view is that doxastic voluntarism won’t hang on difficult and controversial questions about the metaphysics of free will (e.g., whether libertarianism or compatibilism is true; see Steup 2017: 2674; Roeber 2019: 839–840).

On a related view, voluntary belief is intentional belief, so doxastic voluntarism is the view that we can believe intentionally (Scott-Kakures 1994; Steup 2012; Peels 2017: 58). Other philosophers think something even more specific is required for voluntary belief: the ability to believe intentionally for a practical reason (Hieronymi 2006, 2009; Setiya 2008; Buckareff 2014). One benefit of this view is that it seems to capture the idea that voluntary beliefs and voluntary actions should be similar (as the parity thesis does) while remaining specific about the kind of doxastic control required. On the other hand, if voluntary belief requires believing intentionally for a practical reason, this seems like a particularly (perhaps unnecessarily) strong form of voluntarism. Yet other authors hold that the ability to believe intentionally for an epistemic reason would be sufficient for the truth of doxastic voluntarism (see Steup 2008). Feldman (2001: 85) has raised a worry about the possibility of intentional belief: if we don’t have voluntary control over our intentions, even the ability to believe intentionally may not render belief itself voluntary (see also McHugh 2012a; Flowerree 2017). In response, Steup has pointed out that if intentional belief isn’t sufficient for voluntary belief, then many of our seemingly voluntary actions actually wouldn’t be voluntary either (2008: 382).

In sum, while philosophers generally agree that doxastic voluntarism is about voluntary belief, there isn’t a consensus about what exactly “voluntary control” amounts to. And it’s possible that beliefs are voluntary in some of the senses noted above, but not others.

1.3 Which Attitudes?

Now we turn to the question: what kinds of attitudes are relevant to doxastic voluntarism? First, let’s consider what attitudes doxastic voluntarism is not about. Doxastic voluntarism is not the view that we have voluntary control over accepting that p (acting as if p is true) or committing to p. Acceptance and commitment are both taken to be a species of action, or at least action-like, and it’s widely recognized that you can act as if p even if you don’t believe p (for example: because of politeness or high stakes). Some authors have argued that apparent cases of voluntary belief are actually cases of voluntary acceptance or commitment (Alston 1988: 267; Audi 2001; Buckareff 2004; Proust 2012; Tebben 2018). Doxastic voluntarism is also not a thesis about stances (in Van Fraassen’s 2002 sense); stances are clusters of attitudes and commitments which may involve, but go beyond beliefs; for example, a commitment to empiricism (see also Fleisher 2018; Elder 2019). Finally, doxastic voluntarism isn’t about alief: an innate or habitual response to a stimulus, such as our hesitancy to walk on the glass floor at the top of a tall building, even though we believe (and even know) that it’s safe (Gendler 2008: 634).

What attitudes are relevant, then? The first and most obvious is outright belief: if one can bring oneself to believe p voluntarily, then doxastic voluntarism is true. On some views, voluntarily believing p is called “judging” that p (Williamson 2000: 10; Roeber 2019, although the term “judgment” is not univocal; see, e.g., Walker 1996; Shah & Velleman 2005: 503). A second attitude is withholding belief: moving from believing p to being undecided on whether p. We may have more control over giving up a belief (via doubt, à la Descartes (Davies 2001: 113; Schüssler 2013: 155–7)) than we have over forming a belief. This is a legitimate, albeit limited, way of understanding doxastic control (see Frederick 2013). A final species of doxastic voluntarism worth mentioning is credal voluntarism, or voluntary control over credence. Credence (or confidence) is the subjective probability of a proposition, measured on a scale from [0,1]. For example, while I both believe $1+1=2$ and that it will rain tomorrow, my credence in the former is 1, whereas my credence in the latter is 0.85. While most authors writing on doxastic voluntarism tend to focus on outright belief, there’s a separate (and underexplored) question of whether we have voluntary control over our credences (see Wolterstorff 2010; Jackson 2019, forthcoming; Gao 2019; Staffel 2019).

2. History

2.1 Antiquity

Endorsements of doxastic voluntarism reach back at least to the Roman Stoics. Epictetus (d. 135 CE) is recorded in the Enchiridion as claiming that among the phenomena that are “in our power” or “up to us” (ἐφ’ ἡμῖν) is “opinion” (ὑπόληψις). His summary of the types of things that are in our power as “whatever are our own acts” suggests his conceiving of opinion as a species of action. “Opinion” among the Stoics is a species of “assent” (συγκατάθεσις) which may be given (or not) to impressions, or the way things appear to us (Vogt 2012: 651). In his Discourses, Epictetus treats assent as subject to voluntary control (3.12.14). Though this aspect of Epictetus’ thought is largely undeveloped, it suggests an expansive conception of direct doxastic control—wherein one is consistently at liberty to assent (or not) to the way things appear.

Epictetus’ position stands in stark contrast to that of Aristotle, who 400 years earlier asserted the opposite in a passing remark in On the Soul.

[I]magining lies within our own power whenever we wish…but in forming opinions we are not free: we cannot escape the alternative of falsehood or truth. (III.427b20)

Though it is difficult to know exactly how to interpret this last clause, Aristotle does subsequently make clear that

opinion involves belief (for without belief in what we opine we cannot have an opinion)…. [E]very opinion is accompanied by belief. (III.428a20)

The role of the will in belief formation that would later emanate out of the early Christian tradition gave rise to a rather different form of voluntarism than that found in stoic authors. In keeping with the New Testament’s emphasis upon faith as apparently involving a decision to believe or trust (πῐ́στῐς), faith would be thought of as a voluntary action as early as Clement of Alexandria (150–215): “Faith…is in fact preconception by the will, an act of consenting to religion…” (Stromateis II.2). Within this tradition, voluntary control over belief would be thought of as exercised in believing in the truth of things unseen, in keeping with the cardinal characterization of faith offered in Hebrews 11:1: “Now faith is confidence in what we hope for and assurance about what we do not see”.

In the influential thought of Augustine of Hippo (354–430), the role of the voluntary belief operative in faith comes to occupy a defining place not only for the layperson, but also for the philosophical theologian. Encapsulated in his memorable aphorisms, e.g., “we must believe before we understand” (De Trinitate VIII.v.8; also, Liberum Arbitrium i.3; Confessions vi.7)—later appropriated and adapted by Anselm of Canterbury (d. 1109): “I believe so that I may understand” (Proslogion I)—we find that faith and belief are critical prerequisites for understanding and knowledge. In order to understand profound theological truths, one must first resolve to believe the testimony of Scripture (Boespflug 2016).

2.2 Middle Ages

Augustine’s conception of faith would shape how many philosophers and theologians would conceive of doxastic control in the Latin West throughout the Middle Ages. Thomas Aquinas’ (1225–1274) fullest discussions of doxastic control, for instance, appear in his treatments of faith (Summa Theologiae IIaIIae.1–7; De Veritate 14.1–2), as do William of Ockham’s (1285–1347) (e.g., Quaestiones Variae q.5 p.186 in Opera Theologica vol. 8). For Aquinas, the will, motivated by the good of eternal beatitude, “commands (coactus) the intellect to assent” to the articles of faith (Summa Theologiae IIaIIae 5.2; IaIIae.1.8). In article 1 of question 14 of De Veritate, entitled “What is Belief?” he even appears to maintain that belief in general is voluntary:

Sometimes…the understanding can be determined to one side of a contradictory proposition neither immediately through the definitions of the terms…nor yet in virtue of principles…. And in this situation our understanding is determined by the will, which chooses to assent to one side definitely and precisely because of something which is enough to move the will, though not enough to move the understanding (intellectus)…. And this is the state of one who believes (credere).

The insinuation, here, that all belief is voluntary is confirmed elsewhere, but does not imply that all belief-like states are voluntary for Aquinas. For he claims that since knowledge (scientia) compels assent—depriving the will of a choice in assenting—it also thereby excludes belief (Summa Theologiae IIaIIae.1.5; IIaIIae.2.5). (In keeping with Aquinas’ insistence that belief [i.e., credere] and knowledge are mutually exclusive, credere may be better translated “trust” or “to trust” [Boespflug 2021b].)

In spite of voluntarism remaining the dominant position on doxastic control throughout the Middle Ages in the Latin West, there were also expressions of involuntarism, and involuntarist conceptions of faith. The eminent fourteenth century English Dominican Robert Holcot (1290–1349) would give both psychological and conceptual arguments against the possibility of voluntary belief. Conspicuously contradicting Aquinas, he would maintain that even in cases of ambiguous evidence our experience of our own psychology reveals that we cannot, by virtue of an act of the will, believe voluntarily:

For to me, it appears that every man, who does not want to obstinately deny sense, experiences in himself (experitur in seipso) that he cannot by command of the will determine himself to assent to one side of a contradiction, when both are open to question for him. (Sex Articuli ii.91; translated by author)

In such cases, one is compelled to suspend judgment. In fact, Holcot holds that the very notion of voluntary belief yields a contradiction:

I argue that it is not in the power of man to make something appear to be in reality completely as a proposition denotes. Therefore, it is not in the power of man to make a proposition appear to him true; nor, as a consequence, that he believes that to be true. For man cannot believe some proposition to be true unless it appears to him true; nor something appear to him true unless it appears to him, thus, to be just as that proposition denotes. If, therefore, it would be in the power of man to believe a proposition proposed to him, for which, also, he does not have a compelling reason, it would be in man’s power to make a thing appear to him just as he wants. And, thus, there is a contradiction: I believe that this proposition is true, and that proposition does not appear to me to be true. (Quaestiones super Sententiarum I.1 [L 2vb; M 3ra; translated by author])

Yet Holcot, at the same time presciently maintains that we may exercise some voluntary control over belief “indirectly” (indirecte) (Sex Articuli ii.92; see also Boespflug 2018).

2.3 Early Modern Period

History’s most famous doxastic voluntarist, René Descartes (1596–1650), would, like the Stoics he admired, treat assent as a species of action.

[T]he will [possesses the] ability to do (facere) or not do something (that is, to affirm or deny, to pursue or avoid)…. If…I simply refrain from making a judgment in cases where I do not perceive the truth with sufficient clarity and distinctness, then it is clear that I am behaving correctly (recte agere) and avoiding error. But if in such cases I either affirm or deny, then I am not using my free will correctly (libertate arbitrii non recte utor) (“Fourth Meditation” of Meditations, AT VII:57–60; CSM II:40–1).

Conceiving of assent in this way enables Descartes to ascribe full responsibility to agents—rather than God—for their erroneous beliefs. His doxastic voluntarism, on this account, is the keystone of the Fourth Meditation’s free will response to the so-called epistemological problem of evil.

Descartes retains this conception of belief throughout his career. In his late Comments on a Certain Broadsheet, he claims:

For I saw that over and above perception, which is a prerequisite of judgment, we need affirmation and negation to determine the form of the judgment, and also that we are often free to withhold our assent, even if we perceive the matter in question. Hence I assigned the act of judging itself, which consists simply in assenting (i.e., in affirmation or denial) to the determination of the will rather than to the perception of the intellect. (AT VIIIa:363; CSM I:307)

In marked contrast to Holcot, Descartes appeals to our introspective experience of belief formation in support of an expansive amount of doxastic control in the Principles, maintaining that we can exert voluntary control over every would-be belief that is not completely certain (“Part 1” of Principles of Philosophy AT VIIIa:6; CSM I:194). And yet, there is also a sense in which assenting to things that are certain—clear and distinct perceptions—is also free (“Fourth Meditiation” of Meditations AT VII:57–8; CSM II:40; see below). Consequently, everything we believe, we believe voluntarily.

In his objections to the Meditations, Thomas Hobbes (1588–1679) would express his discontent with Descartes’ voluntarism.

[I]t is not only knowing something to be true that is independent of the will, but also believing it or giving assent to it. If something is proved by valid arguments, or is reported as credible, we believe it whether we want to or not. (“Third Set of Objections” with Meditations AT VII:192; CSM II:134–5)

Though scholars have been reluctant to take Descartes’ apparently extreme voluntarism at face value (Cottingham 2008; Newman 2015; Vitz 2010; Schüssler 2013; Davies 2001), it appears far less extreme when viewed against the backdrop of the conception of free will that Descartes seems to have favored—i.e., compatibilism. This latter commitment implies that, even if all assent is voluntary, Descartes has a ready explanation for why one cannot believe whatever one wishes—which is a primary consequence Descartes scholars wish to avoid (Boespflug 2023). Our assent may be determined by clarity and distinctness, but this does not exclude its being voluntary in virtue of doxastic determination being compatible with doxastic freedom.

Mary Astell (1666–1731)—an English philosopher with Cartesian sensibilities—would likewise assign believing to the will, and similarly maintain that we are able to suspend assent concerning any proposition that is not clear or evident.

Ignorance…can’t be avoided but error may…we can suspend our judgment about those things of which we have [no idea], till clearness and evidence oblige us to pass it…[for] judgment belongs to the will. (Serious Proposal II.iii.106–7)

Beyond Descartes and Astell, doxastic voluntarism would face considerable resistance in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries. Benedict Spinoza (1632–1677) would offer what appears to be a conceptual argument against voluntarism in his Ethics (IIP49). John Locke (1632–1704) would give an account of how a variety of doxastic states—knowledge, faith, probable assent—are not under the direct control of the will (Essay concerning Human Understanding IV.xiii.2, p. 651; IV.xvi.8–9, p. 663). The basic idea animating Locke’s involuntarism is that experience shows that doxastic states are caused by the objects of perception, or the appearance of things, which excludes the will playing any role in the process.

Locke’s involuntarism would even figure prominently in one of his main arguments for religious toleration:

[T]he understanding and assent (whereof God hath reserved the disposure to himself, and not so much as entrusted man with a liberty at pleasure to believe or reject) being not to be wrought upon by force, a magistrate would in vain assault that part of man which owes no homage to his authority…. [But] the magistrate may expect to find those laws obeyed which demand not any performance above the power of the subject. (“First Tract on Government”, 1660 [1997: 13]; see also “Essay on Toleration”, 1667 [1997: 137]; “Letter on Toleration”, 1686 [1968: 69–71])

Since even religious belief is not under our voluntary control—and does not bear the profile of an action—we should not threaten citizens with punishment if they do not endorse the religious position of the state. Yet, in spite of his persistent emphasis on the lack of direct control we have over belief, Locke would allow that we possess indirect control over believing insofar as we are able to control our attention, gather evidence, and decide to reflect (Essay concerning Human Understanding IV.xiii). He would even carve out a narrow space for some measure of direct voluntary control in situations where the evidence is ambiguous (Essay concerning Human Understanding IV.xx.15, p. 716; Boespflug 2021a).

Doxastic involuntarism would also play an implicit role in the thought of David Hume (1711–1776) and a prominent role in that of Thomas Reid (1710–1796). In discussing “fiction and belief”, Hume, not unlike Aristotle, maintains that the difference between them

…lies not merely in any peculiar idea, which is annexed to such a conception as commands our assent, and which is wanting to every known fiction. For as the mind has authority over all its ideas, it could voluntarily annex this particular idea to any fiction, and consequently be able to believe whatever it pleases; contrary to what we find by daily experience. We can, in our conception, join the head of a man to the body of a horse; but it is not in our power to believe, that such an animal has ever really existed. (Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding V.ii [1993: 31])

The involuntarism that Hume claims “daily experience” attests to would have uncomfortable consequences regarding his famed skepticism. For the latter would notoriously demand that we refrain from many commonsense judgments based on perception, inductive reasoning, memory, testimony, etc. Yet, Hume would further acknowledge that one is, nevertheless, often unable to maintain such skepticism beyond the confines of one’s study. This is because human nature has conferred compelling force to custom and imagination, such that it is “instinctive” to assent on the basis of the aforementioned sources in spite of the skeptical considerations that call them into question. (Enquiry V.ii [1993: 31])

Reid would appropriate this latter thought as a basis for a distinctive form of epistemological naturalism, enshrining natural belief forming tendencies as epistemic norms (Boespflug 2019). The most salient example is Reid’s famed “principle of credulity”. The principle is, in the first place, a principle in the sense of being a general tendency of human psychology to believe the reports of others; it is in light of this natural tendency that we are warranted, according to Reid, in taking others at their word. The same goes for believing in external objects on the basis of perception:

I will never attempt to throw off this belief [in external objects]; and, although the sober part of mankind will not be very anxious to know my reasons…they are these: First, because it is not in my power: why, then should I make a vain attempt? It would be agreeable to fly to the moon, and make a visit to Jupiter and Saturn; but, when I know that Nature has bound me down by the law of gravitation to this planet…I rest contented…. My belief is carried along by perception, as irresistibly as my body by the earth. (Inquiry VI.xx [1983: 85])

Since we cannot disbelieve our perceptions—and since our perceptual faculties were made by “a faithful and beneficent Monitor”—we are warranted in believing on the basis of them.

2.4 Modern Period

Immanuel Kant (1724–1804) would also reject doxastic voluntarism (Chignell 2007: 327) in spite of his awareness of the potential threat such a rejection poses to epistemic responsibility (Cohen 2013). While allowing that many common expressions suggest that believing is under the control of the will, he maintains that,

The will does not have any influence immediately on holding-to-be-true (fürwahrhalten); this would be quite absurd.… If the will had an immediate influence on our conviction concerning what we wish, we would constantly form for ourselves chimeras of a happy condition, and always hold them to be true, too. But the will cannot struggle against convincing proofs of truths that are contrary to its wishes and inclinations. (Jäsche Logic Ak 9: 73–74 [1992: 577])

Yet, like Holcot and Locke, Kant retains room both for some measure of responsibility and voluntary control over belief via indirect means:

[A]lthough approval does not depend immediately on men’s choice, it nevertheless often does depend on it indirecte, mediately (mittelbahr), since it is according to one’s free wish that he seeks out those grounds that could in any way bring about approval for this or that cognition… it still requires closer direction of choice, will, wish, or in general of our free will, toward the grounds of proof. (Blomberg logic Ak 158 [1992: 124–5])

Alix Cohen has argued that further indirect control over believing may be exercised, for Kant, via our ability to adopt epistemic maxims (2013: 41–8).

Voluntarism would reemerge in the nineteenth century in the thought of Søren Kierkegaard (1813–1855). The metaphor for which Kierkegaard is best known (appropriated from Gotthold Lessing) that faith is a leap suggests that faith—and the belief which it involves—is a type of action. Kierkegaard’s description of the leap in the Concluding Unscientific Postscript suggests that it is both voluntary and doxastic: the agent’s “leap of faith [is] the qualitative transition…from non-belief to belief” (1846 [1944: 15]). Later in the same work, he maintains that “the leap is [in] the category of decision” (1846 [1944: 91]). In his Philosophical Fragments, Kierkegaard treats belief in general as a product of the will:

belief is not a knowledge but an act of freedom, an expression of will…. The conclusion of belief is no conclusion (slutning) but a resolution (beslutning). (1844 [1985: 83–84])

The extent to which such remarks commit him to a radical form of voluntarism is, however, a matter of dispute (Evans 1989; Pojman 1986; Wisdo 1987; for a more recent treatment see Quanbeck forthcoming).

3. Arguments for Involuntarism

Contemporary opponents of doxastic voluntarism typically take one of two general approaches. There are those who think that we cannot believe at will for contingent psychological reasons, and those who think that we cannot believe at will for conceptual reasons (normally regarding the nature of belief). We’ll consider each in turn.

3.1 Psychological Involuntarism

Some authors reject doxastic voluntarism on the basis of psychological considerations. This approach appeals to the experience of our own purported psychological inability to form beliefs at will. The best-known defender of this view is William Alston (1988). Alston’s ultimate goal is to argue against the deontological conception of justification: the idea that epistemic justification should be understood in terms of obligations, permissions, blame, and the like. He notes that understanding justification in this way only makes sense if beliefs are sufficiently controllable, as plausibly, ought implies can: if I ought to believe p, I can believe p. He goes on to argue that beliefs are not sufficiently voluntary to render epistemic justification deontological. He begins his argument for involuntarism in the following way:

My argument for this, if it can be called that, simply consists in asking you to consider whether you have any such powers. Can you, at this moment, start to believe that the U.S. is still a colony of Great Britain, just by deciding to do so. If you find it too incredible that you should be sufficiently motivated to try to believe this, suppose that someone offers you $500,000,000 to believe it, and you are much more interested in the money than in believing the truth. Could you do what it takes to get that reward? (1988: 263)

He goes on to say that it seems clear to him that “he has no such power” and he “very much doubt[s] that any human beings are endowed with the power of taking on propositional attitudes at will” (1988: 263). Alston continues that, for propositions that aren’t clearly true or false, either you conceive of yourself as choosing to believe when you don’t actually have a genuine choice (1988: 266), or you aren’t forming a belief at all, but rather are adopting a proposition as a basis for action or accepting it (1988: 268). Alston concludes that we have neither basic nor non-basic control over belief (1988: 274), and also argues that we do not have reliable long-range control over our beliefs (1988: 276). He’s more optimistic about the idea that we can exercise indirect influence over belief (1988: 278–9), but doesn’t think this is sufficient to ground the deontological conception of justification.

Alston’s argument has been influential, and his approach is endorsed by a number of subsequent authors. Alvin Plantinga (1993: 24) makes a similar point, motivating doxastic involuntarism with related examples. Nikolaj Nottelmann (2006) notes that he finds Alston’s simple argument “entirely convincing” (2006: 560). Nottelmann defends Alston’s argument against various objections to Alston that rely on analogies between belief and action (including Steup 1988; Ginet 2001; Ryan 2003). Rik Peels (2017: ch. 2) also defends Alston’s argument against various challenges: arguments that we have direct doxastic control, indirect doxastic control, and compatibilist doxastic control. Peels concludes that doxastic responsibility shouldn’t be explained in terms of (direct) doxastic control. His positive view is that we should understand doxastic responsibility in terms of influence, or in his words:

one responsibly believes that p if and only if one had control over belief-influencing factors pertaining to one’s belief that p and either one did not violate any intellectual obligations in coming to believe that p or one is excused for doing so. (2017: 12)

Another argument that belief is contingently involuntary is given by Anthony Booth (2017). Booth argues that belief is contingently involuntary by appealing to the nature of suspension of judgment. He argues that if we cannot believe at will, we also cannot suspend judgment at will. However, conceptual arguments for belief-involuntarism do not apply to suspension-involuntarism. It would be odd if belief is necessarily involuntary, but suspension is merely involuntary as a matter of our contingent psychological limitations. Booth concludes that we should embrace the same explanation for both belief and suspension: both are contingently involuntary.

3.2 Conceptual Involuntarism

The arguably more popular route to establishing doxastic involuntarism involves conceptual considerations regarding the nature of belief. Advocates of this approach argue that there is something about the notion of belief itself that precludes acquisition at will—most notably, belief’s possessing a constitutive truth-aim or truth-norm. In the aim of belief literature, it’s widely held that beliefs formed in cases of deliberation have a particular connection to truth. In particular, beliefs, by definition, aim at the truth; if an attitude doesn’t aim at the truth, it’s not a belief (see Moran 1988; Shah 2003; Shah & Velleman 2005; McHugh & Whiting 2014; Vermaire forthcoming; and the essays in Chan (ed.) 2013). This view—that belief aims at truth—forms the backbone for many involuntarist arguments.

Bernard Williams (1973: ch. 9) provides an influential and widely-cited argument for conceptual involuntarism. Williams argues that belief at will would require the ability to believe p regardless of whether p is true. Furthermore, he argues that if you have this ability, then you’d know you had this ability. This, in turn, leads to the problematic implication that you could take yourself to have a belief that you also regard to be false. But this conflicts with the truth-aim of belief: to believe p is to take p to be true. So, he concludes, belief at will is impossible.

While many regard Williams’ claim that belief involves a truth-aim as a key insight, his argument is widely held to be unsuccessful—at least without modifications. Barbara Winters (1979), for example, raises several objections to William’s argument. One thing she points out is that you could have the ability to believe p at will, but not realize you have this ability, and then believe at will without having a belief you take to be false (1979: 255). Winters instead argues for a more modest thesis:

it is impossible to believe that one believes p and that one’s belief of p originated and is sustained in a way that has no connection with p’s truth. (1979: 243)

Along similar lines, Andrei Buckareff (2014) provides a conceptual argument for involuntarism in the spirit of Williams, tweaked to avoid various objections.

Jonathan Bennett (1990) presents a counterexample to Williams’ claim that you cannot form a belief voluntarily without knowing you’d done so: the Credamites. Credamites can occasionally will themselves to immediately acquire beliefs. However, as soon as they come to believe in this way, they immediately forget how their belief was acquired. These beliefs are also ones for which they have some evidence, although their evidence about the matter is inconclusive (1990: 93). Bennett goes on to explore some reasons why, for humans, belief is nonetheless involuntary, but is ultimately unsatisfied with these explanations (1990: 107).

Dion Scott-Kakures (1994) argues that belief at will is conceptually impossible. Call t the time before I formed a belief at will, and $t+1$ the time after I formed the belief. He asks:

Can I have a good reason for believing that I have succeeded in willing myself, as a basic action, from the cognitive perspective I inhabited at t to the cognitive perspective I inhabit at $t+1$?…It is a relatively easy matter to see why the answer is no. (1994: 93)

If I intend to believe p, but don’t believe it, not believing p isn’t sanctioned by my current perspective, but then it becomes a part of my new perspective. This requires a “cognitive blind spot” which means that the belief formation is unguided or unmonitored—a necessary condition for basic actions, according to Scott-Kakures (1994: 89)—so the belief formation cannot be a basic action (1994: 94–95). Dana Radcliffe (1997) responds to Scott-Kakures, arguing that you don’t have to regard the intended belief as unjustified, even if it’s not a part of your current perspective on the world.

Pamela Hieronymi (2006) begins her argument against the voluntariness of belief by defining “voluntary” and “belief”. Following Bennett (1990), she maintains that an activity is voluntary if it can be done immediately in response to practical reasons (2006: 58). Belief is a commitment-constituted attitude that aims at the truth: to believe p is to take p to be true (2006: 49). She then distinguishes two kinds of reasons for belief: content-related reasons (reasons to think the content is true) vs. attitude-related (or “extrinsic”) reasons (reasons to have the attitude: it would be good, useful, desirable, etc.). Content-related reasons are constitutive reasons for belief (2006: 52). However, if you were to believe at will—believe immediately for practical reasons—this would require the ability to believe for extrinsic reasons. But this requires answering a question—whether p—for reasons you don’t take to bear on that question (extrinsic reasons only bear on the question of whether the belief would be good to have). So voluntary belief is impossible. Kieran Setiya (2008) responds, arguing that Hieronymi’s argument proves too much: it entails that you could not voluntarily intend to form a belief. Hieronymi (2009) agrees with Setiya that, on her view, you cannot voluntarily intend to form a belief, but she thinks this is actually the right result. (For a response to both Setiya and Hieronymi, see Vermaire 2022.)

In a series of papers, Conor McHugh provides a conceptual argument that beliefs are not voluntary in the way that actions are voluntary. He nonetheless holds that deontic appraisals of belief are appropriate (2012b); we exercise a version of doxastic freedom modeled on freedom of intention (2012a, 2014, 2017). Unlike many voluntarists, he also argues that non-evidential considerations can be motivating reasons for belief, in cases where the evidence allows but doesn’t compel belief (2012c, 2015).

One thing to note about the arguments in this section (and the next) is that individual authors are operating with different understandings of “voluntary belief”. Some regard voluntary belief to be equivalent to having direct control over belief (e.g., Audi 2001; Nottelmann 2007), or, stronger, the ability to exercise direct control for practical reasons (e.g., Buckareff 2014; Hieronymi 2006; Setiya 2008). Others understand voluntary control over belief to be the kind of control we have over action (e.g., McHugh 2014). Still others hold that voluntary belief doesn’t require “decisional control” but merely the appreciation of epistemic reasons (e.g., Shah 2002). These differences create space for hybrid views, on which belief is voluntary in some senses but not others (e.g., perhaps McHugh’s view).

This raises the question: what is required to establish that belief is (in)voluntary, full stop? An argument that relies on a specific notion of voluntary, e.g., that we cannot form beliefs directly for practical reasons, even if sound, wouldn’t establish that we lack direct doxastic control more generally or that all beliefs are involuntary. Thus, insofar as these arguments rely on a specific notion of “voluntary”, even if they are sound, it doesn’t follow that beliefs are involuntary full-stop. Of course, it would be ideal if the authors in this literature simply agreed on a single notion of voluntary. But for now, the reader should be mindful of the possibility that belief may be voluntary in some senses but not others.

4. Defenses of Voluntarism

Contemporary doxastic voluntarists can be divided into several camps: permissivists, compatibilists, skeptics, one-off voluntarists (although, as we’ll see, it’s debatable whether these should be called voluntarists), and authors who argue for voluntarism based on non-traditional views of belief. We discuss each in turn.

4.1 Epistemic Permissivism

Some of the cases used to motivate involuntarism involve propositions that are obviously true (e.g., $1+1=2$) or obviously false (e.g., the US is still a colony of Great Britain); plausibly, we cannot voluntarily disbelieve the former or believe the latter. However, not all propositions are obviously true or false; sometimes, the evidence is ambiguous and more difficult to assess. Epistemic permissivism is the view that the evidence may underdetermine what is rational to believe, such that there can be multiple rational doxastic attitudes to a proposition, given some evidence (see Kopec & Titelbaum 2016; Jackson & LaFore 2024). Permissivist voluntarists argue that we are, at times, in situations wherein the evidence is ambivalent such that there are genuine live, alternate options for believing. For example, while you cannot believe $1+1=3$ at will, perhaps if you’re torn about whether Smith is guilty or not, and both Smith’s guilt and Smith’s innocence are reasonable explanations of your evidence, you have a genuine choice about what to believe.

Cases of evidential underdetermination and/or ambiguity feature in many voluntarist arguments, even if the authors don’t explicitly use the phrase “epistemic permissivism”. Carl Ginet (2001) discusses a juror who decides to believe a defendant is guilty, a poker player who decides to believe her opponent is bluffing, and a person 50 miles into their road trip who decides to believe they locked the front door (2001: 64). In each case, the thinker’s evidence is ambiguous with respect to the target proposition—in Ginet’s words, the evidence is “noncompelling” (2001: 71). Philip Nickel (2010) similarly argues that voluntary belief is possible in cases where one has “adequate but not conclusive evidence for a proposition” (2010: 312). (McHugh 2015: 1122 calls these cases of “discretion”; see also Frankish 2007: 541; Raz 1999: 9).

Blake Roeber argues both that permissivism is true (2020), and that permissivism clears space for doxastic voluntarism (2019). He notes that evidence can come in small quantities. Consequently, our evidence for a proposition sometimes slowly gets better or slowly gets worse. Suppose you are walking toward a sign. When you’re far away, the sign is a complete blur; you should withhold belief about what it says. Standing two feet away from the sign, you should believe it says “Exit 15”. But as you’re walking towards it, Roeber’s idea is that, somewhere in the middle, your evidence equally supports belief and withholding, such that you could be rational in taking either attitude (2020). Roeber calls these “equipollent” cases. Furthermore, Roeber (2019) argues that equipollent cases enable the possibility of belief at will: when your evidence is balanced, you can choose either to believe that p or to withhold on p.

Kurt Sylvan (2016) argues against permissivist voluntarism by arguing that (the relevant kind of) permissivist situations aren’t possible. Roeber (2019: 854) responds to Sylvan that, even if this is true, this would only show that beliefs formed voluntarily are irrational, but it doesn’t follow that voluntary belief is impossible. This exchange is instructive because it clarifies what’s required for permissivist voluntarism: not that epistemic rationality is in fact permissive, but rather that thinkers believe their situation is permissive or evidentially ambiguous. If a thinker takes themselves to be in a permissive case (even wrongly), this belief may suffice to secure the doxastic options required for doxastic voluntarism—two or more attitudes are “live possibilities” for them. So exercising doxastic control may not require permissivism, but rather the belief that the situation is permissive. On the other hand, if permissivism is true but it’s impossible to know when one is in a permissive situation (as Smith 2020 argues), then it’s unclear that permissivism would enable doxastic voluntarism. Overall, then, perceived or acknowledged permissivism is what’s key for believing at will. (See Coffman 2022 and Kieval 2022 for responses to Roeber. For more on irrational doxastic voluntarism, see Kampa 2020).

Here’s a second worry for permissivist voluntarism. Going back to Alston, many care about doxastic voluntarism in order to secure epistemic deontology and/or epistemic responsibility. However, plausibly, (perceived) permissive cases are limited (how often is our evidence perfectly balanced, equally supporting belief and suspension?). Nonetheless, it seems like we are responsible for a large set of our beliefs, including our beliefs in impermissive cases. If so, it’s unclear that permissivist voluntarism can adequately ground epistemic responsibility. In response, the permissivist could broaden the range of permissive cases (see Nelson 2010), or narrow the scope of epistemic responsibility (as does Weatherson 2008).

4.2 Doxastic Compatibilism

Compatibilism is the thesis that free will is compatible with determinism. Compatibilists argue that actions can be free, even if determined, if they satisfy other conditions, such as the absence of impediments or a proper responsiveness to reasons. Similarly, doxastic compatibilists argue that beliefs, even if determined, can satisfy these same conditions for free action; thus, there is no principled reason for regarding actions as free and beliefs not.

Matthias Steup (2000; 2008; 2012; 2017), a leading proponent of doxastic compatibilism, argues that compatibilism entails that (most of) our actions and our beliefs are free; for similar reasons, he also thinks we can believe intentionally. More specifically, most of our doxastic attitudes fulfill the most popular compatibilist requirements for free action: e.g., they fit with reactive attitudes, fit with our higher-order attitudes, are weakly intentional, and are caused by a reasons-responsive process (2008: 390). Holding that “responsiveness to practical reasons grounds freedom, [while] responsiveness to epistemic reasons does not”, is a form of arbitrary preferential treatment that he labels “chauvinism” (2008: 388). Thus, our beliefs can be free and voluntary in the relevant sense, even if we couldn’t have believed otherwise. While Steup discusses a number of examples of doxastic freedom, a central, recurring example he uses is deliberation, in which we weigh the evidence for and against a proposition, and come to a verdict about it; for example, in a court case, you might weigh evidence to come to a verdict about whether the defendant is guilty (2000: 35). Such cases of deliberation amount to legitimate doxastic decisions; beliefs formed in this way are just as free as actions are. In cases where we don’t deliberate, belief can still be implicitly intentional, similar to intentional, automatic actions such as brushing one’s teeth (2012: 155). Steup generally doesn’t argue for compatibilism, but makes his arguments conditional on its truth (2000: 55; 2008: 391).

Sharon Ryan (2003) is another proponent of doxastic compatibilism. She considers the classic cases provided by Alston and Plantinga: even if you give me a large sum of money, I cannot believe something that is obviously false ($1+1=3$, the sky is green). She then argues, via an analogy with action, that these cases do not show that my beliefs are not under my control or involuntary, as there are plenty of things one cannot “just do” (2003: 63):

Suppose I am driving down the road and I see a mother and her child walking down the road. I see them and ask myself, “should I run them over?” I immediately and freely decide not to and then freely drive on. (2003: 63)

While she is free to run over the mother and child, she cannot do it, even if you gave her one million dollars. Similarly, even if I cannot believe that the sky is green, that doesn’t show that my disbelieving it isn’t free.

Other authors (McHugh 2014, 2017; Shah 2002; Kearl 2023) might not be accurately characterized as doxastic compatibilists, but maintain that reasons-responsiveness can ground epistemic deontology. While McHugh maintains that beliefs are not voluntary in the way that actions are, he nonetheless argues that beliefs are free in the way intentions are free: revisable in response to reasons. Shah argues that we have a kind of agency over our beliefs, and this doesn’t require intentional believing, but that beliefs are reasons-responsive in a Kantian way. While, unlike doxastic compatibilists, these authors maintain that there’s a key sense in which all beliefs are involuntary, they also hold that this weaker strand of doxastic freedom has all the resources for a corresponding and robust epistemic deontology.

A number of objections have been raised to doxastic compatibilism. Rik Peels (2017) argues that compatibilist control is not sufficient for doxastic responsibility, as you could have compatibilist control in the sense that your beliefs are reasons-responsive, but if you cannot influence what you believe (gather evidence, pursue intellectual virtues, etc.), we wouldn’t hold you responsible for your beliefs. This suggests that (indirect) doxastic influence, rather than any compatibilist condition, is the key to doxastic responsibility (2017: 693–4). Timothy Perrine (2020) argues that doxastic compatibilism is inconsistent with strong internalist versions of epistemic deontology. Other objections to doxastic compatibilism are raised by Buckareff (2006), Nottelmann (2006), Booth (2009), Schmitt (2015), and Wagner (2017).

4.3 Voluntarism and Skepticism

A third argument for doxastic voluntarism goes back to Descartes, and perhaps even to Epictetus and the Stoics (see Vitz 2010 for the Cartesian roots of this picture). On this strand of voluntarism, which is defended more recently by Brian Weatherson (2008) and Danny Frederick (2013), our ability to shed a belief via doubt or skepticism—and conversely, our ability to recover a belief through relinquishing such doubts—renders both belief and suspension under our voluntary control. Proponents of this view generally maintain that large swaths of our beliefs are voluntary: for Weatherson, this includes most of our inferential beliefs; for Frederick, we have voluntary control over any belief that we are aware of.

Weatherson provides two notable examples that illustrate both how considering and relinquishing possibilities enables voluntary doxastic control. Suppose Mark is writing his grocery list and sees a carton of orange juice in the fridge, and forms the belief that there’s orange juice in the fridge. As it turns out, his roommate has put an empty jug back into the fridge, so his belief is false. When Mark realizes this, he scolds himself because he lives in a student house where things like this happen frequently; he should have considered the possibility that the carton was empty before forming the belief (Weatherson 2008: 552). Later that evening, Mark is watching his favorite soccer team, Geelong; they are down by 8 goals with 15 minutes to go. His roommates ask him to come to the movies. Mark initially declines in case Geelong comes back, but his roommate pokes fun at Mark because of how unrealistic that is. Mark realizes his roommate is right and forms the belief that Geelong will lose (2008: 553). Weatherson maintains that in both cases, Mark’s beliefs are voluntary. The former example suggests that there are things we believe hastily, but we could have instead stopped to consider alternative possibilities by which we’d withhold belief instead. And similarly, the latter case suggests that we sometimes take a possibility seriously—perhaps too seriously—and once we see that the possibility is unrealistic, we form a belief instead of withholding. Weatherson thinks these changes are a common, everyday occurrence, and renders most of our inferential beliefs voluntary (2008: 561). Parties to the debate may object that these are exercises of indirect control over belief; however, Weatherson maintains examples like these are intuitively voluntary (and makes less of the direct/indirect distinction than others do).

Frederick (2013) takes exercise doxastic control through doubt further, arguing that you have voluntary control over any belief that you are aware of. Take a proposition you have a natural tendency to believe. He argues that, normally, you can gratuitously doubt this belief and thereby withhold belief on it; similarly, you can dismiss the doubt and thereby believe it again. He thinks this process applies to all beliefs we are aware of because “there is no such thing as decisive evidence”; so this process can be applied in voluntarily withholding belief, even for the beliefs that we have excellent evidence (2013: 31–32).

4.4 One-off Voluntarism

Recall that doxastic voluntarism is an existential claim: the view that at least some beliefs are voluntary. This raises the scope question: which beliefs can we actually control voluntarily? Different voluntarists would answer this question differently, making space for a variety of views on how many beliefs are controllable. The views we’ve discussed in this section so far maintain that a more substantial subset of our beliefs are controllable. One-off voluntarists, by contrast, maintain that humans may exercise voluntary doxastic control, but only in uncommon and special cases. While technically these authors endorse doxastic voluntarism in the aforementioned existential sense, because their cases are so rare, it might be somewhat misleading to label them full-blown voluntarists.

Richard Feldman provides a simple case of one-off voluntarism: you can control your belief that the lights in your office are off by going to your office and turning the lights off (2001: 81–82). While this isn’t direct control, this is nonetheless immediate control, and similar to the control we regularly exercise over our voluntary actions. Nonetheless, these cases are limited in scope: we’ll only be able to change our beliefs about states of the world that we have a legitimate and relatively direct control over. Furthermore, Feldman seems to think that Alston’s classic argument applies to most of our beliefs, with this rare exception. So, while we’d be hesitant to label Feldman a voluntarist, we think this type of doxastic control is noteworthy.

A second strand of one-off voluntarism, defended by Rik Peels (2015) and Andrew Reisner (2013), involves evidence-dependent beliefs: beliefs that, when formed, change the believer’s evidence that they are true. Peels (2015: 529) discusses a case involving Dr. Transparent, a scientist who has developed a mind-reading technique that perfectly reliably reads off people’s states of mind. Dr. Transparent promises that he will give you $10, if you come to believe, within a minute, that you will receive $10. (If you disbelieve you’ll get $10, he won’t give you $10.) Peels’ case is one in which the truth depends on the belief: if you believe that p, then p is true; if you believe that not-p, then not-p is true. Peels argues that this style of case meets seven conditions, commonly taken to be closely tied to believing at will: knowing you have the ability, exercising the ability in this particular case, the belief formed at will is rational, the belief is the result of a direct or basic action, the belief is formed at will (at least partially) for practical reasons, the belief is formed intentionally, and the question of whether to believe p is settled by whether it’s worthwhile to believe p.

Reisner (2013)’s case involves Alice, who participates in a psychology experiment involving a perfectly reliable mind reading machine and display. At some point, a number will pop up on the display, based on a function of what Alice believes the number will be. Reisner considers a “multiple fixed points” case in which if Alice’s predicted number, $n$, is greater than or equal to 0, the number displayed is $n/2+1$; if $n$ is less than 0, the displayed number is $n/2-1$ (2013: 169). In this case, if Alice believes the number will be $2$, it will be $2$, and if Alice believes the number will be $-2$, it will be $-2$. (If Alice believes it will be another number, Alice’s belief will be unstable.) $2$ and $-2$ are “fixed points”: if Alice forms either belief, Alice’s belief is known. Reisner calls this a “leap of knowledge”—Alice could change her belief from $2$ to $-2$, “leaping” back and forth, but either way, her belief would amount to knowledge. Reisner, while admitting that his argument doesn’t support any kind of unrestricted doxastic voluntarism, concludes that,

this very limited kind of doxastic voluntarism is consistent with the view that the aim of belief is truth (or knowledge) and that the aim of belief plays a role in setting the norms of belief. (2013: 178)

(Plausibly, Peels’ and Reisner’s cases are permissive ones [see Kopec 2015], so this is yet another voluntarist argument with permissivism in the background. For a response to Peels and Reisner, see Antill 2020.)

4.5 Voluntarism and Non-Standard Views of Belief

A final motivation for voluntarism involves authors who adopt or argue for non-standard views of belief. For example, Matthew Boyle (2009) argues that believing is an activity. Sara Aronowitz (2023; forthcoming) adopts a similar view on which believing is analogous to planning; she argues that such a view makes sense of data from cognitive psychology on which stored beliefs are dynamic and reconstructive. Brian Hedden (2009) and Aaron Zimmerman (2018) both argue for pragmatist views of belief (i.e., the primary function of belief is to guide and/or rationalize action) on which beliefs and actions are equally voluntary. Hedden specifically discusses how such a view could vindicate the deontological conception of justification.

While this motivation for voluntarism is noteworthy, many involuntarists will likely reply that this doesn’t threaten their position, since the notion of belief invoked by these voluntarists is revisionary. While the concept of belief as an action (or action-like) might very well render belief voluntary, most in the literature are working with another notion of belief. At the very least, this move shifts the discussion from the question “is belief voluntary?” to the question “what is belief?”

5. Empirical Work on Voluntarism

As we have seen, the psychological approach to arguing for doxastic involuntarism relies on the judgment that direct attempts to form beliefs at will always remain ineffective. An introspective examination of the process of belief formation, involuntarists maintain, reveals that we have no more direct control over believing a proposition than we do over secreting gastric juices (Alston 1988: 263). This method of determining what is and is not psychologically possible, however, lacks a systematic rigor that would contribute much greater evidential support to involuntarist claims, or for that matter, to voluntarist claims. These considerations have led some contributors to the debate to employ the tools of the psychological sciences in reformulating the psychological case for or against voluntarism.

Among the first such studies, carried out by Turri, Rose, and Buckwalter, purportedly found considerable evidence supporting the truth of voluntarism. Their findings are based on non-philosophers predominately agreeing (on a Likert scale) that individuals, described in a series of vignettes, are able to make choices in believing. They argue that their results concerning “folk psychology” support the idea that belief is voluntary, and that those same results even refute the conceptual claim that the notion of belief itself secures its involuntariness (2018: 2509; see also Cusimano & Goodwin 2019). Nottelmann, Booth, and Lomholt respond by arguing that Turri et al. problematically make the dubious assumption that the subjects of their studies have direct control in mind when they maintain that a belief may be chosen (2023: 7). Nottelmann et al. (2023) conducted a set of studies showing that participants tend to refer to a belief as chosen, even when it is acquired through obviously indirect means. Thus, finding that laypeople hold that beliefs may be chosen “just like that” does not on its own support the traditional voluntarist claim that belief is under the direct control of the will. Indeed, Nottelmann et al. go so far as to claim that the general insensitivity of laypeople to such distinctions of fundamental significance to the voluntarist debate substantially limits the degree to which studies of laypeople can provide any compelling evidence for or against voluntarism.

Further studies by Cusimano and Goodwin suggest that laypeople attribute a greater ability to others in voluntarily changing beliefs than they do to themselves (2020; Cusimano, Zorrilla, Danks, & Lombrozo 2024 found something similar). This plausibly suggests that laypeople hold that there are significant constraints on voluntary belief change when it comes to their own beliefs—a finding in keeping with the introspective reports of epistemologists. Indeed, such findings may furnish an important methodological benchmark for further studies: since laypeople are more aware of their own evidence and processes of reasoning, their ability to judge the measure of doxastic control of others may be substantially limited. While empirical inquiry concerning doxastic voluntarism is controversial, it is unclear why it would not amount to a legitimate—perhaps a necessary—extension of the psychological approach to the issue, provided experiments are adequately sensitive to distinctions concerning varieties of control.

6. The Ethics of Belief

It has become conventional to understand the ethics of belief to broadly pertain to questions concerning the nature of the norms that govern belief formation (see also entry on the ethics of belief). Yet, the ethics of belief may also be understood more strictly to pertain to the moral or prudential obligations we bear to the process of belief formation. The phrase derives from W.K. Clifford’s classic essay, “The Ethics of Belief” (published in 1877), even though the idea that we have moral duties pertaining to our beliefs is much older. Clifford would notoriously claim that it is always wrong to believe on insufficient evidence, where “wrong” appears to have a distinctively moral valence.

In his famous reply to Clifford, “The Will to Believe”, William James would reject Clifford’s evidentialism on the practical grounds that evidentially undersupported beliefs are sometimes risks worth taking (1896; see also Pace 2011). This pragmatist rejection of evidentialism raises questions at the heart of the ethics of belief: must one always believe on the basis of adequate evidence or epistemic reasons? Is it permissible to believe on the basis of prudential or moral reasons?

The issue of doxastic voluntarism is particularly germane to the ethics of belief insofar as the extent to which we can control the process of belief formation would seem to give shape to what duties we might bear in believing (Audi 2001). If it turns out that we have no direct control over believing—and we suppose that “cannot” implies no “ought”—then our obligations vis-à-vis our beliefs cannot consist in choosing certain beliefs. Instead, our obligations (if such there be) consist in exerting our will upon some other stage of the process of belief formation.

6.1 Epistemic Deontologism

One purportedly common way of understanding epistemic obligations is that they are duties that bear on belief formation itself (Alston 1988; Plantinga 1993: chapter 1). This view is known as epistemic deontologism. Epistemic norms, on this view, are normative in the prescriptive sense. While there may be additional obligations that bear on other stages of the process of acquiring beliefs—e.g., in gathering evidence—those pertaining to belief formation itself are most fundamental. It is in the context of arguing that an endorsement of doxastic voluntarism is indispensable to epistemic deontology that Alston made his seminal case against voluntarism.

Though this deontological conception of epistemic obligations need not entail that epistemic duties are also moral duties, there is a tradition of thinking about them in this way. This is how Descartes, for instance, is commonly understood to conceive of epistemic obligations (e.g., Plantinga 1993: 19–22), owing to his suggestive description of doxastic mistakes as a kind of “sin” (peccatum) we are “at fault” for (“Fourth Meditiation” of Meditations AT VII:58; CSM II:41). Believing on the basis of clarity and distinctness, in contrast, is “behaving correctly” (recte agere) (AT VII:59; CSM II:41). Though careful examination reveals Descartes to be ambiguous on this matter (“Synopsis” of Meditations AT VII:15; CSM II:11), one can see how the view would naturally complement his thoroughgoing voluntarism (see section 2.3 of this entry). Clifford is less ambiguous about a moral valence of epistemic obligations, and casts the obligation to believe in accord with the evidence as both moral and, apparently, as applying to belief formation itself (1877 [2004: 517]). Other defenders of epistemic deontologism do not maintain that the epistemic ought has any moral bearing (Feldman 1988; 2000), and they differ on whether deontologism requires voluntary control (Steup 2000 holds that it does; Feldman 2000 holds that it does not).

One recent and controversial extension of the idea that we have moral duties to believe is the claim that believing in certain ways can wrong others. This view, known as doxastic wronging, implies that believing itself is morally impermissible in some instances. The standard examples are those of purportedly racist beliefs (Basu 2018; cf. Gardiner 2018; Fritz & Jackson 2021; Enoch & Spectre forthcoming). Some defenders of this view maintain that its plausibility hangs on the truth or falsity of doxastic voluntarism, and point to defenses of voluntarism as evidence that doxastic agents possess adequate doxastic control to ground claims of moral agency in believing (Basu & Schoeder 2018).

6.2 Pragmatism

The idea that beliefs can wrong others—as well as James’ position that we may believe evidentially undersupported propositions for practical reasons—raises the broader issue of whether it is even possible for there to be practical reasons for (or against) believing. Several authors argue that there are. Susanna Rinard maintains that the rationality of beliefs “is determined in precisely the same way as the rationality of other states” (2017: 123), notably including actions. Hence, “moral or prudential considerations can be reasons for belief” (2019: s.4; see also Leary 2017). Barry Maguire and Jack Woods endorse a closely related, albeit stronger, position: namely, that “there are practical reasons for beliefs, and, indeed, that all authoritative reasons for belief are practical reasons” (2020: 244). These authors, however, acknowledge that such pragmatic conceptions of doxastic rationality depend upon a substantial measure of control over belief.

[T]he significance of our line on this sort of case is vulnerable to future work on “ought implies can” and doxastic voluntarism. (Maguire & Woods 2020: 244; see also Rinard 2019: s.4)

After all, if it turns out that doxastic agents cannot, as a matter of psychological fact, believe on the basis of practical reasons, then the plausibility of such theories of rationality is potentially called into question.

6.3 Evidence Gathering

Though some doxastic involuntarists reject epistemic deontologism, they may nevertheless maintain that we still bear certain obligations pertinent to the process of belief formation. Their involuntarism simply precludes those obligations bearing directly on belief formation itself. Perhaps the most prominent among these is the purported obligation to gather evidence in a responsible way (Locke 1689: IV.xv.5; Feldman 2000; Flores & Woodard 2023). For example, when considering whether anthropogenic climate change is afoot, I may choose to consult a report by the Intergovernmental Panel on Climate Change or one by the Heritage Foundation—or I might prefer a snug place on the couch and gather no evidence whatsoever. Even if I cannot decide what to believe about climate change on the basis of what I learn in the report (or do not learn), it is plausible that I am nevertheless obligated to consult at least some evidence.

It is a matter of some dispute how far this obligation extends. Are we obligated to fastidiously gather evidence with regard to any proposition we entertain? This is clearly not feasible. It is more plausible that there are a limited range of practically weighty propositions for which we have such an obligation. And one might think of the obligation to gather evidence as bearing a positive and linear relationship to the practical importance of the proposition in question.

6.4 Reflection

Though gathering evidence has been regarded by some as the only obligation we bear to the process of belief formation, it seems that this cannot be enough. For merely gathering evidence is not sufficient for making a satisfactory judgment regarding a proposition that one is entertaining. After all, one may have evidence which propositionally justifies a potential belief, yet one may not have done the requisite cognitive work for doxastic justification—i.e., for adequately anchoring the belief in the relevant evidence. For example, one might learn that sea-level rise is predicted to be .6 meters by 2100; and one might also have learned years ago that many portions of the low-lying island nation, Tuvalu, are below .6 meters. Yet, given the temporal gap, one may fail to see the implication that many portions of Tuvalu will be largely submerged by high tides by 2100. That is, some measure of reflection is often required to see the implications of our evidence—a task which we can clearly carry out even if voluntarism is false. It is plausible that we are obligated to carry out such reflection in certain circumstances (see Tidman 1996; Stapleford 2013).

6.5 Adopting Epistemic Norms

As noted above regarding Kant (section 2.4), some have claimed that our adoption of epistemic norms, or doxastic policies, is one way of exerting doxastic control (Cohen 2010; see also Helm 1994). Even if one cannot directly decide to believe in accord with the evidence, one may perhaps decide to endorse, for example, evidentialism. What’s more, one may plausibly maintain, as Clifford did, that there is a moral obligation to adhere to it. Explicitly adhering to such a principle will surely exert a powerful influence upon a wide range of propositions one entertains for belief.

A puzzle arises, however, when one asks whether in such a situation one believes evidentialism is true. If so, how can one voluntarily adopt it without being antecedently committed to a kind of direct voluntary control (Peels 2013)? If one were to insist that an endorsement of evidentialism—or any other epistemic principle—is the automatic output of the principle’s being self-evident or highly plausible, then it becomes unclear that one has voluntary control over believing evidentialism. If, on the other hand, it is claimed that one does not believe the epistemic principle in question, it becomes difficult to see the sense in which one adheres to it (however, see Goldberg 2013 and Fleisher 2018 for alternative non-doxastic attitudes one may take toward their preferred philosophical views).

6.6 Epistemic Virtue and Vice

Even if it is not clear whether we have control over adopting doxastic policies, we do seem to have control over cultivating character traits that shape the process of belief formation (see also §1.1). While one cannot decide to become intellectually humble “just like that”, one can decide to reconsider a position one previously rejected, examine evidence against one’s own positions, and subject the latter to fresh critical scrutiny. Should these practices solidify over time into habits, one would thereby embody the virtue of intellectual humility (see entry on virtue epistemology). Correspondingly, should one not carry out these activities, it may be that one is passively contributing to the cultivation of an opposing epistemic vice—e.g., dogmatism or epistemic pride. In light of the important role such practices play, Clifford, for example, implies that there is a “universal” moral “duty” to engage in virtue-cultivating practices. For in their absence one “may help to…keep alive the fatal superstitions which clog [one’s] race” (1877 [1879: 183]).

7. Religious Faith

Doxastic obligations are a central part of many religious traditions (see entry on faith). For example, in traditions such as Christianity and Islam, believing that God exists or believing certain religious doctrines is often necessary for, or at least a key part of, religious commitment. In Buddhism, those who are following the Eightfold Path are encouraged to believe (or at least accept) the Four Noble Truths (see Siderits 2007). Furthermore, on some views, faith that p requires belief that p (see Malcolm & Scott 2016). Other theistic arguments (e.g., Pascal’s wager) conclude that one should form theistic beliefs. However, if doxastic involuntarism is true, then it’s difficult to make sense of doxastic religious obligations. If “ought” implies “can”, and we cannot control our religious beliefs, then it seems like there couldn’t be doxastic religious obligations. Thus, the truth of doxastic voluntarism is central to questions about the rationality of religious belief and religious commitment within many traditions.

Authors working on doxastic religious obligations generally fall into four categories (see Jackson 2021). First, some authors deny that we have religious doxastic obligations at all, and locate these obligations elsewhere: for example, as obligations to act on, or accept religious claims, or as obligation to make a non-doxastic religious commitment. On some strands of Judaism, for instance, how one acts is much more important than what one believes; David Benatar (2006) even suggests that it’s perfectly sensible to be religiously Jewish and also an atheist. Some traditions in Hinduism similarly emphasize action. Gavin Flood, in his introduction to Hinduism, writes:

One striking feature of Hinduism is that practice takes precedence over belief. What a Hindu does is more important than what a Hindu believes. Hinduism is not credal. (Flood 1996: 12)

In the Christian and Islamic traditions, philosophers writing on faith have argued for the possibility that one could have faith that God exists even absent belief that God exists, in part motivated by concerns regarding doxastic voluntarism (see, e.g., Pojman 1986; Alston 1996; Speak 2007; Audi 2011; Aijaz 2023; Lebens 2023). If faith doesn’t require belief but instead, say, acceptance (acting as if a proposition is true), commitment, or a similar action-like state, then, even if we cannot control our religious beliefs, we can control whether we have religious faith, which is arguably the more central religious attitude.

Other authors have made a similar move regarding Pascal’s Wager. Janesist Catholic Blaise Pascal, writing in the Christian tradition, is often credited with this pragmatic argument for belief in God (1670). However, similar pragmatic arguments exist in the Islamic tradition (see Al-Ghazālī 1105 [1991: chapter IV]) and in the Buddhist tradition (in the discourse to the Kālāmas; see Holder 2006). While these arguments are normally framed as pragmatic arguments for theistic belief, they could be framed differently: e.g., reasons to make a religious commitment or to accept that God exists. Then, pragmatic arguments for theism are compatible with doxastic involuntarism and ought implies can (see Jones 1998; Rota 2016). (This move is, arguably, advocated by Pascal himself, when he says that even if one cannot believe immediately, one ought to act as if one believes, by “taking holy water, having masses…” (1670: fragment 233 [1958: 68]).

A second possibility is to deny that ought implies can. Perhaps we have religious doxastic obligations even if we cannot control our religious beliefs. Richard Feldman (2000) advocates this approach to doxastic obligations, generally. According to Feldman, doxastic obligations are “role oughts”: obligations we have qua our role as believers. We have these obligations because we are in the relevant role, even if we lack direct doxastic control. While Feldman isn’t concerned with religious belief in particular, his argument may be applied to it.

Third, some authors argue that indirect doxastic control is key to understanding religious doxastic obligations. Even if we cannot directly control our beliefs, we can control our belief-forming practices: what evidence we gather, how we gather evidence, what sources we pay attention to, how much we reflect on our beliefs and evidence, and the like. These practices inevitably influence our beliefs, albeit indirectly. Lindsay Rettler (2018a) argues that we have indirect reflective control—i.e., the kind of control we exercise when we reflect on various reasons and evidence for our current and potential beliefs—over both belief and faith. This indirect control is sufficient to ground doxastic obligations and blame.

Finally, others argue that doxastic involuntarism is false, and we have voluntary control over our religious beliefs. For example, Elizabeth Jackson (2023) argues that most of us are in a permissive situation with respect to our religious beliefs, and this allows for the possibility that most of us can exercise direct control over our religious beliefs. Jackson argues that, given this framework, we can understand pragmatic theistic arguments as applying directly to belief; her arguments also apply to questions about the voluntariness of religious faith and religious belief.

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Both authors contributed equally to this article, and were equally involved in every stage of its conception and writing. Thanks to Tania Lombrozo, Justin Mooney, Robert Pasnau, and Matthias Steup for useful comments on an earlier draft.

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Doxastic Voluntarism

1. What is Doxastic Voluntarism?

1.1 Varieties of Control

1.2 Which Kind of Control?

1.3 Which Attitudes?

2. History

2.1 Antiquity

2.2 Middle Ages

2.3 Early Modern Period

2.4 Modern Period

3. Arguments for Involuntarism

3.1 Psychological Involuntarism

3.2 Conceptual Involuntarism

4. Defenses of Voluntarism

4.1 Epistemic Permissivism

4.2 Doxastic Compatibilism

4.3 Voluntarism and Skepticism

4.4 One-off Voluntarism

4.5 Voluntarism and Non-Standard Views of Belief

5. Empirical Work on Voluntarism

6. The Ethics of Belief

6.1 Epistemic Deontologism

6.2 Pragmatism

6.3 Evidence Gathering

6.4 Reflection

6.5 Adopting Epistemic Norms

6.6 Epistemic Virtue and Vice

7. Religious Faith

Bibliography

Academic Tools

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

Browse

About

Support SEP

Mirror Sites

	How to cite this entry.
	Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
	Look up topics and thinkers related to this entry at the Internet Philosophy Ontology Project (InPhO).
	Enhanced bibliography for this entry at PhilPapers, with links to its database.

Doxastic Voluntarism

1. What is Doxastic Voluntarism?

1.1 Varieties of Control

1.2 Which Kind of Control?

1.3 Which Attitudes?

2. History

2.1 Antiquity

2.2 Middle Ages

2.3 Early Modern Period

2.4 Modern Period

3. Arguments for Involuntarism

3.1 Psychological Involuntarism

3.2 Conceptual Involuntarism

4. Defenses of Voluntarism

4.1 Epistemic Permissivism

4.2 Doxastic Compatibilism

4.3 Voluntarism and Skepticism

4.4 One-off Voluntarism

4.5 Voluntarism and Non-Standard Views of Belief

5. Empirical Work on Voluntarism

6. The Ethics of Belief

6.1 Epistemic Deontologism

6.2 Pragmatism

6.3 Evidence Gathering

6.4 Reflection

6.5 Adopting Epistemic Norms

6.6 Epistemic Virtue and Vice

7. Religious Faith

Bibliography

Academic Tools

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

Acknowledgments

Browse

About

Support SEP

Mirror Sites