Human Enhancement

First published Tue Apr 7, 2015; substantive revision Thu Nov 13, 2025

At first glance there does not seem to be anything philosophically problematic about human enhancement. Activities such as physical fitness routines, wearing eyeglasses, taking music lessons and meditation are routinely utilized for the goal of enhancing human capacities. But there are a cluster of debates in practical ethics, conventionally labeled as “the ethics of human enhancement”, that do raise philosophical questions. These debates include clinicians’ concerns about the limits of legitimate health care, parents’ worries about their reproductive and rearing obligations, and the fairness of competitive practices like sports and war, and the possibility of improving human moral agency itself. They also involve more general questions about distributive justice, science policy, and the public regulation of medical technologies.

As usual in practical ethics, an adequate discussion of any specific debate under this heading quickly requires orientation to the science and the social and political practices of specific enhancement interventions. At each turn in these discussions, wide vistas of background philosophical topics also appear for exploration. Rather than providing a detailed account of this whole landscape, we trace a path of core concerns that winds through the current debates on the ethics of human enhancement, as a guide for those interested in exploring further.

1. Introduction

1.1 Terminology: ‘Human’ and ‘Enhancement’

As our preface suggests, the ordinary use of ‘human enhancement’ refers to a wide range of practices, many of which are not explored in the enhancement ethics literature. To orient our tour, it is important to note that usage of the terms ‘human’ and ‘enhancement’ in the literature merit some initial clarification.

In order to avoid equivocating terms in these debates, it is useful to distinguish different uses of the term ‘human’. On the one hand, there are biological uses of ‘human’ to refer to members of the species homo sapiens. On the other hand, there are moral uses of ‘human’ to refer to persons or members of the moral community. The biological and moral uses of ‘human’ are familiar in the abortion debate, where there is disagreement about the personhood or moral standing of prenatal human life, and one must be careful in that context to distinguish biological and ethical/moral uses of the term ‘human’ when defending one’s stance. As it will become clear in the following sections, in the enhancement debate equivocations between biological and ethical senses of the term ‘human’ are sources of many apparent disagreements. Is there anything special about being a member of the biological species homo sapiens that enhancements could threaten? Or do enhancements somehow threaten being human in an ethical sense, e.g., being a subject who has moral rights and duties and is deserving of respect? Are those who criticize enhancements as dehumanizing really thinking about the loss of other markers of the moral standing that is commonly attributed to persons? At this preliminary stage in the discussion, we are foreclosing neither the biological nor the evaluative senses of ‘human’ from the start but will stay alert to both until it becomes important to distinguish and relate them.

With the term ‘enhancement’, on the other hand, it is helpful to specify a working definition from the start. One might simply use ‘enhancement’ as a synonym for ‘improvement’: to enhance is to improve. This definition has the virtue of being aligned with ordinary usage. However, in the context of debates about human enhancement, not all improvements to human capacities are on par (Agar 2024). If I take corticosteroids for my allergies, that is a therapeutic improvement, which restores my breathing to normal levels of functioning and health. (Agar 2024) There is not much room for reasonable debate about whether it would be wrong to take safe and low-cost medications for therapeutic improvements (Kamm 2005). However, in the enhancement literature, ‘enhancements’ standardly refer to biomedical interventions that are used to improve human form or functioning beyond what is necessary to restore or sustain health. This broad definition flows from and reflects the foundational literature in this area (Parens 1995, Juengst 1998). and it also has several implications that are sometimes forgotten.

First, it means that simple line-drawing exercises aimed at isolating enhancement technologies from other biomedical interventions for special precautionary regulation or oversight are destined to be ineffective (pace Anderson 1989). This is because there are no enhancement technologies per se. Whether a given biomedical intervention counts as an enhancement depends on how it is used. When ankle-strengthening surgery is used to improve a bicyclist’s competitive edge, it might raise enhancement concerns, but as a treatment for a bicyclist’s ankle injury, it does not. This means that the developers of even the most outré enhancement interventions will almost always be able to appeal to some correlative therapeutic uses to justify their research, testing, and release into the market (Mehlman 1999; Juengst, et al. 2024). On the other hand, simply pointing out that biomedical technologies can have both therapeutic and enhancement uses does nothing to collapse the logical distinction between those uses, or to defeat the claim that those distinguishable uses might warrant different ethical responses (Buchanan 2011). Although the logical distinction between treatment and enhancement is clear, as we show in Section 2, understanding exactly how to use the distinction and its moral significance are matters of debate.

Second, the term ‘enhancement’ as it is standardly used in these debates restricts its scope to biomedical interventions, even though other methods of increasing normal human capacities raise ethical issues as well. Electronic and robotic tools that enable us to listen, observe, help or harm at a distance, training designed to maximize particular talents, and social practices that foster new forms of human relationship all come with their own trade-offs and moral concerns. But the focus of the enhancement ethics literature is overwhelmingly on interventions that make biological changes in human bodies and brains, using pharmaceutical, surgical, nanotechnological, robotics or genetic techniques (Clarke, et al. 2016, Agar 2013). Standard examples include:

  • cosmetic surgery (Miller, Brody and Chung, 2000; Little, 1998),
  • the use of performance enhancing drugs to improve athletic endurance and strength (Miah 2004; Murray 2009; Tolleneer 2013; Devine 2023),
  • psychopharmaceutical approaches to increasing memory, elevating mood, and improving cognitive capacities (Elliott 1998; Whitehouse, et al. 1997; Savulescu, et al. 2011; Glannon 2011; Levy, Douglas, Kahane, et al. 2014a; Duncan 2016; Earp 2018, May 2023), and
  • genetic and neurological interventions to increase the human life span, acquire new sensory-motor abilities, and, through “moral enhancement”, live together in more peaceable, generous, and just ways (cf. Savulescu, ter Meulen and Kahane 2011; Harris 2016; Wiseman 2016; Johnson, Bishop and Toner 2019; May 2023).

Finally, our definition implies that enhancement interventions attempt to improve specific human capacities and traits, rather than whole persons. Unlike such comprehensive personal-improvement strategies such as psychoanalysis or “the power of positive thinking”, biomedical enhancements offer a piecemeal approach to human perfectibility. As a result, biomedical enhancements involve trade-offs. Comparative thinking about the value of enhancements along different dimensions of desirability is unavoidable and is usually more of an exercise in optimization than idealization (Brennan and Moseley 2013). If extended life span comes with prolonged frailty, or if enhanced altruism compromises survival skills, the overall value of the enhancement can be called into question.

1.2 Brief Historical Background

An important part of the orientation for those new to thinking about enhancement ethics is the ways in which current debates are shaped by the history of earlier efforts at perfecting people. At one level, perfectionist and meliorist impulses have deep roots in Western philosophical and religious thinking, which both modern science and medicine have inherited (Roduit 2016; Rothman and Rothman 2004) Most advocates and critics of biomedical enhancement share these commitments to the value of human excellence and the use of human effort to improve well-being and reducing suffering in the world, but have disagreeing visions of the ideal (Roduit, Baumann, and Heilinger 2013; Parens 2005). Other scholars, recalling the historical imposition of hegemonic religious and political visions of salvation and citizenship, fear the elevation of any canonical account of existing human virtues, in favor of visions that prize people’s capacity to shape their own ideals through reason, autonomy, and democratic deliberation (Sparrow 2014; Buchanan 2011). Others, pointing to the consequences of modern individualism for the common good (Persson and Savelescu 2012), feel confident about being able to name the constellation of existing human traits that should either be preserved (Kass 1997; Annas 1998; Agar 2013) or enhanced (Bostrom 2003). However, almost no one in this literature eschews the development and use of new medical tools for healing purposes (Kamm 2005; Kass 2003). Because of this, a first step in our discussion is to scrutinize the distinction between treatment and enhancement, to see if it can help demarcate where different melioristic ideals diverge.

Another, perhaps more visible, backdrop for the enhancement ethics literature is the history of the 20th century eugenics movement, which attempted to “breed better people” and “improve the human gene pool” through socially biased reproductive controls and inducements (Wikler 1999; Buchanan, et al. 2000; Lombardo 2022). This background prompts questions about the cultural authority of science and the social values it can perpetuate, and it raises fears of slippery slopes that can lead to egregious forms of oppression, by providing a vivid recent counter-narrative to endorsements of enhancement as a way to fulfill our obligations to future generations (Sparrow 2011; Selgelid 2013; Iltis 2016). The eugenics backdrop tends to skew the burden of proof the other way in the debate, towards a more “precautionary” stance that gives advocates of enhancement the burden of distinguishing their proposals from old style eugenics in order to defend the parts of that ideology that they share (Kitcher 1997; Harris, 2007; Agar 2004).

Finally, in the historical foreground for enhancement ethics are contemporary critiques of the commercialization (and homogenization) of beauty through “aesthetic medicine” (Bordo 1993), the evolving history of pharmaceutical performance enhancement in sports (Hoberman 1992), and the scientific career of human gene transfer and ‘genetic engineering’ (Friedman 1998). Each of these stories supports a literature of its own, which has contributed important insights to the broader discussion of enhancement ethics. From feminist and disability studies come critiques of the medicalization of human beauty, focusing on complicity with unjust social norms that can turn ordinary welfare meliorism on its head to prioritize the enhancement uses of biomedicine over standard therapeutic applications (Silvers 1998). Meanwhile, discussions of “doping” in sport have illuminated the ways in which enhancement interventions can undermine communal social practices that depend on presumptions of equality, lifting the discussion above the level of individual choices and transactions (Murray 1987; Murray 2009). Similarly, the checkered career of human gene therapy and the emergence of human gene editing has kept on the table the need to anticipate the physical risks of putative improvements, and how daunting they would make the foreseeable prospect of any intergenerational “germ line” enhancement intervention (Walters and Palmer 1997; Kimmelman 2009; NASEM 2017).

All of these contextual “back-stories” to the contemporary enhancement debates are worth exploring further. They have shaped contemporary thinking about and reactions to enhancement proposals and provide important cautionary tales to keep in mind when evaluating those proposals. At the same time, these back-stories bring their own assumptions and biases into the discussion and can thereby complicate a fresh philosophical assessment.

2. What are the Proper Limits of Health Care?

While much of the enhancement ethics literature leans towards thought experiments set in the future, it is grounded in a set of important debates about how health care should be defined today. In these debates, the claim is often made that the distinction between using biomedical tools to combat human disease and attempting to use them to enhance healthy human traits can provide practical guidance on a range of issues, including the limits of health professionals’ obligations (Miller, Brody and Chung 2000), the scope of health care payment plans (Daniels and Sabin 1994), and the prioritization of biomedical research protocols (Mehlman, Berg, Juengst and Kodish 2011). In each of these cases, the line between treatment and enhancement is drawn to mark an upper boundary of professional and social obligations. Just as the concept of futile treatment is used to indicate the limits of a doctor’s obligations when further intervention no longer can achieve therapeutic goals, enhancement interventions are thought to fall outside health care’s proper domain of practice by going “beyond therapy” in pursuit of other non-medical goals (Kass 2003). This means that patients have no role-related right to demand such services from health professionals, fair insurance coverage plans may exclude them, and those who do provide them bear a burden of justification for doing so that does not apply to “medically necessary” interventions.

As a biomedical boundary marker, the distinction between treatment and enhancement has been enshrined in policies at both professional and governmental levels and continues to inform much of the public discussion of new biomedical advances. However, this distinction is explicated in several different ways, which have different merits as boundary markers for biomedical research and practice. In fact, with philosophical scrutiny, the distinction often seems in danger of collapsing entirely under conceptual critiques even before the question of its moral merits is entertained.

When it is used as a medical boundary concept, enhancement, like futility, plays both descriptive and ethical roles. To use these concepts, we need to be able to identify our efforts as either futile or enhancing and we need to know what the boundary means for going further. Part of the practical challenge for policymakers is that for enhancement interventions, these descriptive and moral implications seem to be at cross-purposes. While futile treatments do no good, enhancements are by definition and description improvements in personal welfare. Yet, the boundary function of calling them “enhancements” in health policy settings is to place them outside of sanctioned interventions. For a field dedicated to pursuing improved welfare for its patients, the fact that enhancements often look just like all the other improvements that health care strives to achieve makes it difficult to discern when an intervention transgresses the normative boundary that the concept purports to mark.

This has provoked three major ways of operationalizing the enhancement concept, each of which seeks to redress the weaknesses of its predecessor.

2.1 Professional Domain Accounts

The first approach to defining the line between treatment and enhancement appeals to the health professions’ conventional vision of their proper domain. Accordingly, “treatments” are any interventions that the professional standards of care endorse, while “enhancements” are any interventions that the professions declare to be beyond their purview. Attempts by professional societies to police their own frontiers by discouraging particular practices as “enhancement” rather than “treatment” reflect this approach, as do appeals to “community standards” by health care payers seeking to distinguish “elective” from “medically necessary” interventions for payment.

For those committed to a particular account of the goals of health care, this approach can offer normative guidance for internal criticism of suspect professional practices (Kass 1985). But of course, there are numerous competing philosophies of health care, none of which command universal allegiance within the health professions. In fact, this approach also resonates well with those who argue that the health professions have no intrinsic domain of practice, beyond that which they can negotiate with patients (Good 1994). For those influenced by this libertarian view of professional autonomy, the normative lesson for professionals concerned about their obligations in specific cases can be simple: whatever interventions their patients will accept can be considered “treatments”, while “enhancements” are simply those interventions which individual health professionals refuse to provide (Engelhardt 1990). Unfortunately, medical historians and sociologists point out that the health professions have always been adept at adapting to the cultural beliefs and social values of the institutions and communities they serve. This is done by ‘medicalizing’ new problems so that they come to be seen as a legitimate part of medicine’s jurisdiction (Conrad 2007). Given the health professions’ philosophical pluralism and political autonomy, their own conventions seem to provide no principled way to exclude new interventions from their domain. To the extent that useful “upper boundary” concepts are required at the policy level (e.g., for societies making health care allocation decisions) this impotence is an important failing for this approach to drawing the distinction.

2.2 Normal Function Accounts

There is another approach to interpreting the treatment/enhancement distinction that seeks to provide a firmer theoretical foundation for delimiting legitimate health care needs. On this approach, to be healthy is to be able to do all that appropriately matched members of one’s own species can do, in our case what human beings of similar age and gender can do. Legitimate health care needs or “health problems” or “diseases” or “maladies” are all characterized by a fall from that level of functional capacity. All proper health care services, therefore, should be aimed at getting people back to “normal”, e.g., restoring an individual’s functional capability to the species-typical range for their reference class, and within that range to the particular capability level which was the patient’s genetic birthright. Interventions which take people to the top of their personal potential (like athletic training) or beyond their own birth range (like growth hormone), or to the top of the range of their reference class, or to the top of the species-typical range, or beyond (!), are all to be counted as enhancements and fall successively further beyond the responsibility of medicine or health care.

The advantage of the normal function account is that it provides a single (relatively) unified goal for health care, towards which the burdens and benefits of various interventions can be compared, measured, balanced, and integrated. Normal functionalists can use physiology to determine when they’ve achieved the species typical range and clinical histories to determine when they’ve brought a patient up to the baseline of his or her personal capability range.

Some critics of the normal function approach take issue with its focus on the “species-typical range”, arguing that it is insensitive to the diversity of ways in which human beings can flourish in life. They point out that those born with disabilities may be wary of biomedicine’s “fatal attraction to normalizing” (Silvers 1998; Asch and Block 2011). Moreover, even when no amount of treatment can give someone “species typical” functioning, there may be compensatory technologies that can actually expand their range of opportunities beyond the norm (Silvers 1998). Should powered wheelchairs be designed to slow and stop at the same distance that walking humans would succumb to fatigue, in order to keep them from “enhancing” their users’ abilities? By the same token, the naturally gifted may find that they have no claim to treatment for injuries or accidents that merely bring them down into the “normal range”. If our champion thinkers, athletes and saints can legitimately claim treatment for problems that impair their species-optimal functioning, bringing the rest of us up to their levels should count as proper health care as well. But that leaves only the most extreme improvements on the other side of the “enhancement” boundary: if our species champions are the benchmark, only interventions that create capacities no human has had before would fall beyond medicine’s proper domain. Individualizing the optimal functional range to individual genomic potentials will not resolve this problem, of course, to the extent that our genomes themselves become biomedically malleable. Establishing the “species-typical norm” for a particular human function is a difficult enough task, even where descriptive statistics can help. But when the boundary is “optimal” not “normal” functioning, the evidentiary foundations of the approach begin to come apart (Sculley and Rehman-Sutter 2008).

The second serious problem for the normal function approach is the challenge of prevention. While some efforts at health promotion, such as exercise, straddle the border of medical responsibility, many preventive interventions (i.e., vaccines) are widely accepted as legitimate parts of medicine’s mission and are located squarely on the treatment side of the enhancement boundary. One of the ways to prevent disease is to strengthen the body’s ability to resist pathological changes before any diagnosable problem appears. But to the extent that prevention attempts to elevate bodily functions above the normal range for the individual (and, in some cases, even the species typical range), it seems to slide into what the normal function approach would call enhancement. If the normal function account is taken seriously as a biomedical boundary marker, how does one defend this kind of prevention? Conversely, if preventive interventions like these are acceptable in medicine, what can it mean to claim that researchers and clinicians should be “drawing the line” at enhancement? (Juengst, et al. 2024)

2.3 Disease-Based Accounts

Probably the most common rejoinder to the problem of prevention is to distinguish the problems to which they respond. Treatments are interventions that address the health problems created by diagnosable diseases and disabilities: maladies in the helpful language of Gert, Culver and Clouser (2006). Enhancements, on the other hand, are interventions aimed at healthy systems and traits. Thus, prescribing biosynthetic growth hormone to rectify a diagnosable growth hormone deficiency is legitimate treatment, while prescribing it for patients with normal growth hormone levels would be an attempt at positive genetic engineering or enhancement (Berger and Gert 1991). On this account, to justify an intervention as appropriate medicine means to be able to identify a malady in the patient. If no medically recognizable malady can be diagnosed, the intervention cannot be medically necessary and is thus suspect as an enhancement. This would clear the way for safe and effective genetic “vaccines” against predictable muscle damage (even if they provided better than normal damage resistance) but would screen out as enhancements efforts to improve traits that were at no diagnosable risk of deterioration (Juengst 1997).

These accounts have the advantage of being simple, intuitively appealing, and consistent with a lot of biomedical behavior. Maladies are objectively observable phenomena and the traditional target of medical intervention. We can know maladies through diagnosis, and we can tell that we have gone beyond medicine when no pathology can be identified. Thus, pediatric endocrinologists discourage enhancement uses of biosynthetic growth hormone by citing the old adage “If it ain’t broke, don’t fix it”. This interpretation is also at work in the efforts of professionals working at the boundary, like cosmetic surgeons, to justify their services. They claim to be relieving diagnosable psychological suffering (mental maladies) rather than satisfying the aesthetic tastes of their clients, and insurance companies insist on being provided with that diagnosis before providing coverage for such surgeries.

On the other hand, disease-based accounts also face at least two objections. The first is one they share with the Professional Domain account: the problem of biomedicine’s infamous nosological elasticity. It is not hard to coin new maladies for the purposes of justifying the use of enhancement interventions (Carey, Melvin and Ranney 2008). Unless some specific (and usually contentious) theory of disease is employed to give this approach its teeth, it puts the power for drawing the boundary back into the profession’s hands and raises the same worries about the social domain accounts (Parens 2013). The more important practical problem is that no matter how the line is drawn, most biotechnological interventions that could be seen as problematic if used as enhancements will not need to be justified as enhancements in order to be developed and approved for clinical use. This is because most such interventions will also have legitimate therapeutic applications. Indeed, most biomedical tools with potential for enhancement uses will first emerge as therapeutic agents. For example, general cognitive enhancement interventions are likely to be approved for use only in patients with neurological diseases. However, to the extent that they are in high demand by individuals suffering the effects of normal aging, the risk of unapproved or “off-label” uses will be high (Whitehouse, et al. 1997).

This last point is critical for policy purposes, because it suggests that, in countries like the USA, the real challenge may not be regulation of the development of enhancement interventions, but rather the regulation of downstream “off-label” uses of therapeutic interventions for non-medical, enhancement purposes. (However, c.f., Moseley and Fröhlich (2025) discuss cases of non-invasive brain stimulation technology that was first developed and tested on healthy subjects to evaluate boosts in creativity and was later utilized for therapeutic purposes.) The policy problems then become problems about controlling access and use of certain interventions, rather than their development. Of course, the fact that a certain type of intervention is declared illegal for physicians to dispense, does not immediately imply that it is morally wrong for anyone to pursue or for other competent professionals to provide. These realities have pressed those who would use the treatment/enhancement distinction for policy purposes to articulate the moral dangers of biomedical enhancement more clearly. Even if doctors eschew such use on professional ethical grounds, are there independent moral reasons why individual athletes, parents, students or other “consumers” of enhancement interventions, should turn away from their availability?

3. Is it Unfair to Use Enhancements?

One type of human enhancement that has received extensive philosophical attention is the use of biomedical interventions to improve the physical performance of athletes in the context of sports (Miah 2004; Murray 2009; Tolleneer, et al. 2013; Devine 2023). One reason athletic performance enhancement garners so much attention is because of its currency, given the epidemic of doping scandals in contemporary sport. Another reason, however, is that it serves as a paradigm case for teasing out important dimensions of the problem: it involves measurable improvements in biological capacities in a social context that is both well outside health care and defined by clear rules of engagement.

At first impression, the ethical problem with performance enhancement in sport would seem to be simply a problem of cheating (Schermer, 2008a). If the rules of sport forbid the use of performance enhancements, then their illicit use confers an advantage to users against other athletes (who either accept the rules of the game or do not have access to the enhancement interventions). That advantage, in turn, can create pressure for more athletes to cheat in the same way, undermining the basis for the competitions at stake and exacerbating the gap between those who can afford enhancements and those who cannot (Murray 1987, Sparrow 2015, Devine 2023).

Extrapolating from sports to a broader competitive view of society at large, critics argue that the widespread social acceptance of enhancement interventions would exacerbate inequalities and create unfair advantages for privileged individuals. That situation is likely to result in the development of sharp divides between enhanced and unenhanced populations, or between an elite class of “genobility” and an underprivileged class of “genpoor”, raising distributive justice and human rights concerns (Mehlman 2003, 2009; Buchanan, et al. 2000; Sparrow 2011).

Much of the rhetoric about “doping” assumes the very claim that needs to be established by argument: that the rules of sport (or the norms of social advancement) ought to ban the use of biomedical enhancement. The rules of a sport can be changed. Novel performance enhancing technologies and training methods are regularly integrated in sports. Thus, whether it is morally permissible to introduce specific biomedical enhancements in sports, in general and in particular sports, depends on considerations about fairness, distributive justice, and the goals of sport itself (or the goals of particular sports). Fairness issues around equitable access to enhancements can sometimes be addressed directly, such as the International Olympic Committee’s decision to provide all teams with “FastSkin” swimming suits at the Sydney Olympics. In other cases, inequalities may come to be accepted as unfortunate but not unjust. For example, when an equatorial country’s ski team did not have access to artificial snow and so could not compete evenly with the ski teams of northern countries.

If enhancement interventions can either be distributed fairly or the inequities they create can be written into the rules of the particular sport in question as part of the given advantages of the more fortunate, then participants no longer face a fairness problem. For those who can afford it, for example, what would be ethically suspect about mounting a mirror image of the “Special Olympics” for athletes with disabilities: a “Super Olympics”, featuring athletes universally equipped with the latest modifications and enhancements? (Munthe 2000)

For answers to that challenge, the critics of biomedical enhancement need to dig beyond concerns about the fair governance of sports to a deeper and broader sense of “cheating”, in terms of the corrosive effects of enhancement on the integrity of admirable human practices (Loland 2002; Schermer 2008a). On this view, to the extent that biomedical shortcuts allow specific accomplishments to be divorced from the admirable practices they were designed to reflect, the social value of those accomplishments will be undermined. If one’s good grades are gained by drug fueled “cramming” rather than disciplined study, their value as evidence of learning diminish. This means that for institutions interested in continuing to foster the social values for which they have traditionally been the guardians, choices will have to be made. Either they must redesign their sports to find new ways to evaluate excellence in the admirable practices that are not affected by available enhancements, or they must prohibit the use of the enhancing shortcuts. However, knowing which way to go suggests that one has a theory of the social practice at risk and of the values that animate it. The case of sport again leads the way down this path in the literature, perhaps because, unlike most important social practices that might be susceptible to enhancement shortcuts (like child-rearing, education, love, politics, and spiritual growth), the stakes are low enough to allow for some deliberate policymaking at the international level.

For example, one prominent theory that has influenced the work of The World Anti-Doping Association (WADA), the international organization committed to policing performance enhancement in elite sport, is the view that “just as healing is the point or goal or end of surgery, so the virtuous perfection of natural talents is the point or goal or end of sport” (Murray 2009). This statement has several important features for the enhancement debate. Sport is concerned with celebrating differences in natural talents and the virtues that can be displayed in attempts to differentiate one’s own talents even further. The virtues that sport celebrates are socially admirable habits and traits in and of themselves, and their promotion is what gives sport social value as a practice. However, within the practice, the virtues are instrumental (as either side-constraints or facilitators) to the perfection of the athlete’s natural talents—i.e., to their differentiation from other people’s talents. Although the key role of hierarchical ranking in sport is often ignored in the rhetoric of sports organizations, philosophers of sport acknowledge that fixation with hierarchical ranking—with competition, contest, score-keeping, record-breaking, championship, victory and defeat—is pervasive in the everyday practice of sport (Coakley 1998) and that “comparing and ranking two or more competitors…defines sports characteristic social structure” (Loland 2002, 10). Sport exemplifies a system of values, virtues, and practices explicitly designed to rank people hierarchically based on their naturally inherited and virtuously perfected traits, celebrating the best specimens as champions. What is unfair about biomedical enhancement, on this view, is that enhancements undermine the traditional role of sport, and its ideals of virtue and personal effort: enhancements obscure the distinction between to distinguish individuals who naturally inherited their talents from their progenitors from those who artificially acquired them from their physicians (Sandel 2004).

But this outcome seems to display the very problem that the fairness critique of enhancement was meant to combat: the danger of fomenting distributive injustice by creating social hierarchies of advantage on arbitrary grounds (Tännsjö 2000; Tännsjö 2005). On the one hand, of the many ways humans use inherited traits to create interpersonal hierarchies, athletic competition is amongst the most benign. When it is “just a game”, comparative interpersonal ranking in terms of genetic identity in sports is a welcome substitute for blood feuds, racism, and genocide. But when sport becomes a matter of national pride and a source of economic opportunity, athletic losers risk more than simply admiration and social status: like insurance applicants with genetic susceptibilities, less naturally talented athletes risk access to important social benefits and potential life plans. In this regard, the challenge that performance enhancement poses to sport is its indictment of the accepted social practice itself rather than its threat to undermine it. The availability of biomedical abilities to undermine competition simply raises the question: are there ways to enjoy, appreciate and even show off our bodies and abilities without requiring someone else to lose social standing on genetic grounds?

Enhancements might reveal inherent injustices within traditional hierarchies in sports, rather than merely create unfair advantages that reward inherited genetic traits and penalize athletes who, through no fault of their own, lack them. In this way, enhancements could promote fairness in sports rather than diminish it. We will examine below whether fairness arguments have a similar impact in discussions of enhancement within the domain of other social practices, such as parenting, education, or military service.

4. Should We Pursue Moral Enhancements?

4.1 What are Moral Enhancements?

When discussing the notion of moral enhancement, two salient questions arise: (1) What does ‘moral’ refer to in this context? and (2) How do we distinguish moral enhancement from other types of enhancement? (Moseley 2025) Regarding the first question, it is crucial to distinguish moral enhancements from technologically induced improvements in mood, emotion, cognition, creativity, or imagination, even though such capacities are usually involved in moral improvement.

Mark Rowlands argues that most discussions of moral enhancement fail to address these preliminary questions and contends that a substantive conception of morality is necessary to develop an intelligible and consistent account of moral improvement (Rowlands 2018). To determine whether our moral capacities are improved by enhancing certain human abilities, we must first clarify what constitutes a moral improvement. For example, a Kantian might understand moral enhancement as strengthening our capacity to evaluate motives and act from the maxim of the categorical imperative. An Aristotelian virtue theorist would emphasize improving capacities that foster practical wisdom. A Humean sentimentalist might contend that moral improvements involve strengthening capacities for empathy or sympathy. (Rowlands 2018) These examples simplify the complexity of each metaphysical theory, but they show the difficulty of assuming a single, straightforward sense of “moral improvement” (Moseley 2025).

These rival philosophical stances also complicate the notion of a common moral baseline, i.e., a standard of normal human moral functioning from which any improvement above that threshold would count as an enhancement. The Kantian, Aristotelian, and Humean accounts diverge on this point. Rowlands offers a sketch of how each framework might be used to specify what counts as a moral enhancement. (2018)

An alternative strategy for avoiding definitional complexity is to examine particular cases that clearly involve the relevant moral issues. Douglas (2008), for instance, examines biomedical interventions that target specific moral failings, such as strong aversions to certain racial groups or impulsive aggression. These cases sharply raise the ethical question: is it morally permissible, or even obligatory, to use biomedical interventions (e.g., psychopharmacology, psychedelic drugs, non-invasive neuromodulation, electroconvulsive therapy, deep brain stimulation) to make someone less racist or less prone to violent acts?

4.2 Are We Unfit for the Future?

Interest in moral enhancement has surged over the past decade. Much of this attention to the topic is in direct response to the influential work of Igmar Persson and Julian Savulescu (2012), who argue that the survival of our species depends on the urgent development and widespread adoption of moral enhancement technologies. They argue that global collective-action problems cannot be solved by traditional means or by cognitive enhancement alone. Worried that an unregulated expansion of cognitive enhancements might amplify injustice and social harm, they argue that widespread access to cognitive enhancement should be preceded, or accompanied, by enhancement of our moral faculties. Improved moral discernment and reasoning, keener senses of empathy and fairness, and deeper sense of solidarity, they contend, would help mitigate the potential social harms by ensuring that the users of enhancement technologies are equipped to do so responsibly (Tennison 2012; Persson and Savulescu 2012). They further argue that moral enhancements will be required to establish enough cooperation among societies to solve the problems of war, overpopulation, climate change, pandemics, and other global crises that may drive human beings into extinction. On broadly welfarist/utilitarian grounds, they contend that there is a moral duty to develop and deploy moral enhancement technologies to preserve human life on Earth.

Critics argue that achieving the moral upgrades in the manner suggested by Persson and Savulescu would require intrusive and draconian social mechanisms: the very kinds of social control that these moral enhancements were intended to render unnecessary (Sparrow 2014b; Harris 2016; Azevedo 2016). Others question the criteria by which moral upgrades would be defined or measured (Joyce 2013; Craigie 2014; Wiseman 2016; Hauskeller and Coyne 2018; Johnson, Bishop and Toner 2019; Paulo and Bublitz 2019). Would the morally enhanced still be permitted to regard certain actions as supererogatory rather than obligatory, or would more be expected of them? We need not aspire to require superhuman virtues, such as angels might possess, but should the morally enhanced at least be regarded as saints? If so, by whose conception of sainthood? Once again, a panorama of alternative philosophical traditions opens for exploration down this road, offering no quick resolution for policy.

It is also worth remembering that specific biomedical enhancements will never yield comprehensive improvements in moral character, if only because moral character is not reducible to the biological substrates of brains and genes. At best, moral enhancement can modify specific biological functions in ways that increase the chances that acting in one manner (e.g. telling the truth) while decreasing the chances of acting in another (like lying) which in certain contexts may actually be the more virtuous thing to do. This double-edged feature of biomedical enhancement means that every morally enhancing intervention risks being, at the same time, a morally disabling one.

This observation suggests that, despite the claims of its defenders, biomedical enhancement is not always well suited to a melioristic ethic aimed at improving human welfare. Often a step forward for some purposes is also a step back in other contexts. Many enhanced people are, in corresponding ways, disabled – and the same may hold for their teams, families, or communities. For example, an enhancement that accelerates reflexes might benefit military pilots in combat but significantly increase the risk of errors among commercial airline pilots. This illustrates how enhancements involve context-dependent trade-offs that are beneficial in one situation yet harmful or unfair in others. If we focus our policies on recognizing that most enhancements come with trade-offs, we might be able to orient our public policy away from abstract regulatory or compensatory models of “enhancement” and toward a focus on the specific social and institutional contexts in which particular interventions might prove too risky or unjust.

5. Do Enhancements Undermine Authenticity?

Critics of biomedical enhancements often express concerns about enhancements undermining authenticity. These concerns often express the fear that enhancements could deprive persons of characteristics essential to their sense of self – such as endurance, determination, growth, faith, or luck – by substituting “hollow victories” for authentic achievements. Critics argue that this loss of authenticity diminishes personal character (Sandel 2007), alienates humans from themselves and their communities (Agar 2013), and weakens bonds of solidarity with those who choose not to enhance themselves (Sparrow 2014). To translate these intuitive concerns into more rigorous philosophical arguments, we must attend carefully to the particular contexts in which the enhancements occur. For instance, the authenticity concerns that arise when parents choose to enhance their children differ markedly from those that emerge when adults choose to enhance themselves. Likewise, therapeutic uses of the same technologies may invite different authenticity considerations. (Elliott 2011). In this section, we identify several central arguments within this broader literature.

5.1 Authentic Achievements

One influential line of argument claims that biomedical enhancements undermine authenticity because individuals cannot rightly claim personal credit for accomplishments produced through such interventions. According to this view, the biomedical interventions that caused improvements in our capacities would supersede our own agency in authoring the achievement (Kass 2003; Sandel 2007). Defenders of this perspective argue that, whereas education, training, and practice proceed through “speech and deeds” that are comprehensible by those who are learning a new skill, biomedical enhancements exert their effects on a subject who “is not merely passive but who plays no role at all. In addition, he can at best feel their effects without understanding their meaning in human terms” (Kass 2003).

One common reply to this argument is that when someone freely choses to use an enhancement on the basis of reflection and deliberation, by means of the “speech and deeds” that guide ordinary self-improvement, it is unclear why the enhancement should be considered passive or inauthentic (Kamm 2005). As Joshua May observes, “mind-altering drugs have likely proliferated throughout human cultures because they promote meaningful and authentic improvements in creativity, bonding, collaboration and group solidarity” (May 2023). Moreover, just as we hold those with enhanced abilities to higher standards of responsibility for negligence and harm (Mehlman 2003), our expectations for enhanced achievements may be correspondingly high (Carter and Pritchard 2019). In both cases, however, the enhanced agent’s authorship of their achievements and agency in self-improvement remain intact (Cole-Turner 1998).

Critics of biomedical enhancements that appeal to considerations of authenticity often acknowledge that enhanced individuals do author their accomplishments, but they question whether those successes carry the same value as “authentic”, unenhanced achievements (Habermas 2003; Sandel 2007; Bublitz and Merkel 2009). They argue that when a marathon runner gains endurance chemically rather than through training, or when a mystic attains Nirvana through psychedelic therapy rather than meditation, each misses something essential to the value of the accomplishment. As Schermer (2008a) and Spitzley (2018) note, the outcomes of such activities cannot be separated from the activities themselves: their values lie in the processes they reward as much as in the results they yield. For discussion of three “easy shortcut” arguments of this kind, see Schermer 20008a and Moseley and Murray 2023 for critical evaluation.

Even if these criticisms show that unenhanced achievements are valuable for reasons that are not shared by enhanced ones, they do not establish that the unenhanced route is, overall, superior. They merely establish that the two forms of achievement are valued differently. Enhanced achievements may have their own distinctive worth. Historically, the character-building struggles we admire seem adept at keeping pace with our tools. From this perspective, biomedical enhancements may serve as important new tools for self-creation that we should consider embracing (DeGrazia 2000; Agar 2004). For a detailed philosophical study of the nature and value of achievement, see Bradford (2015).

5.2 Being True to Oneself

In addition to these types of authenticity concerns, critics of human enhancement argue that biomedical enhancements can, and often do, threaten the authenticity or identity of individuals. Do enhancements undermine the authentic self-authorship or personal identity? Authenticity is widely understood to be a matter of being “true to oneself.” Yet many contributors to these debates neglect to clarify their assumptions about the nature of the self and what it takes to be true to it – or to author oneself. As Lionel Trilling (1971), Charles Taylor (2991) and Charles Guignon (2004) have observed, it is no simple task to characterize the self to which authentic individuals are true.

These questions raise two broad categories of philosophical problems typically classified as philosophical questions about personal identity: metaphysical and practical problems (Schechtman 2007). Metaphysical problems concern the criteria for being a person either at a given time (synchronic identification questions) or over time (diachronic identification questions). In contrast with metaphysical questions about what it is to be a person, the practical problems of personal identity that are primarily concerned with who a person is (Schechtman 2007; Moseley 2012). The practical questions of personal identity often emerge from the first-person perspective, when one seriously asks, “Who am I?”, and tend to surface in times of reflection on one’s deepest commitments. This type of reflection is often not an exercise in philosophy: more often, it is an attempt to understand one’s own character and core commitments (Korsgaard 1996). The decisions and choices that result from this kind of reflection are essential to the processes of self-discovery and self-creation.

This form of self-discovery is a creative and ongoing process of reflecting on our moral experience and sharpening and re-valuating our commitments. The concept of self-creation may seem paradoxical or incoherent if it is understood as a metaphysical explanation of one’s relation to oneself. How can a person create, author, or constitute themselves unless there is a self that already exists to do the creating? The paradox is resolved if we understand ‘self’ in this context as referring to one’s practical identity (Korsgaard 1996; 2008). A practical identify is “a description under which you value yourself, a description under which you find your life to be worth living and your actions to be worth undertaking.” (Korsgaard 1996) This conception of personal identity is agnostic about the metaphysics of personhood: it can apply equally to an immaterial soul or to a hard deterministic vision of the activity of the human brain.

Practical identities are both discovered and created by individuals. Do biomedical enhancements undermine one’s capacity to forge a practical identity? One would need to look at each specific enhancement technology to determine whether it would undermine that capacity. For instance, if a “pro-social enhancement” were to make someone more conformist, unreflective, or susceptible to manipulation by advertising or political propaganda, it would clearly compromise authenticity. Authentic persons usually reflectively affirm their practical identities, their relationships to others, and to the world that they inhabit (Moseley 2012). Enhancements that diminish or eliminate those capacities would thereby undermine authenticity. These considerations intersect with our earlier discussion of moral enhancements in Section 4.2.

Given the complexity of these debates, and the frequent conflation of metaphysical and practical questions about personal identity and self-creation, it is no surprise that little consensus exists regarding whether enhancements undermine authenticity of the self. It is also worth noting that some participants in these debates have moved away from framing these issues as debates about personal identity, since that terminology presupposes that we are essentially persons. Animalists, who hold that we are fundamentally biological organisms (Homo sapiens), reject that assumption. For those sympathetic to the Animalist perspective, the arguments about moral standing and status discussed in Section 6.2 offer an alternative framework for addressing central ethical issues about the self in the enhancement literature.

6. Are Enhancements Dehumanizing?

6.1 Enhancement Threats to Human Nature

In the background of the debates over the boundaries of medicine and the ethics of self-improvement is a set of philosophical concerns about what new biomedical enhancement technologies imply for our shared understanding of human nature and the future of our species. Critics often invoke “dystopian nightmares,” and worry that enhancement interventions may rob us of central normative features of our identity as human beings (Mehlman 2012). Francis Fukuyama influentially argues that biomedical, especially genetic, enhancements threaten our very humanity (Fukuyama 2002). Other bioconservative critics, such as George Annas, go further and argue that the use of genetic enhancements would be a crime against humanity and demand the creation of a “human species protection treaty.” (Annas 2005) They also contend that by taking human evolution into our own hands and directing it towards the emergence of a new species, we risk altering “the essence of humanity itself” and thereby changing “the foundation of human rights.” (Annas, et al. 2002)

These concerns are supported by the language in the Universal Declaration of Human Rights, which recognizes the inherent dignity and “equal and inalienable rights of all members of the human family” as the basis for “freedom, justice and peace in the world” (United Nations General Assembly 1948). These authors fear that genetic enhancement is likely to lead to the emergence of post-humans who are more powerful than us and might perpetrate crimes against humanity, such as enslavement or genocide. Others, such as Habermas (2003), argue that the “ethical self-understanding of the species” is jeopardized by genetic selection or editing practices that parents might use in conceiving and raising their children. These bioconservative arguments focus on the concerns that enhancements will threaten moral equality, human dignity, and human rights.

By contrast, enhancement enthusiasts, often described as transhumanists, welcome the possibility that biomedical interventions might transform human nature for the better. Some even look forward to the emergence of trans-humans or post-persons as the next step in intentionally directed human evolution (Hughes 2004; Harris 2007; Savulescu 2009). At stake in these debates is whether, or how much, normative weight to assign to features of human nature that have traditionally been taken as given (e.g., the families into which we are born and our natural talents and abilities) or inevitable (such as, pain and ageing), and whether those features of human nature place morally significant limits on enhancement.

Moral philosophy has a long history of making normative appeals to human nature. Stevenson, et al. (2017) survey thirteen influential accounts of human nature across Eastern and Western intellectual traditions. There are thorny philosophical issues about whether such appeals are ever legitimate. Ever since David Hume warned us to not derive an “ought” from an “is”, moral philosophers have been skeptical of making strong inferences about what ought to be done directly from empirical claims about human nature. However, virtue ethicists have been more comfortable with adopting an empirical and naturalistic approach to human nature as the basis for understanding what constitutes human well-being and flourishing (Hursthouse 1999, Foot 2001). Explaining what is worth cherishing about being human is an intuitive starting point for making sense of ourselves, our relationships with other human beings, and our place in the world. The task of getting clear about what we do and should value about being human has important implications for the ethics of human enhancements.

Defenders of bioconservatism often emphasize three features of human nature as especially worth preserving. The first feature is human vulnerability. According to one prominent bioconservative view, human beings are creatures that suffer, age and die, and our struggle to deal with this vulnerability is a central aspect of what makes human life valuable (Parens 1995, Habermas 2003). Within this camp, several subgroups can be distinguished. “Life cycle traditionalists” criticize ambitions to control the human ageing process or extend the human life span (Callahan 1995). “Personalists” valorize the ways in which human limitations are humbling and encourage modesty (Fitzgerald 2008). “Psychopharmaceutical Calvinists” caution against quick pharmacological fixes for melancholy or sadness (Elliot 1998). They warn that “easy shortcuts” corrode character, diminish the inherent value of suffering, and diminish the complexity and richness of human practices (Shermer 2008a; Moseley and Murray 2023). The second (set of) cherished features are embodiment and species membership. Species preservationists and environmentalists emphasize our biological embeddedness in nature and our place within a particular evolutionary lineage. They contend that enhancements that blur or bend “species boundaries” by attempting to direct evolution endanger the integrity of both humanity and its ecological relations. (McKibben 2004). The third feature is sociality. Human beings are inherently social creatures that relate to one another through a complex nexus of interpersonal relationships, commitments, and hierarchical structures (Liao 2006a; Liao 2006b).

Critics of bioconservatism argue that efforts to protect these cherished human traits by trying to insulate human nature from enhancement interventions are flawed in several ways. First, there is little reason to believe that enhanced humans would lose their senses of vulnerability, embodiment, connection with nature, or sociality. These traits may manifest differently among post-humans, just as they have evolved across human history. Indeed, transhumanists argue, there are no static features of the human condition: human vulnerabilities to our environment have steadily decreased over history, our moral kinship communities have expanded, and our tolerance for oppressive forms of social organization has dwindled (Savulescu 2009). Accordingly, appeals to “human nature” in abstraction offer limited guidance in deciding which vulnerabilities to preserve, which loyalties to honor and respect, and which social structures to defend and develop. Where a biomedical intervention alters one of these dimensions of human nature, it signals that the moral stakes are high. But those stakes are not always about what might be lost from the human experience, but also what may be preserved or perpetuated.

Second, even if preserving human nature in its current form were desirable, banning enhancements cannot achieve this goal. As Juengst observes, “species are not static collections of organisms that can be ‘preserved’ against change like a can of fruit; they wax and wane with every birth and death and their genetic complexions shift across time and space” (Juengst 2017). In our case, almost everything we do influences this evolutionary process. To argue that everyone has the right to inherit an “untampered genome” only makes sense if one were to take a snapshot of the human gene pool at a given instant and reify it as the sacred “genetic patrimony of humankind”—an approach that some critics nearly adopt. (Juengst 2009)

6.2 Moral Standing and Moral Status

As noted in Section 1.1, there is a persistent risk in enhancement debates of conflating the biological and ethical senses of the term ‘human’. In this debate, the risks are even greater, given that the dispute rests on how to best understand being human. In the biological sense, ‘human’ refers to members of the species Homo sapiens; to be human in this sense is to be a member of that species. In the evaluative sense or moral sense, ‘human’ refers to being a member of the moral community and having the accompanying moral rights that are owed to members of that community. Buchanan (2013) discusses these conceptual issues as part of an in-depth examination of the moral foundations of the international legal human rights system (Buchanan 2013).

One type of general objection to this debate, often from post-modernist quarters, is that discussing human nature at all is an intellectual faux pas, and that we are beyond this sort of “essentializing” discussion (DeGrazia 2012). This objection is weak. Even if there are no essential human properties, we can still articulate a conception of human nature that identifies characteristics most human beings share that are recalcitrant to being removed or are significantly altered by education, training, or indoctrination, and that play significant explanatory roles in both widespread human behavior and differences between humans and other animals (Buchanan 2011, DeGrazia 2012).

It is also crucial to distinguish two possibilities that often become conflated in these debates: (1) the emergence of new traits that are the outcomes of genetic interventions that could produce a new biological species, and (2) the emergence of individuals who would constitute a new and superior kind of moral agent. The former would be Homo maximus, whose qualitative difference from Homo sapiens is vast (Degrazia 2012, 82). The latter would yield post-persons – beings with higher moral status than current moral agents. Buchanan (2011) and DeGrazia (2012) provide careful treatments of these distinctions and their implications.

In the context of debates about transhumanism, it is useful to distinguish between moral standing and moral status, following Alan Buchanan’s influential framework (Buchanan 2011; 2013). Individuals who have moral standing count morally in their own right. For example, on hedonistic utilitarian grounds, sentient beings have moral standing because they can experience pleasure and pain; for Kantians, moral standing is conferred by the capacity for practical reason. Whereas moral standing is a non-comparative notion, moral status is comparative. It concerns the degree to which individuals’ interests matter morally. Thus, both chickens and humans possess moral standing as sentient creatures, but humans have higher moral status because they possess greater capacities for experiencing pleasure and pain and agency.

We typically assume that human beings occupy the highest moral status among earthly creatures. The possible emergence of post-humans or post-persons could challenge our position in the hierarchy of moral status. If post-humans have a higher moral status than current human beings while retaining the same moral standing, what moral objections, if any, could we raise? (Here it may be helpful to return to the discussion of moral enhancement in Section 4.) The more troubling possibility is that post-persons might have higher moral standing than we do, thereby violating the widely held moral equality assumption: the view that all moral agents share equal moral status.

Some transhumanists, such as James Hughes (2004), argue that we should adopt a more optimistic and inclusive stance towards recognizing the political and moral rights of cyborgs and post-humans in future liberal democracies. Critics acknowledge that post-humans might rightfully claim the same natural rights as current humans by virtue of their capacities but argue that creating post-humans would undermine the link between being human and human rights, much as the discovery of rational extraterrestrials might. This shift could have the effect of potentially disenfranchising some existing humans, such as infants or persons with severe neurological disabilities, who cannot demonstrate the functional capacities associated with moral agency.

At the same time, if the post-humans actually have enhanced cognitive and moral capacities, they might claim expanded rights proportional to those capacities, thereby entitling them to a broader range of opportunities and freedoms than ordinary humans. This prospect risks creating the very kinds of oppressive hierarchical societies that the human rights tradition was designed to prevent, potentially paving the way for new forms of coercive eugenics and even the eventual extinction of the human species (Mehlman 2012; DeGrazia 2012).

Susan Levin (2021) offers perhaps the most systematic analysis and trenchant critique of transhumanism in the literature to date. She challenges its core assumptions about the nature of the mind and brain, its utilitarian commitments, its conception of liberal democracy, and its rather crude scientism. Drawing on scientific and philosophical arguments to make her case, she contends that we should not devote our limited scientific and technological resources to the enhancement project, which, she contends, is based on outdated and empirically unsupported assumptions about cognitive psychology, biology, and neuroscience.

6.3 Revisiting Eugenics

Just as it is metaphysically impossible to preserve our species from further evolution, it is likewise impossible to control that process “from the inside out.” The genetic constitution of our species is continually shaped by environmental forces of selection that lie beyond human abilities to control or even, as the phenomenon of emerging epidemics continues to illustrate, anticipate. Moreover, as disability-studies scholars observe, humanity is in no better position today to decide which human traits deserve promotion than it was during the heyday of the eugenics movement, even if society were willing to tolerate the reproductive policies required to manage even the human portion of evolutionary change (De Melo-Martin 2023).

The unsettling resemblance between the aspirations of early eugenicists and certain proposals advanced by contemporary transhumanists, unfortunately, provides some evidence to support this claim (Sparrow 2011, Levin 2021). Such proposals often assume that some genotypes represent “jewels in the genome” (Sikela 2006) while others constitute costly “toxic waste” to be cleansed from the gene pool (Buchanan, Brock, Wikler, and Daniels 2000). Critics argue that this way of thinking reduces persons to their genotypes and undermines our commitment to moral equality amid biological diversity (Asch and Block 2011).

However difficult these arguments may be to reconstruct, it is important to take seriously the concern that certain biomedical interventions may violate human nature, even in public discussions of policy within a pluralistic society. Whether the concern involves the alteration of a constant of the human condition, like senescence; a “species altering” threat to our collective gene pool; or the corruption of practices designed to celebrate the inherited human traits we value most, these appeals all signal that the intervention in question has deep implications for who we want to become in light of who we have been.

Respecting what we have, or have not, inherited from our parents does not, in itself, meet the need to decide which promises we want to make to our children. Invocations of particular vulnerabilities, loyalties, or forms of sociality drawn from the past can provide fodder for positive visions of human nature to guide those promises. Yet in communities that recognize a pluralism of such visions, these appeals should also prompt another policy-making response: the obligation to protect the interests of those excluded from prevailing ideals, even while we debate their merits.

The natural human gene pool has no top, bottom, edge, or direction: it cannot be “used up”, “diverted”, “purified” or “polluted”. The reservoir of human mutual respect, good will and tolerance for difference, however, seems perennially in danger of running dry. Those who emphasize the fragility of human nature and its need for protection should remember that not every aspect of our nature is admirable or worth preserving.

7. Conclusion: Military Enhancements

We shall conclude with a brief case study that illustrates many of the ethical considerations discussed throughout this entry. Although we have differentiated various conceptual and ethical issues raised by enhancement, in practice these considerations are entangled to varying degrees. Reflecting on whether military forces should use enhancement technologies to achieve their goals engages with multiple dimensions of the debate, including the treatment/enhancement distinction, questions of fairness, moral enhancement, authenticity, and dehumanization.

7.1 The Context of Military Enhancements

In recent years, the ethics of enhancement in military contexts has attracted growing attention. Popular fascination with the topic of super-soldiers is hardly new – dating back at least half a century to Captain America comics, which themselves have inspired philosophical reflection on virtue ethics and character (White 2014). Outside of the lessons learned from pulp science fiction, there is a longstanding history of military attempts to biologically enhance soldiers’ combat effectiveness and chances of survival. The history of warfare itself can be viewed as a history of enhancing soldiers (Puscas 2020).

Throughout this section, we use the terms ‘soldier’, ‘warfighter’ and ‘military service-member’ interchangeably, much to the chagrin of those who use these terms more precisely within military institutions. In the United States, for example, the term ‘soldier’ refers specifically to members of the Army, whereas in Europe it refers to all military personnel. Here, we are deploying these terms in a broad and inclusive sense.

Historical examples reveal the enduring tension between moral efficacy and moral restraint. Legend has it that Celtic warriors eschewed body armor (and sometimes even clothing!) in battle, thinking that it diminished the glory of a true victory. By contrast, medieval knights wore full suits of armor that emboldened them to charge into combat. Indigenous peoples of the Orinoco basin (in present-day Brazil and Venezuela) fought under the influence of hallucinogenic drugs that played both ritual and psychological roles in combat, enhancing courage and aggression (Puscas 2020). In modern times, pharmacological enhancement has been common: methamphetamine use was widespread during World War II, and as many as 70 percent of U.S. soldiers in Vietnam reportedly used psychostimulants to boost endurance, strength, and combat fatigue (Puscas 2020). Advances in vaccination and battlefield medicine have also served to enhance soldiers’ resilience and survival (Eagan 2020).

Contemporary and near-future military enhancement efforts, however, are more invasive than earlier technological or pharmacological methods. The United States Defense Advanced Research Projects Agency (DARPA) has been explicit about its interest in using biomedical technologies to augment soldiers’ physical and cognitive capacities. In a 2016 press release, DARPA announced a program on “Boosting Synaptic Plasticity to Accelerate Learning,” noting that “unlike many of DARPA’s previous neuroscience and neurotechnology endeavors, it will aim not just to restore lost function but to advance capabilities beyond normal levels.” (DARPA, 2016, our italics). Similarly, in 2017 DARPA invested $100 million in gene-editing research with the hope of enabling soldiers to “run at super-human speeds, carry enormous weight, live off their fat stores, and go without sleep.” (Eagan 2020)

These types of genetic and neurological enhancements, rather than robotic or drone technologies, are the subject of this discussion. While autonomous systems raise their own pressing ethical questions, we focus here on bodily enhancements of human soldiers, or what we shall call military enhancements.

7.2 The Ethics of Military Enhancements

Military personnel operate within hierarchical institutions in which individual autonomy and genuinely informed consent are constrained. Soldiers often face institutional, social, or economic pressures to accept enhancement interventions, effectively diminishing their voluntary consent (Mehlman, et al. 2013). Autonomy is further limited in contexts where refusal of an enhancement risks career setbacks or loss of operational status (Lin, et al. 2013; Pfaff 2019). Beyond explicit coercion, service members are embedded in a military ethos that valorizes strength, sacrifice, and peak performance, making it difficult to refuse enhancement even when participation appears voluntary. Voluntary consent in these contexts is limited not only by rank and command but also by internalized values and socialized expectations to be the best warrior possible (Eagan 2020). This pressure can be especially intense within elite units, where refusal of a biomedical enhancement may be perceived as a lack of commitment or even as a liability to the team. These dynamics contribute to the emergence of a “performance caste” within the ranks (Chneiweiss 2012). Moreover, the military’s cultural framing of the body as “government-issued”, reflected both in lore and in disciplinary actions such as treating sunburn as the “destruction of government property”, further undermines bodily autonomy and complicates ethical assessments of consent. Even in the absence of overt coercion, the structural, cultural, and psychological dimensions of military life render true informed consent highly suspect in enhancement contexts.

Military enhancements also pose risks and side effects that may occur during active service or long after discharge. Commonly used cognitive enhancements, e.g., modafinil or psychostimulants, can impair judgment, impulse control, and long-term psychological health (Lin, et al. 2012) The neurological enhancements suggested by DARPA may pose unknown and potentially irreversible harms on soldiers. These concerns support arguments that military institutions have a duty of care to protect soldiers from foreseeable biomedical risks (Moreno 2012).

Military enhancements raise special concerns about fairness, both within and between military forces. These concerns may arise between enhanced and unenhanced soldiers within the same military institutions or between military institutions, e.g., between one nation that has enhanced soldiers and another nation that does not. Within a single military organization, unequal access to enhancement technologies may create unjust advantages for enhanced personnel (Lin, et al. 2013). Enhanced soldiers might also face greater operational demands, such as increased deployment tempo, leading to higher rates of trauma and fatigue. Additional fairness issues arise from prospective genetic screening in recruitment, which could exclude individuals based on perceived disadvantage, reinforcing inequalities of “the genetic lottery” (Lázaro-Muñoz, G., and E. Juengst, 2015). Beyond the service period, enhanced soldiers may face unique challenges reintegrating into civilian life. While non-enhanced veterans already confront difficulties transitioning to civilian society (Shay 2011), reintegration may be especially complex for those who are genetically, neurologically or robotically enhanced (Eagan 2022; Eagan and Moseley 2025). Traditionally, soldiers are standardly required to return their government-issued firearms and gear upon discharge. How could they, and should they, return their enhanced brains or robotic limbs? The question of post-service ownership raises new concerns about bodily integrity, medical autonomy, and the potential for the continued state authority over persons’ bodies. If military institutions retain control over enhancements, dis-enhancement may be required at discharge: a practice that may inflict medical and psychological harm.

Military enhancements, especially pharmacological ones, also present dual-use risks, which raise broader ethical concerns about unintended outcomes on civilians. Technologies developed for combat applications could be adapted by non-military forces for coercive purposes, e.g., interrogation (Moreno 2012). On an international scale, the deployment of enhanced soldiers by one nation could trigger an enhancement arms race, destabilizing norms governing permissible warfare (DCDC, 2020; Mehlman, et al. 2013).

Military enhancements that alter cognition or emotion could disrupt the moral responsibility of soldiers who make decisions in combat. Cognitive enhancements can alter judgment and decision-making capacity, which may complicate attributions of moral responsibility in warfare (Levy 2007). Intuitively, we are aware that people who stay awake too long have diminished decision-making capacity. Soldiers who have been enhanced to stay awake for vastly longer than normal periods may thereby experience impaired decision-making capacities. As Wolfendale (2008) argues, military personnel need to be morally responsible agents and moral responsibility is necessary for integrity and the moral emotions of guilt and remorse, which are central to moral growth and psychological well-being. She contends that military enhancements that diminish soldiers’ capacity to experience these emotions would undermine the moral standing of the military and harm the well-being of warfighters. Relatedly, military enhancements that alter mood, memory, or empathy raise concerns about their impact on personal identity, personality and authenticity. Some argue that heavily enhanced soldiers may no longer be the same persons after receiving the enhancements (Moreno 2012), or that the enhancements may lead soldiers to doubt whether their achievements and actions are genuinely their own (Mehlman, et al. 2013). Addressing such questions requires greater conceptual precision in distinguishing among philosophical notions of identity, selfhood, and authenticity, as discussed earlier in this entry.

Finally, like the treatment/enhancement distinction in medicine, military enhancements face a slippery conceptual distinction with important ethical consequences. Traditionally, the Just War theories that undergird military ethics have eschewed the use of disproportionately destructive offensive innovations, from crossbows in the medieval period to carpet bombing and chemical weapons in modern warfare, while generally accepting defensive innovations such as stronger armor and more effective anti-missile systems. How, then, should we assess a project like DARPA’s PREPARE (PRemptive Expression of Protective Alleles and Response Elements) [Other Internet Resources], which seeks to develop gene-editing interventions to confer soldiers with resistance to radiation and chemical agents beyond the normal human range? These innovations would be enhancements by most criteria and raise many of the moral and philosophical issues surveyed throughout this entry.

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Acknowledgments

We would like to thank Allen Buchanan, Jennifer Hawkins, Jonathan Shear, Robert Sparrow, and Michael Tennison for helpful suggestions, and Warren Whipple for valuable research assistance on the original entry. For the most recent revision, we would like to thank Sheena Eagan, Joshua May and Katrina Sifferd for valuable suggestions.

Copyright © 2025 by
Daniel Moseley <moseleyd24@ecu.edu>
Eric Juengst

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