Experimental Jurisprudence

Experimental jurisprudence (or “X-Jur”) addresses questions of jurisprudence or legal philosophy by complementing traditional philosophical analysis with empirical methods. Often those methods include survey experiments that examine laypeople’s intuitions about legal-philosophical thought experiments and concepts of legal significance (e.g., causation, intent, reasonableness). Other times, experimental jurisprudence focuses on the cognitive processes underlying legal reasoning. This entry reviews representative work in experimental jurisprudence and discusses major objections and critiques.

• 1. A General Overview
  • 1.1 Situating Experimental Jurisprudence Within Jurisprudence
  • 1.2 Conceptions of Experimental Jurisprudence
• 2. Research in Experimental Jurisprudence
  • 2.1 “General” Experimental Jurisprudence
    • 2.1.1 The Concept of Rule
    • 2.1.2 Coercion
    • 2.1.3 Legal Validity
  • 2.2 “Particular” Experimental Jurisprudence
    • 2.2.1 Criminal Law
      • 2.2.1.1 The Actus Reus and Mens Rea Distinction
      • 2.2.1.2 Punishment
      • 2.2.1.3 Moral Luck
    • 2.2.2 Tort Law
    • 2.2.3 Property Law
    • 2.2.4 Contract Law
    • 2.2.5 Legal Interpretation
    • 2.2.6 Other Areas of Law
  • 2.3 Empirical Methodologies
    • 2.3.1 Psychological Methods
    • 2.3.2 Behavioral Methods
    • 2.3.3 Observational Methods
    • 2.3.4 Neuroscience
    • 2.3.5 Analysis of Naturally Occurring Language
• 3. Critiques of Experimental Jurisprudence
  • 3.1 Domain-General (Methodological) Criticisms
    • 3.1.1 Replicability
    • 3.1.2 Skepticism about Survey Experiments
    • 3.1.3 Over-Reliance on WEIRD Populations
  • 3.2 Domain-Specific Criticisms
    • 3.2.1 X-Jur’s Contribution to Traditional Jurisprudence is Irrelevant or Limited
    • 3.2.2 The Intuitions of Experts, Not Ordinary People, Matter for Jurisprudence
      • 3.2.2.1 Whose Views Matter?
      • 3.2.2.2 How Does Expertise Matter in Jurisprudence?
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. A General Overview

Experimental jurisprudence uses empirical methods—often modeled on the methods of experimental psychology—to study theoretical or philosophical questions about law (see Prochownik 2021; Sommers 2021; Tobia 2022). This includes questions within both general (e.g., about the necessary features of law and law’s relationship to morality) and particular jurisprudence, regarding specific legal concepts: What is the relationship between contract and promise? What justifies criminal punishment? And what does tort law’s standard of reasonable care require? The remainder of Section 1 provides a detailed introduction to the field, situating it in relation to more traditional approaches towards jurisprudence (§1.1) and outlining differing conceptions of it (§1.2).

1.1 Situating Experimental Jurisprudence Within Jurisprudence

This entry assumes a broad conception of “jurisprudence”, which treats it interchangeably with “legal philosophy” or “philosophy of law” (see, e.g., Dickson 2022: 1), to refer to the scholarly investigation of theoretical questions about law. Jurisprudence is often divided into general and particular (or special, or specific) jurisprudence. “General” jurisprudence concerns the nature of law in general (Plunkett & Shapiro 2017: 137), or the fundamental features necessary to, essential to, or associated with law (e.g., Schauer 2015). “Particular” jurisprudence examines philosophical or theoretical questions about specific legal areas (e.g., contract law or criminal law), often in the context of a particular legal jurisdiction (e.g., American) or tradition (e.g., common law). Experimental jurisprudence scholarship engages in both projects (see §2.1 and §2.2, respectively).

To situate experimental jurisprudence within the broader field of jurisprudence, it is useful to consider that both general and particular jurisprudence have traditionally used conceptual analysis, thought experimentation, and appeals to intuition (see Langlinais & Leiter 2016). To cite two prominent examples in general jurisprudence, Raz (1975 [1990]) describes a society of angels as a means of showing that there could be legal systems which are not coercive (see §2.1.1), and Hart (1958) and Fuller (1958) explore the role of text and purpose in legal interpretation by considering hypothetical violations of the text of a “no vehicles in the park” rule (see §2.2.5). Both thought experiments aimed to trigger intuitions that are supposedly shared by a wider audience (see §3.2.2 for discussion of the relevant audience). In particular jurisprudence, there are similar appeals to “our” shared beliefs, concepts, or intuitions. Consider the concept of causation that is at the heart of criminal and tort law. In their foundational work on causation in the law, Hart and Honoré regard “the plain man’s notions of causation” (1959: 1) as relevant to the law. In this spirit, they describe two principles that allegedly characterize causal reasoning among ordinary people (the contrasts drawn between normal and abnormal events, and between free and intentional human actions and other events; 1985: 33). Similarly, court decisions often refer to commonsense intuitions and the ordinary meaning of causal terms (Macleod 2019). Despite important criticisms of these traditional methods (e.g., Langlinais & Leiter 2016; Nye 2022), conceptual analysis and/or appeals to intuitions are still common in much of contemporary general (see Flanagan & Hannikainen 2022: 1666) and particular (see Tobia 2022: 791–800) jurisprudence.

Why might traditional jurisprudence appeal to shared intuitions or understandings (in §3.2.2. we discuss the philosophical debate about whose intuitions are shared: everyone’s, laypeople’s, or experts)? One answer is to study concepts. Examining ordinary intuitions about law informs our analysis of the concept of law. Another answer is to analyze objects, taking ordinary intuitions about law to clarify the nature of law, or the object ‘law’, not just our concept of it. Most ambitiously, jurisprudence could use intuitions or conceptual analysis to clarify law’s necessary properties—not just the object of law around here, but law as it could exist anywhere.

There are great debates about which of these projects are at the heart of central works in jurisprudence. Those debates sometimes describe the various goals of conceptual analysis as either “modest” or “immodest” (Himma 2019: 32), employing a language initially developed by Jackson (1998). This modest/immodest terminology can invite confusion, and it involves questions that fall beyond this entry’s scope (see Jackson 2021; Nye 2017 for some complications). To avoid these terminological difficulties, we set aside that terminology in this entry, focusing instead on the three different types of projects outlined above. Conceptual analysis could be taken to illuminate concepts, objects, or necessary properties. Again, there are debates about the aims of various traditional jurisprudential projects: Is a particular philosopher analyzing our concept of law, the object “law”, or law’s necessary properties? This entry does not have the space to settle these controversial questions, but traditional and experimental jurisprudence have contemplated all three projects (see §2.1 and §2.2). Some philosophers appeal to intuitions to reveal our shared legal concepts; others to inform the contingent nature of law; and yet others to clarify law’s necessary properties (see also Tobia 2023: 2508–2514).

1.2 Conceptions of Experimental Jurisprudence

Experimental jurisprudence often places itself as responsive to the traditional legal-philosophical backdrop described in §1.1. Insofar as legal philosophers assert intuitions that we “all” share or recognize (e.g., Raz 1975 [1990: 159]), it is worthwhile to empirically examine whether those intuitions are shared (see, e.g., Miotto et al. 2023: 7). And insofar as legal philosophy seeks to elucidate our concepts, like law (e.g., Flanagan & Hannikainen 2022), causation (e.g., Knobe & Shapiro 2021) or reasonableness (e.g., Tobia 2018), data about lay and legal participants’ understanding of these notions can inform these philosophical analyses. On this conception of experimental jurisprudence, new empirical studies have not fundamentally shifted traditional philosophical inquiry. Legal philosophy already has a tradition of appealing to shared understandings and ordinary concepts, and the new empirical methods simply help to evaluate these longstanding claims and questions. On this view, X-Jur’s novelty is methodological, not substantive: It does not steer legal philosophy toward entirely new questions; rather, it addresses existing legal philosophical questions in a new way.

There is some disagreement, however, about what exactly is “new” about experimental jurisprudence. Even in the early twentieth century some philosophers adopted an empirical approach to legal philosophy (e.g., Sharp & Otto 1910; see also T. Murphy 2014 surveying the Norwegian empirical semantics movement from the 1940s–1950s, which included research related to legal philosophical questions), the legal realists emphasized the value of empirical legal study, and a rich tradition of empirical work from the mid to late twentieth century related to philosophy of criminal law (e.g., Robinson & Darley 1995), ordinary notions of law (e.g., Finkel 1995), and legally relevant concepts like causation (see, e.g., Alicke 1992; Spellman 1997) or the impact of outcome severity on moral and legal responsibility (e.g., Walster 1966; see generally Robbennolt 2000).

Yet, X-Jurists often propose that something new is happening. There are some important new features that render experimental jurisprudence distinctive, even while it has various historical predecessors and influences, including naturalism in legal philosophy, law and psychology (see generally Spellman et al. 2025), legal realism (see generally Mikhail 2025), and (behavioral) law and economics. Arguably, the breadth of research questions has increased. There is novel empirical research into questions of general jurisprudence (see §2.1) and many new questions of particular jurisprudence, including areas like contract and statutory interpretation, and concepts like consent and reasonableness (see §2.2). Moreover, the X-Jurist methodological toolkit is expanding (see §2.3); for example, scholars today increasingly look to methods from natural language processing (e.g., Baumgartner & Kneer 2025) and undertake comparative, multi-linguistic, multi-cultural studies (e.g., Hannikainen et al. 2021, 2022).

Least controversially, the term “experimental jurisprudence” is also not new. It referred to a substantially different theory in the earlier twentieth century (Beutel 1934; 1971). In 2014 the term appeared with its current meaning (Solum 2014), as a description of scholarship that uses empirical methods to make progress on legal-philosophical debates. The name under its current meaning suggests an analogy with experimental philosophy, which uses empirical methods to inform philosophical debates from ethics to metaphysics.

Beyond differing conceptions of experimental jurisprudence’s novelty, there are also differing conceptions of its methodological and substantive aims. X-Jur often examines the views of laypeople, those without legal training or expertise, and critiques caution that this data should not “replace” insights from legal practice (Jiménez 2021), that it should only “supplement” traditional philosophical method (Himma 2023: 348), and that simply lifting lay views “wholesale” is a bad idea (Dickson 2022: 113) (see §3 for a comprehensive overview). These critiques assume an ambitious conception of experimental jurisprudence, on which its methodological goal is to displace aspects of traditional methodology and its normative vision is for law to reflect ordinary people’s understanding of law.

However, many X-Jurists endorse a less ambitious conception of the project. Concerning the methodological claim, experimental jurisprudence has often framed itself as a useful supplement, not replacement, of traditional philosophical methodology (e.g., Sommers 2020: 2302; Tobia 2023: 2486; Flanagan 2024: 327). For instance, X-Jurists claim that relying on the intuitions of a larger sample of intuiters is a more rigorous version of the already well-established practice of relying on the authors’ own intuitions (see Macleod 2019; Tobia 2023) insofar as doing so provides a more representative portrayal of the pretheoretical commitments people intuitively share. But no X-Jurist denies that there is much to be done with traditional philosophical methods, e.g., by accommodating or debunking ordinary intuitions, after the data is collected.

While some X-Jur research frames itself as contributing positively to the analysis of legal concepts (see generally, Stich & Tobia 2016, for an overview of the similar “positive program” in experimental philosophy), other X-Jur research is primarily concerned with examining cognitive mechanisms and processes underpinning people’s intuitions related to law (e.g., Struchiner, Almeida, & Hannikainen 2020; Bystranowski, Janik, et al. 2022; Flanagan, Almeida, et al. 2023, similarly to a large part of experimental philosophy research; see Knobe 2016 for an overview). These “cognitive” projects highlight a different potential contribution from X-Jur to legal philosophy, even if legal philosophy is less interested in explaining the ordinary concept of law (and related concepts) than in developing a theoretical concept that can account for a variety of legal phenomena (e.g., Finnis 2011: 277; Atiq 2025; Marmor 2013). Cognitively oriented X-Jur may supplement, for instance, those traditional philosophical projects that aim to explain the legal phenomena in terms of more basic phenomena such as people’s beliefs, attitudes and behaviors (e.g., Marmor 2013; Hart 1961).

In sum, just as different legal philosophers have different goals, so is the case with X-Jurists. Scholars working within X-Jur have taken empirical data to contribute to traditional conceptual analysis, to provide negative or critical challenges to traditional methods and claims, and to offer insight into the cognitive mechanisms underlying people’s legal intuitions.

There are many other relevant dimensions to “conceptualizations of X-Jur”, but one final dimension of importance is X-Jur’s orientation towards laypeople’s views of the law. Many (although not all) X-Jur studies examine laypeople’s beliefs, language, or judgment. At first, it might seem that X-Jur’s study of lay views is premised on an assumption that law should reflect those views. However, this strong substantive claim, that the law should generally reflect lay views of the law, is largely unpopular within experimental jurisprudence. Some have defended this claim in a limited context; for example, the criminal law should reflect lay views of the law, to promote compliance or democracy (e.g., Robinson & Darley 1995; Robinson 2000; Kleinfeld 2017). But much of experimental jurisprudence scholarship treats correspondence between ordinary and legal concepts as, at most, offering (defeasible) reasons for law to use the ordinary concepts. Many scholars ultimately conclude that the lay view should be rejected. For instance, Sommers (2020) argues that the law should not simply adopt the lay concept of consent (see §2.2.4), and Kneer and Bourgeois-Gironde (2017) argue that the lay notion of intent reflects bias, one that the law should seek to eliminate (see §2.2.1). Other X-Jur works emphasize that X-Jur’s empirical contribution does not directly answer this normative question (should law reflect the ordinary concepts). Instead, X-Jur helps unearth facts that contribute to legal-philosophical debate. Because many of law’s central concepts share a name with and plausibly relate to ordinary counterparts (e.g., cause, consent, duty, intent, reasonable), empirical study of ordinary concepts can helpfully disentangle the ordinary from the legal (see, e.g., Tobia 2022).

2. Research in Experimental Jurisprudence

2.1 “General” Experimental Jurisprudence

General jurisprudence is the part of legal philosophy that deals with universal questions about law. Work in general jurisprudence usually tries to identify the necessary (e.g., Raz 2009: 24) or central (e.g., Schauer 2015) features of law (for a slightly broader definition, see Donelson 2023; see also Plunkett & Shapiro 2017). Traditionally, the field has studied topics like the connections between law and morality (Bix 2000), the normativity of law (Plunkett, Shapiro, & Toh 2019), the structure of legal systems (Raz 1970 [1980]), the defining characteristics of legal reasoning (Alexander & Sherwin 2008), among others.

Research in general experimental jurisprudence has touched on many of these areas, including the relationship between law and morality (e.g., Huang 2019) and analogical reasoning in law (e.g., Braman & Nelson 2007). One general motivation for this research is to examine whether people’s intuitions support particular theories or conceptual analyses of law and related concepts (see also Prochownik 2021). In this section we detail three examples: X-Jur of the concept of rule, coercion, and legal validity.

2.1.1 The Concept of Rule

One of the many tasks of general jurisprudence as defined above is to characterize legal reasoning (see, e.g., Schauer 2009). In particular, the field has dedicated much attention to legal interpretation and the role played by the concept of rule within it. The most famous thought experiment imagines a hypothetical statute whose text prohibits “vehicles” from entering the park (see Hart 1958; Fuller 1958; see generally Schauer 2008). The rule’s text straightforwardly prohibits cars, buses, and tanks from the park. But suppose the rule’s underlying purpose is to keep the parkgoers safe. If someone were injured in the park, allowing an ambulance into the park for rescue would plausibly further the rule’s underlying purpose. Does the rule prohibit an ambulance from entering the park? The text would suggest yes, but the underlying purpose no. Whether the folk concept of rule is driven by text, purpose, or both has philosophical implications for both conceptual (e.g., the way legal reasoning differs or doesn’t differ from moral reasoning) and normative (e.g., should we engage in conceptual engineering with regards to the folk concept of rule?) questions (see Almeida, Struchiner, & Hannikainen 2023b for discussion).

X-jurists have studied the influence of text and purpose on ordinary judgments of rule violation, finding that both factors matter (Garcia, Chen & Gordon 2014; Struchiner, Hannikainen, & Almeida 2020). For example, Struchiner, Hannikainen, and Almeida (2020) presented lay participants with different types of cases, following Schauer (1991):

1. core cases (the act is prohibited by both the rule’s text and purpose, e.g., a person enters the park driving a car at full speed);
2. overinclusive cases (the act is prohibited by only the rule’s text, e.g., someone mounts a working truck on a pedestal as a monument inside the park, see Fuller 1958);
3. underinclusive cases (the act is prohibited by only the rule’s purpose, e.g., a person walks inside the park swinging a chainsaw in all directions); and
4. off-topic cases (the act is prohibited by neither the rule’s text nor purpose, e.g., someone walks calmly into the park).

Participants were asked whether the agent in each of these four types of cases violated the rule. They evaluated core cases (i) as most often rule-violating, followed by overinclusive cases (ii), and then underinclusive cases (iii). In contrast, off-topic cases (iv) were largely understood as not rule-violating. That a substantial proportion of participants treat overinclusive and underinclusive cases as rule-violating suggests that both text and purpose influence ordinary rule-violation judgments. Moreover, that effect is detectable using multiple methods (Tanswell et al. forthcoming; Engelmann et al. 2024) and is present among children (Bregant, Wellbery, & Shaw 2019) and across multiple languages and cultures (Hannikainen et al. 2022).

Subsequent work has uncovered many more features associated with rule-based decision-making. Overall, text exerts a larger influence over rule violation judgments than purpose, a tendency that is more pronounced among lawyers and which can be induced by monetarily incentivizing coordination among laypeople (Hannikainen et al. 2022; Bystranowski, Hannikainen, & Tobia 2025). Research has also shown that morally good purposes influence rule violation judgments to a much larger extent than morally bad purposes, and that their influence increases under time pressure and with regard to highly foreseeable purposes (Flanagan, Almeida, et al. 2023; see Almeida et al. 2025). Other research has emphasized people’s sensitivity to context in their evaluation of the linguistic meaning (“text”) of rules like “no vehicles may enter the park” (e.g., Tobia 2020; Waldon, Condoravdi, et al. forthcominga).

Beyond text and purpose, other studies indicate that the rate of enforcement (Wylie & Gantmann 2023), communal evaluation (Levine et al. 2024), and the abstractness or concreteness in which legal cases are described (Struchiner, Almeida & Hannikainen 2020; Bystranowski, Janik, et al. 2022) influence rule violation judgments. Overall, these results have led to a substantially more fine-grained understanding of rule-based decision-making in law. But this is obviously not the end of philosophical investigations. Should lawyers prioritize text in interpreting rules? Should abstractness influence legal determinations? These are questions that require normative argument along traditional philosophical lines. Similarly, extrapolating from empirical observations to broader theoretical claims about, for instance, the relationship between law and morality also necessitates traditional philosophical argument.

Characterizing what is distinctive about legal reasoning is a task that straightforwardly invites empirical examination. One could argue that this is not the most typical situation in general jurisprudence. Some of the field’s central questions are formulated in terms that invite metaphysical and conceptual interpretations. How does experimental jurisprudence tackle these questions?

2.1.2 Coercion

As a second illustration of experimental contributions to general jurisprudence, consider the relationship between law and coercion (see Miotto 2021a). Some philosophers have argued that the presence of coercive mechanisms is a necessary feature of law (e.g., Kelsen 1941; Bentham [LG]), while others have argued that it is not. For example, an influential reading of Austin’s (1832) command theory of law depicts law as a series of commands of a sovereign backed by threats of sanctions. Starting with Hart (1961), mainstream anglophone legal philosophy has shifted away from the view that coercion is a necessary feature of law. Instrumental to this shift was the use of roughly the following thought experiment: imagine a society of angels with several public rules and institutions to ensure coordination, but without sanctions, which are unnecessary, as angels have perfect “respect towards their legal institutions” and lack “all desire to disobey their rulings” (Raz 1975 [1990: 159]. See also: Miotto 2021b). According to Raz, such a system “would be recognized as one [a legal system] by all despite its lack of sanctions” (1975 [1990: 159]). Thus, he concludes, coercion is not a necessary feature of the concept of a legal system. With this, Raz doesn’t deny that extant legal systems are coercive. In fact, he claims that law’s coerciveness “can be said to be true not only of all known legal systems but of all which are possible in human society, given that human nature is what it is” (1975 [1990: 160]). Nonetheless, we can conceive of non-human societies that have non-coercive legal systems.

Most, but not all (see Marmor 2001: 44; Priel 2011: 23; Himma 2020), legal philosophers working in this area seem to agree with Raz’s conclusion (Miotto 2021b), even if they might still insist that coercion’s centrality justifies its inclusion within the purview of general jurisprudence (Schauer 2015).

How could experimental data on folk intuitions help advance this debate? Answering this question depends in part on how one construes the object of philosophical investigation. As discussed in §1.1, some legal philosophers view their task as identifying features of law that would hold across all metaphysically possible worlds in which law exists. For them, experimental data about actual intuitions can therefore play only a limited role. However, we have also seen that most legal philosophers are interested in our actual conceptual representation of law and would thus see experimental data as useful in adjudicating jurisprudential debates. After all, if almost no one represents coercion as a necessary feature of law, it would be hard to claim that our shared concept of law requires that law be coercive. Conversely, if almost everyone evaluated coercion as necessary for a system to count as legal, this would support that there is a conceptual connection between the two. It is thus no coincidence that philosophers often appeal to shared intuitions, claiming, for instance, that the society of angels would be recognized “by all” as a legal system (Raz 1975, but see Nye 2017), or that most people wouldn’t recognize it as such (Himma 2020). Whether these appeals are universal or restricted to specific groups (e.g., legal philosophers or legal practitioners) is controversial (see §3.2.2).

Turning the society of angels thought experiment into an actual empirical study might help adjudicate who is right. Miotto, Almeida, and Struchiner (2023: 105) conducted a study assuming a universal appeal and found that most laypeople (59%) share the Razian intuition (35% rejected it). In fact, they found that when the thought experiment is formulated at a higher degree of specificity, people tend to accept even the possibility of a non-coercive human legal system (2023: 121).

These results vindicate a pre-existing jurisprudential claim about the relationship between law and coercion: hypothetical non-coercive legal systems are conceptually possible. In other ways, however, the results also challenge philosophical orthodoxy. After all, Raz claimed that human legal systems were necessarily coercive. And yet, participants were willing to say that a hypothetical human society without coercion still had a legal system.

This shows that general experimental jurisprudence might not only help gather evidence for or against current philosophical theories (for another example, see Roversi et al. 2023) but also help bring into view new possibilities. Perhaps the clearest instance where this has occurred so far concerns the issue of legal validity.

2.1.3 Legal Validity

As a final example of general X-Jur, consider legal validity. Donelson and Hannikainen (2020) set out to investigate whether Fuller’s “internal morality of law”—a set of eight principles that Fuller thought must be at least partially met by all legal systems—receives widespread endorsement. In doing so, they uncovered an apparent contradiction: participants assigned to one condition tended to agree that compliance with Fullerian principles was necessary for something to count as a law, while participants in another condition tended to say that actual laws flaunted said principles. For instance, more participants agreed that the law as enforced in a hypothetical society called the Faraway nations “could not differ much from the law as formally announced”, than with the empirical statement that law as enforced “does not differ much from the law as formally announced”. This sounds contradictory because whatever is necessarily the case must also actually be the case. Thus, if the enforcement of all possible laws must necessarily match up with their formal announcement, it would follow that the enforcement of any particular law would adhere to the way it was formally announced. One simple explanation for this effect would be that participants interpreted “could” in a normative sense. However, the effect held even for participants who described their interpretation of the necessity statements in an alethic, instead of a normative, sense (Hannikainen et al. 2021). The same puzzling pattern was obtained among lawyers (Donelson & Hannikainen 2020: Study 2) and across 11 different countries (Hannikainen et al. 2021).

Himma (2023) takes this body of evidence as a challenge to the usefulness of X-Jur, claiming that “if we assume that our conceptual practices are coherent, it is difficult to see what these results could tell us about them” (2023: 365). While acknowledging the difficulty, recent work by X-Jurists has attempted to demonstrate that the contradictory nature of the results only arises under certain assumptions about the conceptual structure of the concept of law (see §3 for a more detailed discussion of Himma 2023).

To see the way conceptual structures might come into play in interpreting the empirical results, it is useful to consider a so-called thick ethical concept from outside the legal domain such as “courage”. We see someone as courageous when they engage in a risky action that is simultaneously normatively valuable. At least according to some views on thick concepts, this means that both risk and normative value are necessary conditions for courage. Accordingly, it would be contradictory to say that someone acted courageously when they didn’t do anything valuable (see Willemsen & Reuter 2021 for evidence in that direction).

If the concept of law were a thick concept (see Enoch & Toh 2013 for discussion of this possibility), participants in Donelson and Hannikainen’s (2020) study would indeed have contradicted themselves. For instance: suppose that legislative enactment and compliance with the internal morality of law play the same roles in the concept of legal validity that risk and normative value play in the concept of courage. It would follow that a statute could only count as a law when it was enacted by a legislature and complied with the internal morality of law. Hence, it couldn’t be simultaneously the case that (a) compliance with the internal morality of law is a necessary feature of legal validity and (b) there are laws which don’t comply with the internal morality of law.

Donelson (2023), however, suggests that law might not be a thick concept, but a dual character concept instead. Dual character concepts are associated with two distinct application criteria, one descriptive and the other normative. The canonical example is that of a scientist. Someone is a scientist in a descriptive sense if they engage in certain concrete activities such as performing experiments and writing scientific papers. But when someone who engages in the aforementioned activities doesn’t have a sincere commitment to empirical knowledge, most participants are tempted to say of them that “there is a sense in which they are a scientist, but if you think about what it truly means to be a scientist, you would have to say they are not truly a scientist” (Knobe, Prasada, & Newman 2013). If the concept of law has the same structure, there would be a descriptive criterion determining one sense in which something can count as a law and a normative criterion determining a different sense. Under this way of setting things up, there would be no contradiction: “The folk […] holds that [actual] laws need not obey Fullerian principles, but true laws must […]” (Donelson 2023: 34).

The same idea has been independently considered as one way of answering the central jurisprudential question of whether unjust statutes count as laws. In a pioneering paper, Flanagan and Hannikainen (2022) have shown that a plurality of participants conceptualize unjust statutes as law in one sense, but not true laws. Further research has expanded on those initial results, extending them to cases of unjust conduct that are not forbidden by statute (Flanagan & Almeida 2024) and for rule violation judgments (Almeida, Struchiner & Hannikainen 2023a).

While legal philosophers have long claimed that law has a “dual nature” (Alexy 2010) or a “dual character” (Finnis 2007 [2024]), it has been argued that the dual character structure posed by experimental philosophers is substantially different from these previous treatments, despite the shared terminology (Almeida 2024). Another strand of legal theory might claim that these studies simply pick out an ambiguity in the word “law”, which might refer to two entirely different concepts (e.g., L. Murphy 2005; Shapiro 2011; Hart 1961; see Almeida 2024 for a response). It’s also worth noting that some are skeptical about whether dual character concepts provide a useful philosophical framework, claiming that existing theoretical tools better explain the linguistic patterns under discussion (Phillips & Plunkett 2023; Atiq 2025).

Overall, general experimental jurisprudence is still in its infancy, even when compared to particular experimental jurisprudence (see §2.2). So far, only a small number of general jurisprudence questions have been addressed by experimental methods, and important criticisms raised about those few questions that have been addressed are still being debated.

2.2 “Particular” Experimental Jurisprudence

Particular jurisprudence studies legal-philosophical questions about specific areas of law. The same enterprise is also sometimes called “special” or “specific” jurisprudence (see Khaitan & Steele 2023). We employ “particular jurisprudence” throughout the entry. Particular jurisprudence is preoccupied with questions like: What justifies criminal punishment (e.g., Hart 1959); what is the relationship between our ordinary notion of causation and causation in the law (e.g., Hart & Honoré 1959); what should the tort law standard of reasonable care require (e.g., Keating 1996); what is the nature of property ownership (see, e.g., entry on property and ownership); what is the relationship between ordinary promise-making and legal contracting (e.g., Shiffrin 2007); and should judges interpret a legal rule via its text or purpose (Hart 1958; Fuller 1958)? Unlike the broad debates in general jurisprudence, debates about these particular questions are typically steeped in details and context of particular areas of law and particular jurisdictions.

Particular experimental jurisprudence has contributed data and analysis to each of the questions in the previous paragraph. In fact, researchers have produced an enormous amount of experimental work of philosophical value about many particular legal concepts. Given the spatial and thematic limitations of this entry, we can only skim the surface of the literature. This section reviews some representative examples of particular X-Jur across five areas: criminal law, tort law, property law, contract law, and legal interpretation. In selecting the examples, we sought to emphasize two recurring objectives of research in particular X-Jur: (1) to clarify the extent of correspondence (e.g., Knobe & Shapiro 2021; §2.2.2) or divergence (e.g., Sommers 2020; §2.2.4) between folk concepts and their legal counterparts, and (2) to establish whether the application of legal concepts is driven by reliable or unreliable (e.g., Kneer & Skoczeń 2023; §2.2.1) cognitive processes.

2.2.1 Criminal Law

Criminal law is a branch of law with salient connections to laypeople’s sense of justice and morality. Many of the behaviors considered by society as wrong are also penalized by criminal law, and some of the relevant objectives of criminal law are to protect socially valuable goods and restore justice when wrongs against such goods are committed (e.g., Darley 2009; Robinson & Darley 1995). Moreover, criminal acts are usually sanctioned with especially coercive means, which raises the important philosophical question of the justification of criminal punishment, which divides retributivists (e.g., Moore 1997) and utilitarians (e.g., Bentham [PML]; see §2.2.1.2 “Punishment” below).

In this light, it is unsurprising that criminal lawyers often formulate or interpret legal norms to serve a common sense of justice (e.g., Robinson & Darley 1995: xv, 1). Many studies in the particular X-Jur of criminal law thus examine the content of folk concepts relevant to criminal law and the extent to which they overlap with their legal counterparts (see, especially, Robinson & Darley 1995). To the extent that legal theorists and practitioners refer to ordinary intuitions when drafting, interpreting, or applying criminal law, they may find such research valuable. However, whether more general implications can be drawn for criminal law theory and practice from such research is a matter of discussion. According to one position in this debate, “the criminal codes of societies should be broadly in accordance with the moral intuitions of the governed community” (Darley 2009: 15). One reason for this is that discrepancies between criminal codes and community views undermine the law’s moral credibility (e.g., Robinson & Darley 1995; Carlsmith & Darley 2008; Darley 2009); which may weaken people’s willingness to obey it (e.g., Robinson & Darley 1995: 201–202). In contrast, others scrutinized the psychological processes involved in people’s applications of concepts relevant to criminal justice, finding that lay judgments are often affected by irrelevant factors or are otherwise subject to systematic biases. This has led some to argue that legislators ought to minimize the impact of laypeople’s moral intuitions on criminal law (e.g., Nadelhoffer 2006; Malle & Nelson 2003). Below, we review examples of research that exemplify these two projects in X-Jur of criminal law.

2.2.1.1 The Actus Reus and Mens Rea Distinction

In common law, the two constitutive elements of a criminal offense are actus reus (the action or conduct, the “external side of the criminal conduct”) and mens rea (the mental state of the actor, the criminal conduct’s “internal side”) (Fletcher 2007: 43). These elements constitute Coke’s well-known (1644: 6 [ch. 1]) principle: criminal conduct combines a guilty act with a guilty mind (actus non facit reum nisi mens sit rea). Similar requirements for committing a crime are also present in continental legal systems.

Some work in X-Jur, however, has challenged that mens rea evaluation might be completely decoupled from analyzing the external outcomes caused by one’s conduct. Supporting this challenge, Kneer and Bourgeois-Gironde (2017) have found that intentionality ascription among professional judges is sensitive to the valence and the severity of the outcome caused by the protagonist’s action in ways that closely mimic lay intuitions (e.g., Knobe 2003; for a meta-analysis of outcome effects on responsibility judgments, see Robbennolt 2000). In one study, legal experts read a story about a mayor who decided to build a highway connection despite adverse consequences on the environment. In one condition, the consequences were severe (animals in the construction zone died), in another one, they were mild (animals were temporarily disturbed). Professional judges perceived the major’s action as significantly more intentional when its outcome was severe. The authors of the study go on to argue that this mismatch between laypeople’s and professionals’ intentionality ascriptions on one hand and the legal requirements of mens rea on the other constitutes a bias in need of addressing (but see Prochownik et al. 2025; Tobia 2024).

Other work, however, shows that people are capable of distinguishing between the two constructs. These studies reveal that actus reus and mens rea have dissociable cognitive and neural bases and that they independently affect moral and legal judgments. For instance, Young, Cushman, et al. (2007) presented subjects with vignettes that varied in terms of protagonists’ beliefs (negative vs. neutral) and caused outcomes (negative vs. neutral). For example, in the “negative belief and negative outcome” condition, the protagonist knowingly puts a toxin into her friend’s coffee, and the friend dies; in the “neutral belief and negative outcome condition”, she falsely believes that she puts sugar into her friend’s coffee which turns out to be a toxin, and the friend dies. Afterward, participants judged whether what the actor did was morally permissible while their brain activity was monitored.

The study found that a brain region associated with belief attribution (e.g., Saxe & Powell 2006; Saxe & Wexler 2005) was involved in participants’ moral judgments across all four experimental conditions. However, they also found significant differences regarding the role of belief attribution in forming moral judgment across conditions. For instance, cases of failed attempts were determined solely by belief attribution. Cases of successful crimes relied on belief attribution to a lesser extent, plausibly because of the greater role of causal information in forming moral judgments (Young et al. 2007: 8238–8239). Finally, cases of “unknowing harms” (involving neutral beliefs and negative outcomes) were determined by causal and belief attribution, but also involved activating brain areas associated with conflict. These findings suggest how information about the actor’s belief (relevant for mens rea in the law) and the outcome they cause (relevant for actus reus in the law) is encoded in the brain and integrated into moral and legal judgment (Young et al. 2007: 8235).

Cushman’s (2008) research further supports the idea that intentional and causal analyses sometimes compete to determine moral and legal judgments. In one of his studies, participants were presented with the following scenario: Brown and Smith are two runners competing for a championship. During the banquet before the race, Brown sprinkles some poppy seeds on Smith’s food, believing that Smith is allergic to them. Now, some participants read that Brown’s belief was false and Smith was unharmed (“no harm” condition). Others read that although Brown’s belief was false, Smith died due to causes independent of Brown’s action (“harm” condition). Arguably, in both cases Brown committed the same crime (a failed attempt to kill Smith) and, therefore, deserves the same amount of punishment. However, participants in Cushman’s study assigned significantly more punishment to the agent in the “no harm” condition than in the “harm” condition. One possible explanation for these surprising results is that, on the one hand, in the “no harm” case, the judgment of punishment relied straightforwardly on belief attribution. On the other hand, in the “harm” condition, the independent causal chain led away from the perpetrator and could have “blocked” people’s assessment of his mental state (Cushman 2008: 371).

Together, these studies suggest that human moral psychology reflects the operation of Coke’s principle, requiring the combination of mens rea and actus reus for committing a crime. However, they also indicate that information about mental states and caused outcomes contribute differently to a range of moral and legal judgments (e.g., crimes of attempts are evaluated based on belief attribution, successful crimes based on belief and causal attributions), which raises a possibility of discrepancies between the criminal code and lay intuitions.

Distinct criminal law systems conceptualize culpable mental states differently. The Model Penal Code (MPC, see Other Internet Resources), on which many state criminal codes in the US are modeled, distinguishes four categories of mens rea: purpose, knowledge, recklessness, and negligence. For instance, a criminal result is caused purposely if it was a “conscious object” of the perpetrator, knowingly if the perpetrator was “practically certain” that it would occur, and recklessly if the perpetrator acted despite the “substantial and unjustifiable risk” of causing it (MPC, Section 2.02). Finally, the outcome is brought about negligently if the perpetrator was unaware of the risk, although they should have been.

The assessment of the mens rea element of crime in the US is a task performed by a non-specialist jury, but are laypeople able to assess the defendant’s mental state in accordance with the MPC guidelines? This is an empirical question examined in some recent X-Jur research. Shen et al. (2011) presented a sample of jury-eligible Americans with various scenarios that differed in the perpetrators’ mental states (four mens rea categories distinguished by MPC mentioned above and blamelessness). Additionally, the researchers manipulated the severity of harm, a factor known to affect mental state attribution (Shen et al. 2011: 1326; see Knobe 2006; Machery 2008). After reading each scenario, participants decided how much the perpetrator should be punished. The results showed that participants exacted varying degrees of punishment depending on the perpetrator’s mental state in accordance with the MPC, with one exception: They did not differentiate punishment for criminal outcomes committed knowingly and recklessly—even when participants had access to the MPC’s definitions of mens rea. In a follow-up study, participants read the scenarios and classified the protagonist’s mental states into one of the MPC’s mens rea categories. In this sorting task, participants only did well in identifying purposeful and blameless crimes, but exhibited difficulties identifying other mental states. Other research has replicated this pattern, demonstrating that laypeople struggle to distinguish recklessness and knowledge when evaluating criminal outcomes (even when trained on a more accessible version of the MPC guidelines; see Ginther et al. 2014) and to apply these doctrines appropriately when assessing criminal liability for crimes involving attendant circumstances (i.e., although MPC requires knowledge, laypeople reckoned recklessness sufficient for criminal liability; Jones, Montague, & Yaffe 2020).

In sum, these findings suggest that laypeople’s determinations of mens rea fail to capture various subtleties in the MPC—especially, between outcomes committed knowingly versus merely recklessly. Moreover, they consider recklessness a sufficient condition of criminal liability for crimes requiring knowledge concerning attendant circumstances. This may have serious implications for jurors’ ability to correctly ascribe mens rea, especially for crimes (e.g., homicide) where assigning recklessness or knowledge of the outcome substantially affects their legal consequences (Shen et al. 2011: 1349). If jurors cannot make this distinction properly or reliably, this may result in unequal treatment of perpetrators committing the same crime (e.g., Ginther et al. 2014: 1329).

In this light, normative questions arise: Should the distinction between knowledge and recklessness be abandoned by the MPC? Should recklessness be a sufficient requirement for criminal liability? Potential answers to these questions are not straightforward and may vary. For example, it could be argued that jury instructions should better explain the distinction between knowledge and recklessness to jurors or, if such clarification does not suffice, that the distinction should be abandoned altogether (Shen et al. 2011: 1352, 1354).

2.2.1.2 Punishment

As we have seen, a person who commits a guilty act with a guilty mind commits a crime and is thus, at least in principle, liable to punishment. There are different views regarding how to justify punishment in the philosophy of criminal law (see the entry on legal punishment for a review). On the one hand, retributivists (e.g., Moore 1997; J. Murphy 2007) argue that criminal offenders should be punished because they deserve it. In other words, the offender’s “desert” provides a sufficient reason for punishment, irrespective of its consequences (e.g., Moore 1997). On the other hand, consequentialists (e.g., Bentham [PML) argue that criminal punishment is justified by its potential benefits—i.e., by its capacity to deter, incapacitate, and/or rehabilitate (past or future) offenders. According to the deterrence version of this view, criminal punishment deters future crime either by barring a specific offender from repeating their crime in the future (specific deterrence) or by dissuading potential offenders from committing similar crimes in the future (general deterrence). Incapacitation prevents a specific offender from undertaking criminal activities (at least) for the time being while serving their sentence. Finally, rehabilitation aims to reform criminal offenders (e.g., morally educate them) so they do not repeat their crimes in the future. These are the most frequent utilitarian reasons for criminal punishment, but there are many more. For instance, punishment also serves a communicative function—it sends a message that the community disapproves of certain activities, and by doing so, it, among others, reinforces social norms prohibiting such behaviors in society and morally educates criminal wrongdoers (e.g., Nadelhoffer et al. 2013: 237, 240–241). A recent survey of law professors found endorsement of many of these as a justification of criminal punishment, including rehabilitation (92%), deterrence (82%), incapacitation (65%), retribution (40%); and expressivism (35%); 3% of participants reported that there should be no criminal punishment (Martínez & Tobia 2023)

While philosophers and legal scholars have debated these different reasons for punishing criminals armed with arguments, abundant experimental work in social psychology and experimental economics has focused on examining laypeople’s punitive behavior and their underlying motives. Many of these studies, using different experimental techniques and paradigms, have been offered in favor of the intuitive retributivism hypothesis (see generally, Zisman & Rehren forthcoming), i.e., that people punish based on “just desert” considerations rather than a utilitarian calculus.

For instance, Darley, Carlsmith, and Robinson (2000) presented subjects with ten scenarios involving a variety of intentionally committed harms that differed in the severity of the offense (a retributivism-relevant factor) and the likelihood of the offender’s recidivism (an incapacitation-relevant factor). The researchers found that people’s decisions about how much to punish were primarily driven by the offense’s seriousness. In the following part of the study, participants were asked to reassign punishments for all scenarios, adopting retributivist and incapacitation perspectives. Punishment assignments from the retributivist perspective closely mirrored those made beforehand without any instructions. In contrast, assignments from the incapacitation perspective relied more on the information about the likelihood of the perpetrator repeating the crime; however, they also considered the offense’s severity. These results indicate that people base their punitive decisions on just desert considerations by default, although they can also consider the incapacitation perspective when directly prompted to do so (see also Carlsmith, Darley, & Robinson 2002, for similar findings regarding retributivism and deterrence). Similarly, Carlsmith (2008) found that people endorse utilitarian principles when formulated abstractly but reject them if they violate their sense of justice while deciding concrete cases (see Carlsmith & Darley 2008: 207–208 for a discussion).

Other studies examined people’s punitive behaviors in addition to punitive judgments. For instance, Carlsmith (2006) investigated the kind of information people seek while deciding on an appropriate amount of punishment for the committed crime (the so-called “behavioral process tracing” task; Jacoby et al. 1987). When given a choice, laypeople sought retributivism-related information before and more frequently than information related to incapacitation and deterrence, suggesting that they “punish primarily on the basis of retribution” (Carlsmith 2006: 437; see also replications based on a similar research paradigm: Keller et al. 2010; Rehren & Zisman 2022). In another study, based on the experimental economics paradigm, Nadelhoffer, Heshmati, and colleagues (2013) found that participants punished third-party players by deducting their welfare at the cost to themselves regardless of whether others would be informed about the punitive deduction, indicating that punishment is driven by retributivist motives and not by the desire to communicate disapproval.

However, a recent X-Jur study points towards a different direction. According to Michael Moore (1997), the deserved suffering of the criminal wrongdoer provides a sufficient reason for punishment—a belief that is supposedly shared by many. Bauer and Poama (2020) experimentally tested these sufficiency and pervasiveness claims. They presented participants with a thought experiment based on an actual criminal case involving rape and robbery (Moore 1997). After reading about the case, participants imagined that the sexual and violent impulses of the previous offender were significantly impeded due to an accident and that he had no further need to commit robbery due to a large inheritance, eliminating the risk of repeating such crimes in the future; nonetheless, he was sentenced to ten years in prison by the court. Participants were then provided with different details regarding how much the offender suffered in prison and whether he underwent a moral change, and evaluated the justness of the sentence. The results showed that both factors mattered for people’s justness evaluations, providing limited support for the sufficiency claim. Moreover, participants endorsed retributivism explicitly in only one out of three different measures of the participants’ views on the goals of punishment, undermining the pervasiveness claim.

Future experimental work should bridge the apparent inconsistencies in the findings regarding folk retributivism and examine their theoretical implications.

2.2.1.3 Moral Luck

Moral luck is another puzzling phenomenon of philosophical (e.g., Williams 1976; Nagel 1979) and legal (e.g., Enoch 2010) relevance examined by experimental research. Imagine two agents driving home at night after consuming alcohol. They both get distracted while driving and, while one of them crashes into a tree, the other fatally runs over a pedestrian. Although both agents are equally guilty of driving under the influence and equally had no control over the resulting outcome, the driver who killed a pedestrian (“morally unlucky”) would face more severe punishment than the driver who hit a tree (e.g., Cushman 2008; Young et al. 2010; Lench et al. 2015).

Recent findings in X-Jur shed light on the psychological processes involved in laypeople’s judgments in such cases. Kneer and Machery (2019) investigated the impact of moral luck on a range of moral judgments (permissibility, wrongness, blame, and punishment). In their studies, one group of participants saw both vignettes about lucky and unlucky agents (designed to promote reflective comparison), while others only one of those stories (to mimic real-life conditions in which people evaluate cases sequentially). In the former (joint evaluation) context, moral luck had a limited effect. In the latter (separate evaluation) context, moral luck intuitions appeared across various judgments, arising most strongly in the case of punishment judgments (cf. Cushman 2008). Arguably, such findings explain why ordinary intuitions and criminal codes are often in agreement; for instance, “why legal systems often impose more severe penalties for more negative outcomes” (Prochownik 2021) and assign greater punishment for successful crimes than failed attempts (e.g., in the US, but see Model Penal Code; e.g., Cushman 2011; Enoch 2010). However, whether the law should depend on luck (Cushman 2011) is a normative question that cannot be answered by empirical data alone. It touches on the broader philosophical question of whether we should hold others responsible for outcomes beyond their control (see Enoch 2010), with numerous implications for the philosophy of criminal law.

2.2.2 Tort Law

Tort law reflects the civil law governing the consequences that follow from a person’s act that wrongs another person (or their property). For example, the tort of “negligence” applies to a person who breaches a duty to act with reasonable care, when that breach causes injury to another person. As even this simple example illustrates, conceptual questions abound in the philosophy of tort. When exactly does someone act without “reasonable” care, and in what circumstances is such a breach the “cause” of an injury? Traditional legal philosophy has studied these questions, and in recent years, X-Jur of tort has also contributed to the examination of concepts like causation and reasonableness.

First, consider causation. Judgments about causation play a central role in legal reasoning, e.g., as a prerequisite for liability in criminal and civil contexts. Moreover, what counts as a cause under the law is often taken to be the same as our notion of cause in everyday life, or at least plausibly related to it (Hart & Honoré 1959: 1). But causation is notoriously tricky to pin down. For instance: imagine that John negligently crashes his car into Paul’s fence. Did his negligence cause the damage? One notion of cause (often referred to as a but-for cause) requires us to imagine whether the outcome would have obtained in a counterfactual world where John wasn’t negligent. That allows us to see that John’s negligence is a cause of the damage to Paul’s fence: had he driven with appropriate care, the fence would be intact. But there are many other but-for causes that are necessary for the damage to have occurred. Had the car dealership not sold a car to John, the damage wouldn’t have occurred; if John’s employer hadn’t changed headquarters, his commute wouldn’t have run through Paul’s yard, etc. It would be ridiculous to deem the car dealership or John’s employer responsible for the damage to Paul’s fence. So, even though but-for causation might be a necessary condition for the kind of legal responsibility under discussion, it’s clearly not sufficient. Thus, an action that passes the but-for test will then be treated as a cause in fact, though not every cause in fact will then be treated as a cause in law (or proximate cause).

In a series of studies, Spellman (1997) explored the role of such counterfactual reasoning in people’s causal attributions. For instance, one study investigated people’s causal attributions in cases involving conjunctive causes in a temporal chain, i.e., a sequence of causes that are each individually necessary and jointly sufficient for the outcome to obtain. Participants considered a scenario in which two players each tossed a coin for a chance to win $1000. However, the coins landed differently (one landed heads and the other landed tails), and as a result, neither player won any money. Participants’ causal judgments reflected a sensitivity to the temporal order: such that when Player 2’s coin toss occurred after Player 1’s coin toss, their action was seen as more causally relevant to their loss—than when they occurred simultaneously. Follow-up studies indicated that this effect reflects a tendency to credit events with causal relevance to the extent that they change the probability that an outcome occurs. In sum, Spellman’s (1997) studies suggest that people spontaneously compute the contingency of an outcome on an event and assign causal relevance to actions with the highest contingency (while also favoring actions that are temporally closer to their outcomes).

Early research in social psychology has focused on laypeople’s judgments of causation in the context of unfortunate outcomes, showing that probability isn’t all there is to it. For instance, Alicke (1992) described a car accident in which a driver, driving over the speed limit, in combination with an environmental element (e.g., the presence of an oil spill on the road), caused an accident in which multiple road users sustained injuries. Additionally, the study manipulated the driver’s motivation for speeding: to hide an anniversary gift in the morally good condition, versus a vial of cocaine in the morally bad condition. Although the driver’s actions were the same across conditions, they were seen as playing a greater causal role when speeding to hide a vial of cocaine than when doing so to hide an anniversary gift. Follow up studies replicated the initial effect, showing that in matching pairs of actions, the blameworthy variant is seen as more causally relevant in explaining multiple downstream outcomes than the blameless variant—whether the action was necessary or sufficient (see also Knobe & Fraser 2008).

Incorporating both counterfactual reasoning and the effects of norm violation on ordinary causation judgments, Joshua Knobe and Scott Shapiro (2021) explored the concept of proximate cause through the lens of experimental jurisprudence. They highlighted a debate between formalists, according to which the notion of a proximate cause in law is purely descriptive, and realists, for whom the notion of a legal cause relies on normative standards. By reviewing numerous studies in cognitive science, the authors argued that judgments about causation depend on a particular kind of moral judgment, specifically, a judgment about whether the target action is normal—both in a descriptive and a normative sense. The authors then advanced an account of how causal judgments in both conjunctive cases (when causes 1 and 2 are together necessary and sufficient) and disjunctive cases (when the presence of either cause 1 or 2 is on its own necessary and sufficient) can be explained by participants’ representations of whether the candidate causes are normal or abnormal. In closing, the authors argued that the theory of proximate cause as causal selection can predict a wide range of highly visible decisions in US American case law. (For a critical review, arguing that the ordinary “abnormality test” is not the best explanation of legal causation, see Sebok 2021 in Other Internet Resources).

As a second example, consider reasonableness, another central legal concept, sitting at the core of the negligence standard in common law torts, as well as other standards in and out of tort law (Zipursky 2015). There is rich philosophical debate about the nature of legal reasonableness, and many highlight the concept’s connection to ordinary reasonableness or ordinary reasoning (e.g., Zipursky 2015; Gardner 2015; Geistfeld 2020). Is “reasonable” action what most people would do, cost-benefit justified action, ideal or virtuous action, or something else?

Experimental jurisprudence has examined the ordinary notion of reasonableness to inform these philosophical questions. Jaeger (2020; 2025; forthcoming) finds that descriptive norms (e.g., perceived average behavior) affect laypeople’s evaluation of reasonableness, while cost-benefit norms (what is perceived to be efficient) do not. Drawing on research on the concept of normality (Bear & Knobe 2017), Tobia (2018; 2025) finds that lay evaluations of reasonable quantities (e.g., a reasonable number of hours’ notice for a landlord to provide before entering) are better predicted by a hybrid combination of average and ideal quantities (e.g., the average number of hours’ notice; the ideal number of hours’ notice) than by either the average or ideal alone. Baumgartner and Kneer (2025) find that in natural language, “reasonable” is more like thick concepts (like “cruelty”) that have descriptive and evaluative aspects, compared to purely descriptive concepts (like “table”) or thin evaluative ones that have only evaluative content (like “good”). Beyond these studies about average versus ideal versus hybrid theory, empirical research reports that lay evaluations of reasonableness are subject to hindsight bias (LaBine & LaBine 1996; Kneer 2022); when an action leads to a worse outcome (all else equal) participants are inclined to evaluate the action as less reasonable.

2.2.3 Property Law

Though there is some debate as to whether property is a philosophical issue (see the section on this topic in the entry on property and ownership), some philosophers have explored philosophical issues in property law (e.g., Locke 1689; Snare 1972). In the domain of experimental jurisprudence, researchers have interrogated the folk concept of ownership as a window into what it means for something to be one’s property. Does the evidence indicate a universal ordinary concept of ownership? If so, what philosophical significance does this have? How does it bear on the common assumption that property law is fundamentally technical and even stripped of philosophical depth?

Evidence suggests that a concept of ownership emerges at a young age: children as young as two understand that an object’s owner need not be currently using the object; and at three they prefer their own toys to identical duplicates owned by others (see generally Nancekivell, Friedman, & Gelman 2019). At age two, young children’s behavior already suggests some concern with ownership rights, e.g., by protesting against a puppet’s seizure of an object they recently made (whereas protests were weaker in reaction to seizure of a third-party’s object; Kanngiesser & Hood 2014). In another study, 4-year-olds applied similar principles to harmless interventions on others’ property as they did on others’ body parts (Van de Vondervoort & Friedman 2015; see also Van de Vondervoort et al. 2017): for example, they judged disapproved interventions on others as worse than disapproved interventions on themselves—suggesting that children may acquire norms about property by extrapolating from norms about bodily autonomy.

Early research on children’s concept of ownership revealed that 5-year-old children pay closer attention to information about the past use of an object over information about future use. Furthermore, attention to past use information plays a heightened role in circumstances in which first possession is indicative of the object’s history (Friedman et al. 2013). To investigate whether children view ownership as conferring the right of use or of exclusion, Nancekivell and Friedman (2014) compared children’s judgments of the potential uses of non-owned objects to the uses of owned objects, and discovered that children view non-owned objects as amenable to multiple uses—much like objects they personally owned, but unlike objects owned by someone else—indicating that ownership appears to primarily confer the right of exclusion, and not the right of use to the same degree.

This short overview barely scratches the surface of the empirical study related to property (for further reading, see Blumenthal 2010; Nadler 2018; and Nancekivell, Friedman & Gelman 2019). In sum, developmental research indicates that children’s concept of ownership may arise by extending their concept of the body, and that it depends on an object’s history of use and confers a relatively persistent right of exclusion. In this regard, existing research points toward a rich intuitive basis for adults’ beliefs about property. Although some philosophers have examined issues in property, it is a comparatively overlooked area. X-Jur research offers a new way to make philosophical progress in understanding some of the property law’s fundamental concepts.

2.2.4 Contract Law

The notion of consent plays a central role in moral and legal theory. In an often-quoted passage, legal scholar Heidi Hurd (1996) notes that

consent turns a trespass into a dinner party; a battery into a handshake; a theft into a gift; an invasion of privacy into an intimate moment; a commercial appropriation of name and likeness into a biography. (1996: 123)

According to the “canonical view of consent”, as articulated in legal scholarship and moral philosophy, valid consent can occur only when the consenter exercises their personal autonomy. This account renders consent invalid when, for example, consent is obtained using threats of physical violence, since the consent does not reflect the person’s autonomous choice. Similarly, consent is—on the canonical view—invalidated by material deception (see Sommers 2020: 2239). In cases of deception, the consenter’s autonomy is thwarted by the fact that knowledge about the act to which they are consenting is deliberately withheld.

In recent years, experimental research has gathered important insights into the way people reason about the validity of consent (e.g., Sommers 2020; Demaree-Cotton & Sommers 2022). For instance, consider the following scenario:

Did Marvin consent to his surgery? In Sommers’s (2020) study, 66% of participants affirmed that Marvin consented to the surgery, even though he was deceived by his doctor. Moreover, “participants saw the doctor as less deserving of punishment” in cases of deceived consent than in cases where there’s no assent at all (Sommers 2020: 2273). This same basic pattern was documented in other cases of consent by deception, involving sexual relations, police searches, and participation in scientific research: Overall, participants did not take deception to defeat consent.

Together, these studies suggest discrepancies between the folk concept of consent and the canonical understanding that prevails in the law. Yet, jury instructions in the United States call upon jurors to employ their own folk concept to inform their decisions, raising the concern that they may deviate systematically from the legal understanding (e.g., by treating mere assent obtained through deception as consent).

Viewing these features of the folk concept of consent as normatively undesirable can inspire attempts to engage in “conceptual engineering”—a concerted attempt to redefine a concept in response to its perceived inadequacies. For example, scholars might attempt to foster the adoption of an improved notion of consent that precludes consent obtained by deception and/or demands the exercise of autonomy.

Other research has investigated the folk understanding of contracts. According to the doctrinal view, a mutual communication of assent (e.g., an offer from a buyer followed by acceptance of the offer from the seller) suffices to establish a binding contract. Wilkinson-Ryan and Hoffman (2015), however, show that participants consider a contract to be binding at a later stage—when the transaction is complete.

In one of the authors’ studies, participants were asked to imagine that they had signed a contract, and that the contract either came into effect immediately and could be nullified anytime in the first 72 hours, or that the contract would come into effect after 72 hours unless it was nullified before then. Participants reported being more open to shopping around for a better alternative in the second condition (in which the contract was not in effect) than in the first (in which it was)—even though both groups of participants had signed the contract and were able to render it void. Similarly, participants appeared to view the private act of signing a contract as more binding than an informal communication of assent to the other party. Lastly, the research reveals how people’s understanding of contract formation is influenced by moral norms regarding reciprocity: When describing an agreement to buy a used car, participants were randomly assigned to consider a seller who either shows signs of commitment to their agreement (getting the car detailed and taking down a “For Sale” sign) versus a comparable seller who does not (because the car was recently detailed and parked indoors). Participants were more reluctant to cancel the verbal agreement with the first seller, whose actions of getting the car detailed after the agreement (versus before) convey a greater commitment. This suggests that norms of reciprocity underlie people’s reasoning about the bindingness of contracts.

2.2.5 Legal Interpretation

Much of the experimental jurisprudence of interpretation has examined “ordinary meaning” (see Slocum 2015; Lee & Mouritsen 2018; Tobia 2020), or the way an “ordinary reader” would understand a legal text. This concept is especially important in contemporary American legal interpretation, in which “textualists” seek to interpret law’s terms as they would be understood by an ordinary or reasonable reader (see Scalia & Garner 2012). American courts have relied on dictionaries as an important source of information about ordinary meaning. More recently, corpus linguistics (e.g., Lee & Mouritsen 2018) emerged as another way to achieve the same goal. A series of experiments (Tobia 2020) shows that, although legal interpreters see both dictionaries and corpus linguistics as methods to uncover the same facts about language (ordinary meaning), the conclusions about language delivered from both methods diverge significantly from ordinary use as ascertained by survey-experiments. For example, while many dictionary definitions would classify an airplane as a “vehicle”, common methods in legal corpus suggest that an airplane is not within the ordinary meaning (see also Lee & Mouritsen 2018). Dictionaries offer systematically more inclusive definitions, while corpus linguistics reflect prototypical examples that are considerably narrower.

As an alternative to those methods, X-Jurists have used survey-experiments to uncover whether specific “linguistic” interpretive canons accurately reflect ordinary linguistic practices (e.g., Tobia, Slocum & Nourse 2022; Randall & Solan 2025). For example, consider the rule “no cars, buses, trucks or other vehicles may enter the park”. The “ejusdem generis” interpretive canon holds that when a list (like “cars, buses, trucks”) is followed by a catchall phrase (like “or other vehicles”), the catchall should be interpreted in line with the theme of the list. So the ejusdem canon holds that “other vehicles” should be construed to include only entities like cars, buses, and trucks—perhaps including motorcycles but not including bicycles. Recent work finds that, even though laypeople have not been taught the Latin canon “ejusdem generis”, their intuitive judgment about rule meanings reflects its guidance (Tobia, Slocum & Nourse 2022).

Other studies address linguistic issues relevant to specific cases. For example, several studies examined how ordinary people understand causal phrases like “because of” (e.g., Macleod 2019, 2025), an issue at the center of Bostock v. Clayton County, 2020. As another example, the question in Bondi v. VanDerStok, 2025, was whether a non-assembled “gun parts kit” constitutes a “firearm” within the meaning of a U.S. firearms law. Waldon, Condoravdi, and colleagues (forthcominga) presented an empirical and linguistic analysis of artifact nouns, such as “firearm,” “chair,” and “table,” to inform the case. The U.S. Supreme Court referred to this linguistic analysis of artifact nouns in its opinion, which concluded that yes, “firearm” includes some such gun parts kits. U.S. Courts have also indicated interest in empirical methods to aid legal interpretation. Several judicial decisions have cited corpus linguistic studies, and in 2024, a Supreme Court opinion (Pulsifer v. United States, 2024 (Gorsuch, J., dissenting)) cited an amicus brief that summarized an experimental survey study of how ordinary Americans understand negated conjunctions (Tobia, Egbert & Lee 2023).

Other studies have tested issues related to particular areas of law, such as contract law (e.g., Furth-Matzkin 2025; see also Ben-Shahar & Strahilevitz 2017; Mouritsen 2019) and treaties in international law (e.g., Pirker & Skozeń 2022; see Macleod 2025, for an overview). While much of the X-Jur work in this area employs corpus linguistics (e.g., Lee & Mouritsen 2018) and survey-experiments (e.g., Tobia 2020), scholars have also proposed the addition of other methods, such as word embeddings (Choi 2024). Very recently some lower court opinions have even cited ChatGPT in interpretation (e.g. Snell v. United Specialty Ins. Co., 102 F.4th 1208, 1221 (11th Cir. 2024) (Newsom, J., concurring)), a practice that has already generated some critiques (e.g. Waldon, Schneider, et al. forthcomingb; Lee & Egbert 2024; Choi unpublished).

2.2.6 Other Areas of Law

As the previous sections demonstrate, there is a voluminous literature in particular experimental jurisprudence. We have highlighted some major research areas, but inevitably, even this review omits important work. X-Jurists have also explored perjury (Skoczen 2022), evidence (Macleod 2023), health and disability law (Dorfman 2025), and, doubtlessly, much more that we lack the space to cover. The NYU Press Psychology and the Law Series includes a number of outstanding volumes that present research in law and psychology, including in tort and property law, but also family law, evidence, and environmental law. Many of these findings have implications for theoretical debates in jurisprudence.

2.3 Empirical Methodologies

As noted in Section 1, some researchers take experimental jurisprudence to be continuous with the more traditional strands of jurisprudence. It is also not the first movement in legal research to embrace empirical methods. Thus, what marks it out against traditional jurisprudence, on the one hand, and quantitative approaches in fields such as legal psychology and law and economics, on the other, is the use of empirical methods to investigate a broad range of philosophical questions about the law. But general talk of “empirical methods” obscures the rich palette of tools used by X-Jurists. To the extent that different empirical methods play different roles in philosophical argumentation, understanding the various methods helps clarify the philosophical points made by scholars working within the movement. Thus, in this section, we aim to define and exemplify some of the methods currently in use within experimental jurisprudence.

2.3.1 Psychological Methods

In their simplest form, psychological survey-experiments contrast multiple (often two) vignettes that differ from one another exclusively with regard to one property of interest, which is usually referred to as the experimental manipulation or treatment. Experimenters also ask participants at least one question about each vignette. At the analysis stage, this question will serve as the dependent variable to be explained in terms of the experimental treatment.

For instance, Kneer and Skoczeń (2023) were interested in whether judgments about the objective probability that an event would have occurred are affected by knowledge of the actual outcome in situations where legal responsibility is salient. For their first two studies, all conditions started with the following introduction:

Then, participants in the “Neutral” condition read the following ending:

Participants in the “Bad” condition received a vignette that ended differently:

Here, the treatment was whether the outcome was neutral or bad. Thus, this is the only factor that differs between the two versions of the stimuli. All else remains the same, including the questions that participants are asked to answer. In this study, one such question was: “[H]ow likely was it from an objective point of view that there would be a flood this year?”.

In Study 1, Kneer and Skoczeń used a between-subjects design, meaning that participants were randomly assigned to read either the “Neutral” or the “Bad” ending. Contrasting the objective probability estimations between these two groups revealed a fairly large difference. Since the only thing that changes from one group to the other is the severity of the outcome, this means that participants took into account the actual outcome (of a flood) in their assessments of how probable it was that a flood would occur. In other words, the observed difference in the dependent variable was caused by the manipulation of the independent variable.

One important aspect of the experimental paradigm is that it is able to detect effects that are unbeknownst to the participants themselves. Kneer and Skoczeń’s Study 1 can show that outcome severity affects probability estimations even if participants themselves do not introspectively or consciously recognize that it does so. This is one reason why survey-experiments are a useful supplement to armchair methods, which usually rely heavily on introspection.

What the specific design employed in Study 1 cannot tell us is whether each participant would see this difference between conditions as problematic. Presumably, if participants take information about the actual outcome to be relevant in assessing the outcome’s objective probability, the difference observed in Study 1 should emerge equally in an adaptation of the experiment in which participants consider both endings. If instead they deem the difference in the actual outcome to be irrelevant, their objective probability estimations should not differ across conditions.

To test which of these were true, Kneer and Skoczeń ran the same stimuli as a within-subjects design, in which participants received both versions of the vignette (with differently named farmers) side-by-side. In this modified design, there was no significant difference in the dependent variable for both endings. The authors interpret this to mean that the folk concept of objective probability is outcome-insensitive. Hence, they characterize the pattern of results that occurs in the between-subjects design as a performance error in the way that people apply a non-moral concept in morally laden situations.

This is just one example that illustrates how X-Jurists can use experiments to interrogate philosophical problems. Experimental surveys are often much more complex, involving the independent manipulation of several different variables and mixing elements of within- and between-subjects designs. Still, the overall strategy for drawing inferences about causal processes remains fundamentally the same.

In addition to survey-experiments, some experimental jurisprudence research uses non-experimental (or cross-sectional) surveys that ask the same set of questions to every participant—i.e., without introducing a manipulation. For example, Martínez and Tobia (2023) surveyed law professors’ views on dozens of legal theory debates, inspired by the Bourget and Chalmers (2014) survey of philosophers. The results clarify expert legal theorists’ beliefs about central debates, from legal interpretation (e.g., textualism or purposivism) to the justification of criminal punishment (e.g., retributivism or deterrence).

Other recent research has made use of other sophisticated methods—that do not rely on participants’ self-report—to gain insight into the cognitive processes that underlie people’s reasoning about legal concepts. Some researchers have advocated for the use of “eye-tracking” methods to better understand legal reasoning (see Engel & Rahal 2022)—a popular method in psychology to document the trajectory of participants’ visual attention during experimental tasks. The key principle is that, when information is presented visually (as in images or text), participants must orient the stimuli toward the foveal region of the eye and fixate on the stimulus for at least 200 or 300 milliseconds to acquire the information. In this way, eye-tracking data can provide a source of insight into the information processing underlying behavior during a given task.

2.3.2 Behavioral Methods

While most experimental jurisprudence has used psychological methods to study human judgment, some employ behavioral methods and/or study human behavior. For example, Sheppard (2012) sought to determine how a legal expert’s caselaw decisions depend on the amount of time available to decide. An empirical study recruited law students in a simulated judicial decision-making exercise, in which some participants had a two-minute time limit to write an opinion and others had unlimited time. The group with a time limit had a lower strength of conviction in their reasoning. For an overview of studies on the influence of factors like time pressure and rules versus standards on judicial behavior, see Sheppard (2025). As a second example, Spamann et al. (2021) recruited judges from seven countries to participate in a fifty-five-minute simulation of a judicial decision. The study recorded the judge’s use of specific documents (e.g., briefs vs. statement of facts vs. precedent) to better understand judicial behavior.

In the neighboring discipline of economics, there is a long tradition of research that seeks to mimic dynamic social interactions in a controlled experimental setting. This research methodology draws on a suite of “economic games”, in which multiple players interact under varying instructions that allow them to increase their monetary reward. The application of economic games to legally relevant behavior has had a profound influence on the scientific understanding of legal phenomena and given rise to a unique subdiscipline, now known as law-and-economics.

One of the most influential applications of economic games was geared to understanding humans’ tendency to exact punishment on antisocial partners (Fehr & Gächter 2000). By employing a variation on the public goods game, this study documents participants’ willingness to exact retributive punishment on non-cooperative others, i.e., on those who fall short of the average financial contribution to the common good. Participants tended to exact punishment, reducing the non-cooperators’ wealth, even though doing so implied a monetary cost (i.e., costly punishment), even in one-off games (where they themselves would not stand to benefit from the efficacy of punishment in bringing about cooperation), and even when punishment occurs without communication between the punisher and punishee (such that the punishee does not know they have been punished; Nadelhoffer, Heshmati, et al. 2013). In adaptations of the two-player trust game (Charness & Dufwenberg 2006; Ederer & Stremitzer 2017) document the role of guilt aversion in sustaining trust and cooperation, in which a promisor’s aversion to disappointing a promisee underlies the promisor’s generosity. To the extent that those findings use sophisticated empirical methods to address results that have been used in philosophical arguments about the law, we can conceive of them as part of X-Jur, their classification as law-and-economics notwithstanding.

2.3.3 Observational Methods

One of the inherent limitations of (artificial) experimental research derives from participants’ intentional or unintentional tendency to modify their behavior in reaction to the understanding that they are being observed—and, particularly, to behave in ways that do not reflect their real-world conduct (see §3.1.2). To overcome this, some research in the social sciences turns to observational methods, such as quasi-experimental techniques or natural experiments, in which individuals’ real-world behavior is documented under conditions that approximate those of a controlled experiment.

For example, Thompson et al. (2025) uploaded a random sample of entries about past legal decisions in Ireland onto Wikipedia. They did not announce this change, and simply observed the pattern of citation of these (and other control cases not on Wikipedia) before and after the upload. Thompson et al. report that Irish judges increased citation of the Wikipedia cases more than to the control cases, taking this result to indicate that the judiciary turns to Wikipedia. As another example, consider Baumgartner and Kneer (2025), who examine the ordinary concept of “reasonableness” by documenting how the term is used in a corpus of naturally occurring language (see also §2.3.5).

The previous two examples are explicitly situated within legal-philosophical debates, but there is abundant prior experimental research documenting the phenomenon of ingroup bias—the idea that individuals judge other members of their demographic or ideological ingroup more favorably than non-members. This pattern could raise certain concerns for jurisprudence, namely, that judges may deviate from certain standards of impartiality by evaluating ingroup members in a more lenient manner than outgroup members. Research by Lee Epstein and colleagues (2018) examined this precise hypothesis by analyzing 4644 votes on 530 US Supreme Court cases involving free speech (between 1953 and 2014) as a function of justices’ political leanings. In line with evidence of ingroup bias, the study demonstrated that—while liberal justices were more supportive of free speech overall—both conservative and liberal justices appeared to exhibit greater support for free speech on cases that aligned with their political values.

2.3.4 Neuroscience

Neuroscientific methods, including electroencephalography (EEG) and functional magnetic resonance imaging (fMRI), examine brain activity. Some of these methods have been applied to make progress in legal philosophy. For example, a longstanding debate in philosophy of criminal law concerns the distinction between mens rea categories (see §2.2.1). For the purposes of criminal liability, what distinguishes “knowledge” from “recklessness”? A collaboration of neuroscientists, lawyers, and philosophers investigated this question with neuroscience (Vilares et al. 2017; Jones, Montague, & Yaffe 2020). They presented participants with clear cases of knowing and reckless behavior and measured the participants’ brain activity with fMRI; then, they found that a machine learning algorithm trained on that data could correctly classify people as knowing or reckless 71% of the time (in some circumstances), based on data about brain activity alone. They argue that this supports a “detectable distinction” in the brain between knowledge and recklessness (Jones, Montague, & Yaffe 2020: 21).

Others have applied similar methods to questions in criminal law (see, e.g., Buckholtz et al. 2008) and law and legal theory more broadly (see, e.g., Jones, Schall, & Shen 2021).

2.3.5 Analysis of Naturally Occurring Language

Experimental jurisprudence is increasingly turning to methods that analyze naturally occurring language. These methods include corpus linguistics (e.g., Lee & Mouritsen 2018), machine learning, especially word embeddings (e.g., Choi 2024; Gries et al. 2024), and large language models (e.g., Arbel & Hoffman 2024; Engel & McAdams 2024; but see Waldon, Schneider, et al. forthcomingb; Lee & Egbert 2024; Choi unpublished). All these examples concern debates about legal interpretation, but scholars have also used these methods to analyze particular jurisprudential concepts, like reasonableness (Nyarko & Sanga 2022; Baumgartner & Kneer 2025) and consent (Nyarko & Sanga 2022).

3. Critiques of Experimental Jurisprudence

Consider two types of critiques of experimental jurisprudence. The first focuses on applying empirical methods to philosophical questions more broadly; therefore, they are also described as “domain-general” (Jiménez 2025: 79). Such criticisms apply to any attempt to inform philosophical debates using empirical data and hold across a wide set of empirically informed theoretical approaches (i.e., across experimental philosophy, not just X-Jur). These critiques include: (a) the problem of replicability, (b) limitations of survey and vignette studies, and (c) sampling from only WEIRD (i.e., Western, Educated, Industrialized, Rich, Democratic) populations.

The second type of criticism concerns the application of empirical methods to legal-philosophical questions; therefore, they are also described as “domain-specific” (Jiménez 2025: 79). These criticisms focus on features uniquely associated with law and the concepts essential to it. One such criticism aims to establish that X-Jur’s contributions are either irrelevant to jurisprudence or of only limited significance, given the nature of jurisprudence. A second type of domain-specific criticism is the “expertise defense”, which argues that X-Jur incorrectly focuses on laypeople, but to learn about the law and legal concepts, it should examine the judgments of legal experts—such as legal philosophers or officials.

3.1 Domain-General (Methodological) Criticisms

We will first discuss three domain-general critiques of experimental methodology as applied to solving philosophical questions.

3.1.1 Replicability

A recent effort to estimate the reproducibility of psychological science concluded that only between 33% and 50% of studies published in high-ranking psychology journals in 2008 could successfully be replicated (Open Science Collaboration 2015). Put simply, this implies that when re-running an experiment while adhering to the authors’ methodological guidelines (in terms of sampling and protocol) and ensuring ideal conditions under which to observe the effect (i.e., high statistical power), the researchers’ repetition of the experiment did not produce the initial published result. More broadly, scholars in areas including psychology, political science, medicine, and behavioral economics (e.g., Camerer et al. 2016) have examined replicability, reporting some replications and some failures of studies to replicate. Colloquially, these replication failures have been described as a “replication crisis”.

Given the close connections between the methods employed in psychological research and those used in experimental jurisprudence (see §2.3.1), replication failures in psychology may have raised certain doubts about the trustworthiness of published findings in experimental jurisprudence. Unfortunately, there is currently no estimate of the reproducibility of experimental jurisprudence, but Cova and colleagues (Cova et al. 2021) attempted to replicate 40 studies in the neighboring discipline of experimental philosophy published between 2003 and 2015, finding a replication rate of approximately 70%. This suggests that experimental philosophy studies may be more trustworthy, as a whole, than studies in psychological science. To the extent that X-Jur is more closely related to experimental philosophy than to psychology, that should give us reason for optimism.

This might be due, in part, to changes adopted by the scientific community in reaction to the so-called reproducibility crisis. Since the publication of the Open Science Collaboration’s paper, researchers have adopted a series of research practices aimed at ensuring reproducibility, such as making their data and analyses available online and reporting pre-registered studies. Pre-registration requires experimenters to pre-commit to various choices including sample size, the precise analyses that will be performed, and inclusion criteria—in order to reduce “researcher degrees of freedom”, especially the researchers’ freedom to hypothesize after the results are known (also known as HARKing) which is thought to be one of the main causes of the replication crisis phenomenon. Scholars have argued that following these practices improves reproducibility and increases scientific credibility (see Nosek et al. 2018). To the extent that many works in X-Jur follow these guidelines (see, for instance, the open data and stimuli for the cross-cultural Experimental Jurisprudence Cross-Cultural Study Swap project), we have reasons to be cautiously optimistic about the field’s reproducibility.

Many experimental philosophers use crowdsourcing platforms to recruit participants, as this provides easy access to populations that are more diverse than the convenience samples usually available in Western College campuses (Behrend et al. 2011, see also §3). Recent research has found that the quality of data from one prominent crowdsourcing provider (Amazon’s MTurk) has deteriorated dramatically in recent years (Chmielewski & Kucker 2020; Peer et al. 2021). This might raise alarms about the reproducibility of work in X-Jur to the extent that X-Jurists rely on data from this platform. Anecdotally, we know of many X-Jurists who have taken notice and switched to different platforms and/or started to supplement their data with other recruitment methods. Future studies should assess the reproducibility of X-Jur directly, using systematic replication attempts.

3.1.2 Skepticism about Survey Experiments

As we have seen, experimental jurisprudence deploys a number of different empirical methods to address its questions (§2.3), but many use survey-experiments (Hoeft 2023; see also §2.3.1). One well-known criticism in psychology is that the participants’ responses to vignette-based studies might not accurately reflect their behavior in real life (for a critical review of the issue of ecological validity, see Holleman et al. 2020). While much X-Jur work aims to understand human beliefs and judgment, and not to predict human behavior, one should still worry about the limitations of vignette studies: They are often abstract, limited in detail, and detached from real-world context. If their features depart too heavily from those of real-life legal decision-making, we would not be able to conclude much about the latter based on the former (Jiménez 2025). Versions of this critique may also apply to traditional philosophical thought experimentation, which is often deliberately abstract and decontextualized (for discussion about this worry in experimental philosophy, see Machery 2017). As in traditional thought experimentation, experimental jurisprudence sometimes seeks to test fundamental conceptual or legal criteria by either reducing a scenario’s detail or complexity or by considering exotic hypotheticals.

While critical of over-reliance on one specific method, these objections to survey methods do not necessarily represent existential threats to experimental jurisprudence. Instead, they point towards ways in which the field would benefit from considering different methods, such as qualitative research and behavioral experiments (see Hoeft 2023). These methods would, according to critics, be better suited “to capture […] the fact that law is a complex, institutionalized, social and cultural practice” (Jiménez 2025: 90). At the very least, however, the criticism as stated doesn’t apply to the parts of experimental jurisprudence which don’t rely on survey-experiments, opting instead for observational strategies, such as the studies that employ corpus linguistics (§2.3.5).

3.1.3 Over-Reliance on WEIRD Populations

A further criticism, emerging from a broader issue in the empirical study of the mind, was highlighted by a team of anthropologists and psychologists (Henrich, Heine & Norenzayan 2010a; 2010b) in what is now a landmark paper. Through a number of case studies, Henrich and colleagues illustrate their broad claim that “most people are not WEIRD”. Here, WEIRD refers to the acronym “Western, educated, industrialized, rich and democratic” and the psychological peculiarities of individuals raised in this cultural context, through a flurry of studies comparing WEIRD and non-WEIRD societies. This fact serves as a note of caution against interpreting the results of empirical studies, so often conducted in European and North American contexts, and increasingly through the use of online platforms, as evidence of fundamental or cross-culturally robust patterns of judgment (see also Blasi et al. 2022). This concern bears on the generalizability of research in experimental jurisprudence; and some researchers have sought to address it by investigating whether and how legal concepts operate in different cultural and linguistic contexts (Hannikainen et al. 2021; 2022; Tobia, Hannikainen, et al. forthcoming).

This criticism is usually framed in terms of the diversity of research participants, but it could also be raised with respect to researchers. Lack of researcher diversity can constrain or otherwise impact the questions posed, theories developed, hypotheses tested, data interpretations offered, and implications explored. Researchers in the broader field of philosophy are unrepresentative in various respects; as just one example, consider gender. A recent study found that women constitute a smaller share of Ph.D.s in philosophy compared to even many STEM fields (Leslie et al. 2015). Such concerns certainly extend to sub-fields within legal philosophy. Much of general jurisprudence concerns debates among famous men (e.g. Hart–Dworkin) and co-citation analysis reveals general jurisprudence to be especially self-referential and isolationist, when compared to other areas of legal philosophy (Bystranowski 2024). It is too soon to tell how X-Jur stands, either in general or comparatively to other legal-philosophical fields, but the diversity of its researchers is undoubtedly an important value to which to attend as the field continues to develop.

In concluding this section (§3.1), it is worth noting that all three critiques could apply to experimental philosophy of any subject—law, morality, epistemology, and so on. Versions of these general critiques might also be leveled at traditional legal-philosophical methodology: Is one philosopher’s intuition about a thought experiment replicable, shared by (all) other legal philosophers (§3.1.1), does the often abstract nature of thought experimentation render it insufficient to inform theory about complex legal systems (§3.1.2), and does the philosophical literature rely too heavily on intuitions of Western populations or philosophers of certain races, genders, or socio-economic backgrounds (§3.1.3)? The debate about experimental jurisprudence has carried the incidental benefit of turning attention to these foundational questions about the general methodology of legal philosophy.

3.2 Domain-Specific Criticisms

In this section, we consider a number of critiques of X-Jur that appeal to specific features of jurisprudence. Where the critiques discussed in §3.1 could be leveled at many efforts to use empirical data to bear on philosophy (whether in jurisprudence, metaphysics, or aesthetics), the critiques discussed here are more closely connected to specific facts or claims about the law or the philosophical field of jurisprudence.

This section considers two broad sets of “domain-specific” critiques. First, we consider objections that, given the nature of jurisprudence, the contributions offered by X-Jur are either irrelevant or of limited significance (§3.2.1). Second (in §3.2.2), we consider the frequent objection that most X-Jur studies the wrong population: ordinary people. Instead, this objection goes, X-Jur should study populations with expertise in law or legal philosophy.

3.2.1 X-Jur’s Contribution to Traditional Jurisprudence is Irrelevant or Limited

There is debate about whether X-Jur meaningfully contributes to traditional jurisprudence, given the nature of jurisprudence and the questions it asks. One possible position is that X-Jur contributes nothing to these debates—the method is irrelevant. Perhaps surprisingly, few have defended that claim in print. Instead, the vast majority of such critiques assert a milder position: X-Jur has limited relevance to traditional jurisprudence (e.g., Dickson 2022; Himma 2023; Jiménez 2021; 2025).

Some critics point to the limited usefulness of general X-Jur because of the nature of general theorizing about the law. For instance, Dickson (2022) is skeptical of what she calls “vox pop” techniques in legal philosophy. Although conceding that survey data might be useful she argues that “such data could at best be a starting point, and something for the legal philosopher to work with, interpret, and extrapolate from” (2022: 114). This is so because legal philosophy is largely about extracting and interpreting people’s self-understandings in terms of law, which manifest themselves (often implicitly) in a range of attitudes and behaviors in which people make use of and draw distinctions about the law (2022: 113–114). These self-understandings “do not come pre-packaged and explicit such that the legal philosopher’s job is merely to record and reproduce them” (Dickson 2022: 114).

At least some defenders of X-Jur appear sympathetic to these critiques, endorsing a similar distinction to Dickson’s between X-Jur as one “step” or one tool in the philosopher’s toolkit and X-Jur as a full “replacement” of traditional methods. For many X-Jurists, collecting data is only the initial step, with further steps requiring the interpretation and evaluation of the data based on theoretical concerns (see discussion in Tobia 2023). In fact, one of the features that distinguishes X-Jur from other empirical approaches to the law is its goal to inform traditional philosophical questions about the law (Tobia 2022, 2023; Prochownik 2021). Thus, these scholars argue, X-Jur’s approach broadly is consistent with the general view of the character of legal philosophy presented by Dickson (see also §1.2).

Many defenders of X-Jur also appear sympathetic to Dickson’s second point: we can only learn so much about people’s concepts from eliciting intuitions in response to surveys :

the self-understandings of those living under law are more implicit, and diffuse, than the “vox-pop” or “eliciting intuitions” notions connote. (Dickson 2022: 113)

The phrase “vox-pop” might suggest that X-Jur conducts public opinion polls, but the vast majority of X-Jur research does not employ a simple polling method. Instead, X-Jur uses varied research methods (see §2.3 for a review), especially survey-experiments. Unlike a poll, experiments can provide insight into which factors underlie people’s judgments and which features characterize people’s concepts, even when these are not immediately clear to subjects themselves.

This section has briefly reviewed the more common version of this critique of X-Jur: It offers a limited contribution to jurisprudence, but it cannot replace traditional philosophical inquiry. A closer inspection of this debate reveals that there may not be many substantial disagreements between these critics and the many practitioners of experimental jurisprudence who see the method as complementary to or continuous with traditional legal-philosophical methods.

However, it is possible to imagine a stronger criticism stating that legal philosophy aims to reveal the deep nature of law as a phenomenon that is not bound in any way by people’s concept of it (e.g., Greenberg 2016: 1950). Under this view, any experimental endeavors to reveal the folk concept of law would be irrelevant to legal theorizing. However, since this broader criticism equally applies to the whole tradition of conceptual jurisprudence and not experimental jurisprudence specifically, we will not address it here (see, for example, Dickson 2022: 123–134 for a critical discussion).

Another critique claims that studies in general X-Jur (e.g., Miotto, Almeida & Struchiner 2023; Flanagan & Hannikainen 2022; Donelson & Hannikainen 2020) are of limited relevance to traditional conceptual debates in general jurisprudence because the survey questions used by researchers in general X-Jur do not make explicit all relevant implications of the different legal-philosophical positions under test. Consequently, they fail to trigger subjects’ actual beliefs about the law, because subjects would presumably change their responses if they had knowledge of the difficulties associated with them. Thus, these survey-experiments fail to expose the conceptual practices of competent speakers and, consequently, cannot inform jurisprudential debates concerning the folk concept of law. In other words, a survey could only tell us something about ordinary beliefs if it clarified to participants “all of the implications of an answer that might affect how they respond” (Himma 2023: 355). At the very least, the researchers should make sure that survey responses reflect “all potentially relevant uncontentious conceptual and logical implications” (Himma 2023: 355).

To give an example: Himma (2023) criticizes Miotto, Almeida and Struchiner (2023; discussed in §2.1.2) for not spelling out that saying the society of morally perfect angels has law “entails that it is not a necessary condition for the existence of a legal system that it criminalises harmful acts” (2023: 355). According to Himma, if it was made clear to the participants that, in a society of morally perfect beings, there is no need for criminal norms (as well as a vast array of other legal norms that characterize human societies), their intuitions about whether angels have a legal system would change, leading to different results. While other studies by these researchers arguably circumvent this specific criticism (see Study 5), there is no doubt that they also fail to specify all (even uncontentious) implications that could be relevant.

A strong reading of this criticism entails that no experiment could ever lead to conclusive evidence about folk concepts. After all, no matter how long the survey vignettes and response options were, some possible implications that could affect participants’ responses would always be left to spell out. In that stronger variant, Himma’s objection leads to global skepticism about survey data’s usefulness for solving conceptual issues in philosophy and other related fields (and would thus arguably belong to the domain-general family of criticisms). After all, vignettes in moral psychology, the psychology of causation, and many other complex disciplines also fail to specify all potentially relevant implications that might affect lay responses. Moreover, one might argue that this is intentional. Psychologists refrain from providing explicit theoretical information to avoid leading participants to respond in accordance with the theories that were supposed to be under test.

A milder interpretation of this criticism assumes that the researchers in X-Jur should always aim to clarify in their surveys all relevant uncontentious implications of adopting certain positions by participants. For example, according to this criticism, Miotto and colleagues should describe in their study “what norms a society of real angels would need in order to do what they need done” (Himma 2023: 355), but not other uncontentious implications that are irrelevant. An experiment containing this information would then lead to conclusive evidence about the relationship between the folk concept of law and coercion. This criticism, whether successful or not, doesn’t challenge the relevance of X-Jur per se. It simply points out ways in which armchair philosophy might lead to better X-Jur. Also, the criticism does not seem to apply on equal terms to all legal-philosophical questions. For instance, one may doubt whether there exists an uncontentious theory regarding the relationship of law and morality (Flanagan 2024).

3.2.2 The Intuitions of Experts, Not Ordinary People, Matter for Jurisprudence

Another important criticism of X-Jur that applies to both general and particular X-Jur boils down to the claim that it studies the wrong population. Most existing X-Jur studies laypeople. However, the expertise defense claims, it should only study experts (e.g., legal theoreticians, legal practitioners, or legal officials). Laypeople’s judgments on legal matters are irrelevant to legal theorizing, either because they are unreliable (Himma 2023), indeterminate (Jiménez 2021, 2025; Sebok 2021), or not authoritative (Jiménez 2025). One needs many years of university-level legal or philosophical education (Himma 2023) and competence in legal reasoning (Jiménez 2021; Sebok 2021; Himma 2023) to be able to competently address jurisprudential questions. Moreover, some claim that only the beliefs and attitudes of people in certain positions of authority—and not those of the population at large—matter in answering questions about legal concepts (Jiménez 2025).

This criticism resembles the objection formulated by traditional philosophers against experimental philosophy, which became known as the “expertise objection” or “expertise defense” (see generally Nado 2014; but see Jiménez 2021: 14–15). The expertise objection against experimental philosophy assumes that ordinary people’s responses to hypothetical philosophical cases (but not those of experts) are susceptible to philosophically irrelevant factors and are thus unreliable. Therefore, it’s the philosophers’ intuitions that should matter in philosophy.

The similarity between the expertise objection in general X-Phi and in X-Jur is especially close when it comes to questions in general jurisprudence. For instance, one critic claimed that “advanced training in law or philosophy is needed to address conceptual questions” (Himma 2023: 369). That would be the case because, although linguistic competence requires speakers to correctly apply terms to easy cases (i.e., cases in which the term clearly applies or clearly does not apply), it doesn’t include the ability to correctly decide whether the term applies in hard cases. So, while ordinary speakers may be able to decide when the term “law” applies in a variety of easy cases, they do not have the deepened conceptual competence that would allow them to apply the term accurately in hard cases concerning the borders of the term’s application, such as those disputed by legal theorists (2023: 366–368). Doing so requires an extra skill to extract from these patterns “shared metaphysical views about the nature of the corresponding kind” (2023: 372), which can only be acquired by a special kind of academic training. This argument leads to the conclusion that, in cases of conflict, lay intuitions are irrelevant (2023: 373).

Regarding questions in particular jurisprudence, the expertise objection takes a different form. Legal systems are at least partly constituted by social facts, such as the beliefs and behaviors of legal officials (e.g., Hart 1961). Thus, the beliefs of legal officials—but not those of laypeople—are partly constitutive of law. If that account of the nature of law is true (for discussion, see Adler 2006), then we should care exclusively about legal officials as a population, given that it is their beliefs and actions (and, by extension, their concepts) which create legal meaning (Jiménez 2021; 2025).

A related critique of particular X-Jur has claimed that it has limited explanatory power with regards to legal theory and practice as compared to traditional jurisprudence. Consider the research by Knobe and Shapiro (2021), discussed in Section 2.2.2. The paper’s main claim is that the effects of norm violation over the ordinary notion of causation mirror the case law doctrine of proximate cause to a large extent. Moreover, they argue that this is so because the legal concept of a proximate cause builds upon the ordinary notion of causation, even though it also departs from it in some ways. According to Sebok (2021), however, an alternative legal rule, known as the risk rule, explains contemporary case law even better than ordinary causation can. While in some tort law cases the results of applying Knobe and Shapiro’s “abnormality test” and the risk rule align, other cases are better accounted for in terms of the risk rule. This, Sebok points out, “reveal the limits of the use of research into ordinary judgments about causation for law” (2021: 4).

One response to this debate has noted that Sebok’s objection (risk rule runs counter to judgments of ordinary causation) is itself offering an empirically testable claim (Tobia 2022: 768). One could think of similar objections to other findings in particular X-Jur where skeptics would point to alternative legal sources as competing explanations to the ones rooted in ordinary reasoning. All of those would depend on empirical facts about the legal rule’s congruence or incongruence with lay intuitions and relative explanatory merit.

The expertise objection against general X-Jur as conceived above faces at least two significant challenges. First, it is in “need to offer a theory about why the opinions of experts is to be preferred to the folk when it comes to law”; second, it “needs to specify the sort of expertise required and to think about who has that expertise” (Donelson 2023: 37; for further discussion of these questions, see also Finnis 2011; Atiq 2025; Marmor 2013).

3.2.2.1 Whose Views Matter?

Let’s consider possible answers to the who question first. Who are the relevant experts capable of answering difficult conceptual questions in general jurisprudence? Critics of X-Jur have proposed three primary answers: (a) legal philosophers, or perhaps the narrower category of “theorists with PhD in philosophy or law” (Himma 2023: 371), (b) “lawyers” more broadly (2023: 372), and (c) “legal officials” (Jiménez 2021). None of these options is free from controversy.

Consider the view that it’s legal philosophers whose views matter. It is not clear why legal philosophers’ intuitions about the law would be epistemically superior to those of laypeople (Donelson 2023; Flanagan 2024). For instance, many legal philosophers did not attend law school, which may put into question whether their understanding of legal systems is sufficient to decide hard conceptual questions about the law (Donelson 2023: 38). Moreover, even if we would only consider the views of legal philosophers who did attend law school, the mere fact that certain intuitions are shared by such group does not in itself speak in favor of their accuracy; it may as well be that people who endorse certain intuitions tend to become legal philosophers (Flanagan 2024; cf. Cummins 1998). Finally, accepting that legal philosophers have a very important role in coming up with theories that build upon folk concepts (as argued by Dickson 2022; Atiq 2025) isn’t to say that we should poll legal philosophers. Instead, one could accept that advice by using poll data collected from any population as an input for philosophical reflection.

How about legal practitioners or officials (Himma 2023; Jiménez 2021)? It is arguable that at least some sorts of legal expertise (e.g., being an attorney or a judge) may provide individuals with a predictive advantage similar to the one scientific experts have over laypeople, making them better candidates for relevant experts than legal philosophers (Flanagan 2024; cf. Donelson 2023: 37; Jiménez 2021). However, it is unclear that legal practitioners have a conceptual competence to decide general-level theoretical questions concerning the nature of law, as one can be a fully capable practitioner of law without understanding its nature as a social practice (Jiménez 2025: 87); especially if one considers that “some jurisdictions and law schools fail to require aspiring attorneys to learn anything about such questions” (Donelson 2023: 37). Moreover, prioritizing officials’ judgments about what the concept of law is has been charged with circularity--it is not possible to define legal officials without a prior concept of law, which, therefore, must be decided in other ways than by consulting legal officials (Flanagan 2024). Finally, this view has troubling consequences for the traditional methodology of jurisprudence. Legal philosophers are usually not legal officials directly shaping the law’s content. If so, then this version of the expertise objection implies that “today’s experimental jurisprudence is largely looking in the wrong place—but so have decades of traditional jurisprudence” (Tobia 2022: 769).

Ultimately, the choice of population might be less consequential than the debate might suggest, given that several recent X-Jur studies found similar patterns in how the folk and legal experts respond to hypothetical legal cases (e.g., Kneer & Bourgeois-Gironde 2017; Prochownik et al. 2025). Thus, for at least some questions, examining ordinary concepts also illuminates legal experts’ concepts (Prochownik et al. 2025; Tobia 2022: 765–770).

However, the correspondence between lay concepts and legal concepts is not universal. Other studies have uncovered differences between laypeople’s and legal experts’ concepts (e.g., Tobia 2024 on the concept of intent). And other studies found that lay intuitions diverge from the law (e.g., Robinson & Darley 1995).

A final complication in this debate about “whose views matter” is that there is sometimes disagreement within these populations. Several experimental jurisprudence studies find that laypeople disagree with each other (see, e.g., §2.1.1. on laypeople’s rule violation judgments). And among experts, there is sometimes disagreement. For example, consider the question of whether experts endorse legal positivism. Bourget and Chalmers (2014: 12) surveyed philosophers, finding that only 40% endorse legal positivism; yet a study of American law professors finds that a much larger proportion (74%) endorse legal positivism (Martinez & Tobia 2023). Even if a legal philosopher concludes that laypeople are not the right population to consult, the choice of which expert population (e.g., professors of philosophy or professors of law) makes a difference. And empirical work can surface useful facts about the existence and nature of such disagreements.

3.2.2.2 How Does Expertise Matter in Jurisprudence?

Now, consider the second challenge faced by the expertise objection as applied to general X-Jur—providing a story of why relevant expertise would make a difference (Donelson 2023: 37). One possible answer is that experts are capable of reconstructing shared assumptions and implications of the conceptual practices that, in addition to these practices themselves, determine the conditions of concepts’ application in hard cases (Himma 2023: 367). Himma observes that deciding hard cases involves considering counterfactual hypothetical cases—an ability that is essential for academic training in law and legal philosophy. If so, then theorists in law and philosophy who have undergone training in counterfactual reasoning would have an advantage in addressing difficult conceptual questions (2023: 372). This story relies on the assumption that “people need some training in counterfactual reasoning to do it competently” (2023: 372). However, scientific findings suggest that the ability for counterfactual reasoning is a part of ordinary human cognition that already emerges in childhood (Flanagan 2024; cf. Byrne 2016).

Another “why” answer (Jiménez 2021, 2025) states that legal experts have authority over the meaning of “law” because their conceptual practices and understandings largely shape the referent of this concept (i.e., the way the law operates in reality). However, others challenge that “law really is a concept fixed by expert opinion” (Donelson 2023: 37; Tobia 2022): Arguably, “law” is not a concept determined exclusively based on the expert’s views, like it is, for instance, in the case of scientific concepts (Donelson 2023: 37; see also Adler 2006). This seems to find confirmation in the widely shared view in jurisprudence that ordinary intuitions matter for theorizing about the concept of law (e.g., Dickson 2022).

A closely related story focuses on particular legal concepts, such as “proximate cause” or “consent” (Jiménez 2021). Again, the argument is that these concepts have their legal meaning determined by legal authorities alone, even if there might be substantial overlap with laypeople’s folk concepts. However, this would go against the perspective often explicitly taken in judicial and scholarly writing, which grants an important role to ordinary people’s understanding of legal terms (Flanagan 2024).

In concluding, consider a final different proposal about what kind of expertise matters in jurisprudence. Rather than locating expertise in one population that has the “right” intuitions, this view understands conflicts in intuitions and the complex relationship among lay, philosophical, and legal concepts as sites worthy of philosophical exploration. This view begins by noting that, in many legal systems, ordinary people also create law—contributing directly to the production of legal content as jurors deciding mixed questions or as statutory interpreters. Moreover, any legal expert (whether a legal philosopher or legal official) was once an ordinary person, and it is plausible that they bring some aspects of that ordinary experience and understanding to law. There are similar considerations about legal language: Law is clearly written and expressed with technical language, but it is not a foreign language to its ordinary citizens. Legal notions—cause, consent, reasonableness, intent—share names with similar notions that we use in ordinary life, whose legal meanings are not entirely distinct from their ordinary ones. Empirical study of ordinary notions and ordinary people can help disentangle the ordinary from the legal (Tobia 2023: 2507).

On this proposal, experimental jurisprudence plays a methodological role in jurisprudence. The question about whether law should adopt or even focus on the understanding of an ordinary person, legal philosopher, legal academic, or legal official is itself a worthy jurisprudential question. In many legal domains, there are plausible reasons to consider both ordinary and expert understandings of law. The relevant expertise of legal philosophers includes generating theories and hypotheses about what connects or distinguishes legal notions from corresponding ordinary ones. Philosophers have long theorized about the relationship between ordinary notions (e.g., ordinary cause) and legal ones (e.g., legal cause) and informed legal argument with thought experiments about ordinary notions. This perspective sees experimental jurisprudence as playing a similar methodological role as these traditional methods of philosophical analysis: Conducting experiments about how laypeople, philosophers, and legal officials understand law can unearth important facts for improved jurisprudential debate. These facts do not generally resolve jurisprudential debates, but they provide new and sharper insights for philosophical analysis of law.

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Cited Resources

• [MPC] Model Penal Code Annotated
• Sebok, Anthony, 2021, “Beware of Strangers Bearing Gifts”, JOTWELL, 14 January 2021, Reviewing Knobe and Shapiro 2021. [Sebok 2021 available online]
• Strohmaier, Niek, 2017, “Introducing: Experimental Jurisprudence”, Leiden Law Blog, 1 December 2017.

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• Legal Theory Blog: The Legal Theory Blog posts new research in jurisprudence, including experimental jurisprudence. The Blog also features a “Legal Theory Lexicon”, which offers short introductions to important legal theory concepts.

Related Entries

causation: in the law | concepts | experimental philosophy | law: and language | naturalism: in legal philosophy | nature of law | nature of law: legal positivism | nature of law: natural law theories | property and ownership | punishment, legal | thick ethical concepts

Acknowledgments

The authors wish to thank Brian Flanagan, Lucas Miotto, and Noel Struchiner.