1. Most of the information in this biography is derived from Findlay’s “My Life” in Studies in the Philosophy of J. N. Findlay (1985) confirmed when possible in other sources.

2.. Findlay’s South African background obviously provokes questions about his politics. He never commented, publicly or privately, on the South African liberation struggle. If this is a fault, so also it was a fault in Camus never to comment on the struggle for the liberation of Algeria. Camus was a pied noir; Findlay a pied blanc, and they were both more loyal to their friends than to an idea. On most matters, Findlay’s sympathies leaned to the left: at one time he even ran a left-wing bookstore that later proved to be Communist front.

3. Many years later, in 1967, Findlay took up the question of whether non-human animals have aesthetic experiences. He concluded:

There are, I should say, no radically different types of conscious mind, only minds of different degrees of elaboration or development. I think with Pythagoras that earwigs cannot be utterly different from Einsteins, and with Leibniz that the sleeping monads present in pokers are not utterly different from the lucid monads that give lectures on philosophy. This is why I do not believe in bull-fights or factory farms, and why I do not doubt that cats, cows, birds, and other less exuberant animals may at times fall into a zestful, purring meditation which I should not hesitate to call ‘aesthetic.’ Aesthetic attitudes are not, therefore, the special perquisite of a long-haired class produced in certain relaxed societies; they are latent in whatever consciousness is. (“The Perspicuous and the Poignant”, 1967d [1972: 95])

4. Findlay’s argument was: God must be either necessary or contingent. He cannot be necessary, because His non-existence is possible. And He cannot be contingent, because no contingent being is worthy of worship. Findlay repudiated this argument in 1970.

5. Russell had written about Meinong, “There is no problem at all in truth and falsehood; that some propositions are true and some false, just as some roses are red and some white” (Russell 1904: 525).

6. The idea that a root ethical judgment is a kind of wish is rare in philosophy but not unprecedented. Russell, in a neglected book called Religion and Science (1935: ch. IX) argued that moral judgments were nothing more than generalized wishes, in the grammatical form of the optative. Optatives have the feature of being neither true nor false, which is what Russell felt about ethical judgments, at least in the 1930s. In rejecting the view that ethical judgments are grammatically indicative, Russell and Findlay preceded by two decades the view, common in the 1950s, that moral judgments are not indicatives but disguised imperatives (Hare 1952).

7. “These curious inventions of Goodman plainly have no correspondence with any genuine essences, and have no function in science or philosophy, except, perhaps, by their sheer absurdity and uselessness, to make us ask what a genuine form or essence might be” (DC: 50).

8. A point by point rebuttal by Findlay of the first 80 sections of Husserl’s Ideen was published in The Philosophical Forum in Fall 2018.

9. This argument is referred to in many places by Findlay as “the Platonic inversion.”