AI and Its Varieties From an Epistemological Perspective

According to a canonical textbook definition, AI research aims to build systems that can think or act either like humans or in an ideally rational way (Russell & Norvig 2016). Today, as we face systems that seem intelligent in one way or another, the term “AI” is often used as a catchall for systems developed in the field. In the present entry, “AI” is used in this way. Specific systems that display seemingly intelligent behavior, both algorithms and robots, are called “AI systems,” “AI tools,” or “AI models.” Whether the systems really think remains controversial and is not relevant for most epistemological questions (see, e.g., Bringsjord & Govindarajulu 2026, §8 for a discussion).

The 20^th century has seen two main paradigms for building AI (e.g., Boden 2016; Bringsjord and Govindarajulu 2026). The older one, often called “symbolic” or “good old-fashioned AI” (GOFAI), is based on the idea that thinking is the manipulation of symbols according to rules, as in arithmetic or logical calculus (Haugeland 1985, 112–116). For instance, Weizenbaum’s (1966) famous program ELIZA processes natural language using fixed rules. Current computer simulations (see, e.g., Winsberg & Alvarado 2026) also follow this paradigm: scientists construct algorithms that evaluate (approximate) solutions to equations that, in turn, model the Earth’s atmosphere, for example. GOFAI was heavily criticized because human behavior seems to escape description using simple rules (Dreyfus 1972 and 1992).

In the other, “connectionist” or “subsymbolic” approach, neurons, their mutual connections, and the dynamics of neuron activations are modeled using so-called artificial neural networks (ANNs; see, e.g., Nielsen 2015 for a technical introduction; see Buckner 2019 for a philosophical introduction). A paradigmatic network model has an input and an output layer of nodes (artificial neurons) and several intermediate layers, with the number of intermediate layers defining the network’s depth. Deep neural networks (DNNs) are, accordingly, networks with a comparatively large number of layers. After the input neurons have been fed with data (e.g., a pixelized image), the information contained in the data (i.e., the colors in the pixels) is further processed: the nodes of each layer are activated (set at numerical values) based on the activation of nodes from the previous layer, following so-called activation functions and weights. The activation of nodes in the final layer is then interpreted, for example, as the classification of the input. Today, more complicated networks and architectures are used. Furthermore, DNNs can be trained to produce text or images (related models are called generative AI models).

To a large extent, the behavior of neurons in ANNs is not programmed by humans but instead acquired from data using “machine learning” (ML), a technique that can also be used for GOFAI. One popular ML method is supervised learning, in which the algorithm (e.g., describing the dynamics of artificial neurons) is optimized to reproduce the value of a target variable (i.e., the “labels,” typically human classifications). In more technical jargon, losses—i.e., deviations between the output and the value of the target variable—are minimized. By contrast, unsupervised ML identifies patterns (e.g., clusters) in unlabeled training data (see Danks 2014 for a philosophical introduction). In reinforcement learning, a model is permanently revised based on rewards it receives in a changing environment (e.g., Kaelbling et al., 2019).

Over the last few years, the distinction between the symbolic and connectionist paradigms has become less significant, as they can be combined. For instance, modules following different paradigms can be coupled. Additionally, ANNs can be trained so that specific constraints articulated in symbolic language (e.g., energy conservation) are satisfied (e.g., Cuomo et al. 2022). More importantly, ANNs can be trained on linguistic (and thus symbolic) data, an idea that underlies LLMs (large language models). The basic purpose of LLMs is to predict the next few words given a text input. They can achieve this because they encode the statistical distribution of word combinations, as learned from large text corpora. Currently, the most prominent LLMs use so-called transformer models (Vaswani et al. 2017; see also Khan et al. 2022). These models include an encoder and a decoder that map inputs (e.g., words) to vectors in a high-dimensional vector space and back. A so-called self-attention mechanism is used to process sequences of input data (cf. Soydaner 2022). Currently popular chatbots, such as ChatGPT and Claude, are LLMs that have been fine-tuned to mimic the contributions of a human interlocutor in a conversation (see Zhao et al. 2023 [Other Internet Resources] for a recent overview; see Wolfram 2023 for an introduction). Notably, by suitably prompting models or using reinforcement learning, researchers have made LLMs imitate stepwise reasoning (e.g., Wei et al. 2022; Guo et al. 2025 [Other Internet Resources])

When we want to understand how AI contributes to inquiry, it seems useful to abstract from the technicalities and characterize AI applications in terms of high-level epistemic functions, such as classifying items, making predictions, reasoning, detecting objects in images, and generating images, among others. However, such descriptions of AI systems cannot be embedded in a comprehensive classification. There is no agreed general classification of high-level epistemic tasks, although traditional epistemology (e.g., Hume’s epistemology) has attempted to explain cognition using a restricted set of epistemological functions.