The Free Rider Problem

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Garrett Cullity replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

In many contexts, the efficient production of a good by a group is jeopardized by the incentive each member of the group has not to contribute towards its production. If

1. the benefit received by each member of the group depends mainly on the level of others’ contribution towards producing it,
2. the cost of any one member’s contribution is likely to be greater than the resulting benefit to that member, and
3. one member’s decision whether or not to contribute will have little effect on the level of contribution by others,

then each member may have an incentive not to contribute, leaving the work of producing the good to the others. In situations with this structure, I can reason: if others are producing the good, I will receive it without contributing; if not, I will not receive it if I do contribute; so either way, I am better off not contributing. But if many of us reason in the same way, this can threaten to make each worse off than they would have been if all had contributed. This is the free rider problem, which has two main manifestations. In its non-production manifestation, these incentives prevent us from producing the good at all. In its free riding manifestation, the good is being produced because some group members are contributing, but it is being produced inefficiently because of the non-contribution of others (the free riders). Notice that in the non-production manifestation, there is a free rider problem but no free riding—because there is no good-production on which to free ride.

The most familiar free rider problems arise in connection with the production and consumption of public goods. Contribution towards the production of a public good can either take the form of giving up one’s own resources in a pooled effort to produce a good that would not exist independently of our actions (for example, volunteering for military service in defence against an external threat) or of constraining one’s own actions as part of a joint effort to reduce the bad effects that are produced when many of us act in an unconstrained way (for example, limiting pollution). We can call these resource contribution and constraint cases, respectively.

The free rider problem invites three kinds of investigation, which this article discusses. There are analytical investigations that seek to understand the dynamics through which free rider problems can arise. There are remedial investigations that seek to identify the range of available solutions to free rider problems, and explain how it is that uncoerced public goods production does actually occur. And there is also a set of normative questions asked by moral and political philosophy. Does the free rider problem illuminate the function of morality or the value of the state? Under what conditions is free riding wrong, and if so, why? Can a foundation for political obligation be found in an anti-free-riding principle? And under what circumstances can coercion justifiably be used by the state to resource the stable production of public goods, and to punish and deter free riding?

These different investigations have been a focus of interest in seven main disciplines. Social psychology asks: To what extent and in what circumstances are people motivated to free ride? and What sorts of countervailing incentives are effective in motivating cooperation when free riding is possible? Game theory asks: Under what circumstances does the rational pursuit of individual self-interest recommend free riding? Informed by those two areas of enquiry, mainstream economics then asks: What real-world mechanisms are the most efficient ways of producing public goods, given the incentives to free ride? Political science asks: What explains the existence of stable public goods production where it does occur, despite the incentives that favor free riding? Evolutionary biology asks: do we need group selection to explain the evolution of the cooperation-securing dispositions that can solve the free rider problem, or is individual selection sufficient? Moral philosophy asks: Under exactly which circumstances is free riding morally wrong, and what explains why it is wrong (when it is)? And relatedly, normative political philosophy asks: Do the moral reasons against free riding supply a grounding for political obligation?

This article starts by locating the free rider problem in relation to other kinds of collective action problem (§1), then describes some of the major landmarks in the history of theorizing about it (§2). Analytical investigations of the problem are examined in §3, remedial investigations in §4, and then the last two sections turn to normative investigations, discussing the treatment of the free rider problem within moral philosophy (§5) and political philosophy (§6).

• 1. Collective Action Problems
• 2. History
  • 2.1 Plato
  • 2.2 Hobbes
  • 2.3 Hume
  • 2.4 Twentieth-Century Developments
• 3. The Causes of Free Rider Problems
  • 3.1 Strategic Structure
  • 3.2 Psychological Factors
  • 3.3 Public Goods
• 4. Solving Free Rider Problems
• 5. The Free Rider Problem and Moral Philosophy
  • 5.1 The Function of Morality?
  • 5.2 The Moral Evaluation of Free Riding
• 6. The Free Rider Problem and Political Philosophy
  • 6.1 The Value of the State
  • 6.2 Political Obligation
  • 6.3 Combatting the Free Rider Problem
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Collective Action Problems

A collective action problem is a situation in which it is better for every member of a group that everyone does A than that no one does A, but conflicts in what the parties regard as being in their own interest risk producing an outcome that is worse for every member than everyone’s doing A would be. Collective action problems contrast with coordination problems. In a coordination problem, producing a mutually advantageous outcome (such as meeting at a rendezvous point) can be obstructed by a lack of information, not by the conflicting interests of the parties (Cronk & Leech 2013: Ch. 1).^[1]

This description of collective action problems is deliberately broad, covering problems of many different kinds. It allows that collective action problems can arise when, in fact, each person’s interests are best served by that person’s doing A, but many people instead falsely believe that they are individually better off not doing A. And it allows for various different ways of specifying what it takes for an outcome to be better or worse for an individual. However, notice that the distinction between collective action problems and coordination problems precludes identifying interests with preference-satisfaction. If you and I fail to meet because, having agreed to rendezvous at the cathedral, I proceed to St Patrick’s while you go to St Brendan’s, then while we are en route we have different preferences (mine being that I arrive at St Patrick’s, yours being that you arrive at St Brendan’s); so if interests consisted in mere preference-satisfaction, our interests in this case would conflict. On the preference-satisfaction view, whenever a mutually advantageous outcome is obstructed by a failure of information it would also be obstructed by conflicting interests, so the distinction between coordination problems and collective action problems would be lost.

The free rider problem can be defined as that particular kind of collective action problem that arises when the efficient collective production of a good is jeopardized by the incentive each agent has not to contribute towards its production. Not all collective action problems are free rider problems—for example, a chicken game has the following strategic structure (where the cells represent the outcomes of the actions available to the two parties, and the numbers represent each party’s preference-ranking of the given outcome):

In a chicken game, conflicting interests jeopardize the attainment of a mutually advantageous outcome, so it is a collective action problem; but it is not a free rider problem, since it is not a situation in which the efficient collective production of a good is jeopardized by each agent’s incentive not to contribute.

One common way in which free rider problems commonly arise is through strategic situations whose underlying structure is that of a multi-party Prisoner’s Dilemma. An n-party Prisoner’s Dilemma can be defined as a situation in which the possible outcomes of interaction between several agents are ranked by each agent as follows:

When everyone has this preference-structure, three significant consequences follow. First, non-cooperation dominates: each agent prefers non-cooperation, whatever the others do. (In each column, the bottom cell is ranked higher than the top.) Second, each prefers everyone’s cooperating to everyone’s not cooperating. (The top left cell is ranked higher than the bottom right cell.) And third, for each agent the highest-ranked outcome is the one where that agent is the only non-cooperator and the lowest ranked outcome is the one where they are the only cooperator. (These are the bottom left and top right cells.) While sharing these three features in common, different n-party Prisoner’s Dilemmas can have different rankings of the other possible outcomes. In some n-party Prisoner’s Dilemmas, the outcome in which everyone cooperates (rank r) is ranked higher than every outcome in which there is an intermediate number m of others who cooperate (rank \(s_m\)); in some, r is ranked lower than \(s_m\) for every intermediate number m; and in others, there is some number of cooperators for which \(r > s_m\) when m is greater than that number and otherwise \(r < s_m\).

But despite this variety, the category of multi-party Prisoner’s Dilemmas is not capacious enough to include all free rider problems. In particular, a free rider problem can fail to have the first of the multi-party Prisoner’s Dilemma’s three distinguishing features (domination). As we will see, free rider problems can become more acute in very large groups, when the benefit accruing to any agent from their own contribution is small and social monitoring of contributions is weak, than it is in small ones; but when the number of contributors is small and the good to be provided is important, contributing to its provision might then serve one’s interests best. For example, if a police service is supported by the resources contributed by millions of people, I may have an incentive to enjoy the service without paying for it; but if there is no public policing it may be in my interests to join a local vigilante group to increase my own security significantly. If so, there can be situations in which, given that the number of contributors is actually large, the efficient provision of a good is jeopardized by the incentive for non-contribution, so we have a free rider problem; but where non-cooperation does not dominate, since it is not true that non-cooperation is preferred whatever the pattern of cooperation or non-cooperation by others is, so we do not have a Prisoner’s Dilemma.

Finally, specifying further, we come to Tragedy of the Commons cases: those where every member of a group has free access to a common resource, and unrestricted use produces full depletion of that resource (G. Hardin 1968). This is one specific kind of multi-party Prisoner’s Dilemma, to be distinguished from other kinds that do not involve resource depletion. It is true that a Tragedy of the Commons need not involve any free riding: if no one constrains their resource use, no one is free riding on the contributions of others towards producing a good. But as we saw, that is not a good test of whether we face a free rider problem. In a Tragedy of the Commons, the good of sustainable ongoing access to the common resource is jeopardized by the incentive each has (through unrestricted use) not to contribute towards producing that good. So a Tragedy of the Commons is one particular way in which a free rider problem can arise. It is a specific (common resource) kind of multi-party Prisoner’s Dilemma, which is a specific kind of strategic structure that underlies some but not all free rider problems (those where non-cooperation dominates), which are in turn a specific kind of collective action problem—the kind in which the efficient collective production of a good is jeopardized by each agent’s incentive not to contribute.

It is worth noting that the classification of some situations as free rider problems or not depends on which agents we are considering. For example, the problem of global climate change, when considered as a problem concerning the actions of cross-temporally persisting nations, is a free rider problem. It is a constraint case in which all nations will ultimately end up worse off than they would have been had they all restricted their net emissions. However, at the level of individuals, it seems not to be a free rider problem. The costs of the resource use of currently living old and rich individuals will primarily be borne by the younger and future poor, and this will continue to be true in the future as one generation passes on the burdens of its resource use to the next (Gardiner 2001). Within any given generation, those who pass on those burdens are not themselves worse off than they would all have been had they restricted their resource use. At the level of individuals, then, the climate change problem is not a free rider problem, or even a collective action problem as defined here: it is worse than that.

2. History

2.1 Plato

Investigations of the incentive structures that underlie the free rider problem have ancient roots. In Plato, we find a sustained interest in the conflict between incentives of self-interest and the norms sustaining social order. To Callicles in the Gorgias he gives the view that standards of justice are a device insinuated by the weak to constrain the strong; to Thrasymachus in Book I of the Republic he gives the view that, on the contrary, they are a device imposed by the strong to oppress the weak. These opposing views then produce a common challenge: for someone whose own interests are not served by conforming to the standards of justice, what good reason is there to do so? Glaucon, taking up Thrasymachus’ form of the challenge in the Republic Book II, then refines it further: in many circumstances, one’s own conformity with standards of justice is instrumentally advantageous; but what about the possible or actual circumstances in which it is not?

Plato does not get all the way to articulating the free rider problem itself, however. While he is interested in the incentives that underlie it, his concern is not with the strategic problem that these incentives pose to the collective production of the goods the free rider enjoys. And in the context of his discussions, this makes good sense. It is not a satisfactory reply to either Callicles or Thrasymachus to point out that the very goods the free rider enjoys depend on others’ not free riding. That is not yet a reply to someone who wants to know what good reason they have to contribute.

Nonetheless, in developing Socrates’ answer to the challenge in the remaining books of the Republic, Plato does supply what would be a distinctively Socratic solution to the free rider problem. This involves challenging the free rider’s conception of what one’s own interests consist in. If, as Socrates maintains, the virtue of justice itself (as a state of harmony in the soul) is a constituent part of one’s own good, then it is a mistake to think that it ever really is in one’s true interest to act unjustly. The implication of Socrates’ view, apparently endorsed by Plato, is that philosophy can help to alter one’s incentives in a pro-social direction through dispelling a mistaken conception of one’s own interests. And as applied to Socrates himself, this view can explain both his willingness to submit himself for execution by the state of Athens (as a contribution to recognizing and upholding the just authority of the state) and his commitment to the philosophical teaching for which he was executed (as a contribution to helping the young to form the right conception of their own true interests).

2.2 Hobbes

The strategic structure of the free rider problem, and its significance for what were to become the social sciences, first come into focus in the writings of Hobbes. In Leviathan (1651) Hobbes’s interest is best characterized as analytical and remedial, rather than normative (Hampton 1986: Ch. 1). His concern is with a constraint version of the free rider problem, with respect to the good of civil peace. Given an understanding of human motivation as predominantly self-interested and interested above all in our own self-preservation, Hobbes sees himself as producing a science of moral philosophy, demonstrating the rules of conduct that are necessary to serve our own interests most effectively (Leviathan: Ch. 15 [1996: 110–11]). Given our natural equality of power and mutual vulnerability, it is better for each of us that we all live under a law-enforcing sovereign that is sufficiently powerful to give us effective incentives not to attack each other. Without this, the state of nature this leaves us in is a war of all against all that is worse for everyone (including those who succeed in defending themselves). Given how much worse the state of nature is, it is in the interests of each to support the establishment of a sovereign who can enforce civil order, thereby leaving oneself (and everyone else) better off than they would be without it. We get a

deduction, of Sovereign Rights, from the nature, need, and designs of men, in erecting of Commonwealths, and putting themselves under Monarchs, or Assemblies, entrusted with power enough for their protection. (Leviathan: Ch. 20)

Hobbes’s solution to the free-rider problem is not, like the one suggested by Socrates, an internal solution, changing our incentives in a pro-social direction through philosophically-based psychological reform. Instead, it is an external solution, imposing effective enough coercive penalties to change the self-interested calculus for each individual in a way that makes compliance rational for (unSocratically) self-interested agents. The contribution philosophy can make towards solving the problem is not to change our conception of our own interests, but to remove errors in our reasoning about how best to satisfy them.

The cause, therefore, of civil war is, that men know not the causes neither of war nor peace, there being but few in the world that have learned those duties which unite and keep men in peace, that is to say, that have learned the rules of civil life sufficiently. (De Corpore: Ch. 1)

In effect, the state puts us in a position in which we should agree with Glaucon: justice is, actually, instrumentally rational for each of us. Hobbes’ understanding of the strategic structure of the problem allows him to explain the stability of the solution: if the power of an authoritative sovereign is either to be imposed on everyone or not to be imposed at all, it is in the interests of each that it be imposed.

Given this, it is not mysterious on Hobbes’s view why there should be a state: this is better for everyone, and therefore is preferred by all self-interested agents (which is to say for Hobbes: all agents), as long as they are not reasoning erroneously. The problem that remains to be resolved is what has subsequently come to be classified as a battle-of-the-sexes problem, whose basic strategic structure in the two-party case is this:

Here, there is a mixture of coordination problem and conflicting interests. It is better for each of us to coordinate with the other than to miss out on the benefits of coordination, but we have competing interests regarding the available coordination points. As applied to Hobbes’s case, it is better for each person that we coordinate on a sovereign; but some of the different possible sovereigns are better for some citizens; others for others. Warring over this can then threaten to leave us without a state altogether (giving us a free rider problem in its non-production manifestation).

In itself, this problem is a strength of Hobbes’s theory, not a weakness: as an explanatory theory, it has to accommodate the observed facts of civil strife. However, it leads him to the most contentious part of his political theory: the claim that solving this problem requires a sovereign whose power is undivided and unlimited—an absolute monarch. How such a sovereign could be justly established seems not to be a question that Hobbes’s system has room for: in his system, justice lies downstream, not upstream, from the establishment of a sovereign power. It can be in the interests of all to coordinate on an individual in whom to vest this power, and the rules of justice are those that are then imposed by the sovereign to secure civil order.

Political science has largely resisted this part of Hobbes’s theory. Fully unrestricted political power includes the absence of restrictions on persecuting political opponents: since this raises the stakes in contests over political control, it is frequently a source of conflict and oppression, rather than a guarantee of peace and personal liberty. After Hobbes, a major preoccupation of political theory has been to examine the mechanisms through which democratic decision-making can handle the battle-of-the-sexes problem for determining political authority; to explain how this can secure a stable solution if and because it is recognized as just; and to analyse the structural threats to it (Przeworski 1988, 2010, 2016).

2.3 Hume

While a recognition of the strategic structure of the free rider problem is implicit in Hobbes’s discussion of the authority of the state, it is both explicit and general in Hume. He writes in the Treatise:

Two neighbours may agree to drain a meadow, which they possess in common; because ’tis easy for them to know each other’s mind; and each must perceive, that the immediate consequence of his failing in his part, is, the abandoning the whole project. But ’tis very difficult, and indeed impossible, that a thousand persons should agree in any such action; it being difficult for them to concert so complicated a design, and still more difficult for them to execute it; while each seeks a pretext to free himself of the trouble and expense, and would lay the whole burden on others. (1739–40: §3.2.7 [1978: 538]).

Here we very clearly have a recognition of how the non-participatory incentive to “lay the whole burden on others” can lead to the failure to produce a significant good, and of how the disincentives become greater obstacles to cooperative action in larger groups than small ones.

Hume’s interest in the problem, like Hobbes’s, is explanatory rather than normative. Indeed, when later in the Second Enquiry he considers the “sensible knave”—someone who regards it as wise to practise honesty when, as often, it is the best policy but to take advantage of all the exceptions—Hume confesses

that, if a man think that this reasoning much requires an answer, it would be a little difficult to find any which will to him appear satisfactory and convincing. If his heart rebel not against such pernicious maxims, if he feel no reluctance to the thoughts of villainy or baseness, he has indeed lost a considerable motive to virtue. (1751: 9.2.23 [1975: 283])

Hume’s interest is not in refuting the sensible knave, but in explaining the sense of justice that most of us have and the sensible knave lacks. However, Hume’s explanatory interest differs from Hobbes’s. Unlike Hobbes, Hume is interested in the non-egoistic parts of our psychological make-up, and he wants to explain how our thought and action could come to acquire the complex character it has. In Hume’s psychological picture, three main elements are in play that explain our attitudes and behaviour when faced with free rider problems. We develop a sense of justice, as an “artificial virtue”: given the existence of cooperative conventions that are mutually useful in rendering us all better off than we would be without them, our dispositions to comply with those conventions can then attain the status of virtues by being appreciated as useful or agreeable by others. Secondly, given others’ endorsement and acceptance of those conventions and their disapproval and sanction of infringements of them, it can become instrumentally advantageous to comply with those conventions, given our interest in others’ goodwill. But then, thirdly, our psychology does also contain the narrowly self-interested incentives that create the free rider problem. We are both selfishly and altruistically motivated. So while in smaller groups free rider problems can be solved without coercive intervention to change our incentives, as groups get larger this becomes increasingly difficult (as he points out in the meadow-draining example).

To emphasize the point: Hume’s account of the artificial virtue of justice is not presented as a solution to free rider problems: it presupposes that there are already cooperative conventions in existence, in response to which the artificial virtue can develop. But it is an account of one of the psychological elements that can be mobilized in opposition to self-interest, as part of the explanation of how such conventions can stably persist (Sayre-McCord 2016).

2.4 Twentieth-Century Developments

In the twentieth century, the free rider problem becomes a more direct object of study within economics and the other social sciences, and is illuminated by game-theoretical research into the strategic structures underlying different collective action problems.

In 1916, Vilfredo Pareto gives a sharp statement of the free rider problem in constraint cases (rather than resource contribution cases) in this passage:

If all individuals refrained from doing A, every individual as a member of the community would derive a certain advantage. But now if all individuals less one continue refraining from doing A, the community loss is very slight, whereas the one individual doing A makes a personal gain far greater than the loss that he incurs as a member of the community. (Pareto 1916 [1935: vol. 3, sect. 1496, pp. 946–7])

Here, we find him sharply articulating feature (ii) in our initial description of the problem—the cost of any one member’s contribution is greater than the resulting benefit to that member. And although his description directly covers only constraint cases, where the relevant contribution is not performing an action of a type whose unconstrained performance by many of us produces bad effects, his description can easily be extended to resource production cases.

The 1950s see significant developments in game theory and economics in understanding some of the key contributory components of free rider problems. In game theory, Merrill Flood and Melvin Dresher in 1950 formalize (for the 2-party case) the mathematical structure of what came to be known as the Prisoner’s Dilemma (through an example given by Albert Tucker; see Flood 1958, Peterson 2015). In economics, Paul Samuelson (1954) mathematically defines what he calls “collective consumption” goods as those for which every consumer consumes the total output, emphasizing the implication that for goods of this type no one’s consumption subtracts from anyone else’s, and deriving a description of the necessary conditions for the optimal production of such goods.

With Mancur Olson’s The Logic of Collective Action (1965), the first book-length study of the free rider problem is published, providing the platform for much of what has followed. A lesson that Olson draws from the free rider problem is that social theory makes a fundamental mistake when it seeks to explain and predict the behaviour of a group by treating the interests of its members as a set of component forces and accounting for the behaviour of the group as the vector sum of those forces. Olson elaborates and explains Hume’s observation that free rider problems become stronger as group size increases, and he argues that, in a democracy, the interests of tightly integrated minorities will tend to be overrepresented, prevailing over the interests of a more loosely affiliated majority. He also offers a “by-product” theory of how to solve free rider problems: by attaching ancillary private benefits to participation in collective action, effective incentives to contribute can be established and the benefits of collective action secured—as for example when union membership is accompanied by discounted insurance policies.

Subsequently, a significant focus of political science research into the free rider problem has been on conducting empirical work that seeks to explain how and why uncoerced solutions to it are obtainable. A centrepiece of this work is Elinor Ostrom’s Governing the Commons (1990), which focuses on ecological management, investigating how the free rider problem in its Tragedy of the Commons form has been solved, under certain replicable conditions, without resorting to either state regulation or private ownership.

3. The Causes of Free Rider Problems

The free rider problem arises when the efficient collective production of a good is jeopardized by the incentive each agent has not to contribute towards its production. As such, it is a type of recurring real-world problem that is sometimes actually solved, and other times not. It is not itself an abstract game-theoretic strategic structure. There are two main sets of interacting components in play, which combine to produce a free rider problem. One is the underlying strategic structure of the situation in which the problem arises. The other is the way that human psychology tends to operate in situations with that structure.

3.1 Strategic Structure

The first major contributor to whether a free rider problem arises in a given situation is the strategic structure of the situation. A situation’s strategic structure consists in the features determining what it would be rational for narrowly self-interested, rational agents to do in that situation—the subject studied by game theory. That description invites the question “What is narrow self-interest?”, which of course is a further large topic. We saw earlier that, once we make the distinction between collective action problems and coordination problems, an agent’s interests cannot simply be identified with the satisfaction of their preferences; and their narrow self-interest will have to exclude such things as Socrates’ virtue of justice in order for game-theoretic analysis to work. However, rather than examining more fully the issues this raises, it will suffice here to work simply with the intuitive idea of an agent’s material advantage—the incentives connected to this are what matters in producing free rider problems.

It was pointed out above that, although the strategic structure most commonly associated with free rider problems is that of a multi-party Prisoner’s Dilemma, this is not essential. A free rider problem can arise in situations in which non-contribution does not dominate—that is, in which it is not true that non-contribution is rational for a narrowly self-interested agent whatever other agents do. Self-interest can actually favour non-contribution, so we get a free rider problem; but if, were the number of contributors smaller, self-interest would favour contribution, we do not have a Prisoner’s Dilemma.

So the strategic structure that is conducive to producing free rider problems is broader than the class of Prisoner’s Dilemmas. Instead, it can be described in terms of the three features (i)–(iii) we began with. Where “benefit” refers to narrow self-interest, the first relevant feature is that the benefit received by each member of the group depends mainly on the level of others’ contribution towards producing it. This allows that one’s own contribution may produce some enhancement of the benefit one receives. But—this is the second feature—the cost of any one member’s contribution is likely to be greater than the resulting benefit to that member. This second feature allows for the possibility of levels of contribution by others for which contributing produces a net benefit to the contributor, but says that this is unlikely. And the third feature is that one member’s decision whether or not to contribute is independent of others’.

Situations with those three structural features are especially conducive to producing free rider problems. However, a free rider problem is not itself a strategic structure. Strategic structures are descriptions of the situational features determining what perfectly rational and narrowly self-interested agents would do. Free rider problems are problems for actual agents—agents who are neither perfectly rational nor narrowly self-interested. To the extent that their behaviour approximates that of the agents modelled by game theory, those models are helpful in understanding how free rider problems arise. But a free rider problem should not be identified with the strategic structure that gives rise to it: it is the outcome of the interaction between that structure and the psychologies of the agents involved.

3.2 Psychological Factors

The free rider problem, as we have defined it, concerns the agents’ incentives not to contribute towards the production of a good. A situation’s strategic structure is relevant to whether the agents face a free rider problem because of its effect on their incentives. But just what effect it has on those incentives depends on various psychological factors.

First, actual agents are not perfectly well-informed, and they are not perfectly rational. This carries the implication that a free rider problem can arise in a situation in which a perfectly rational, well-informed and narrowly self-interested agent would prefer to contribute. Perhaps the conditions (i)–(iii) do not actually hold, but the agents involved are misinformed and falsely believe that they do hold, or the agents have the correct information but interpret it irrationally. For example, suppose that the union officials adopt Olson’s by-product strategy for encouraging union membership, attaching an insurance discount to the membership benefits. The discount might be large enough to make it rational to join, but if many of us ignore the offer letter or miscalculate the benefit, we might still actually face a free rider problem.

And, second, actual agents are not always exclusively self-interested. This can in one respect make free rider problems easier to avoid, but in another it makes this harder. The respect in which it makes it easier is that Hume seems right that most of us are equipped with pro-social attitudes that make some difference to our behaviour. The idealized agents of game theory are all Humean “sensible knaves” who “feel no reluctance to the thoughts of villainy or baseness”. But most actual agents do feel at least some reluctance to the thoughts of villainy or baseness, wanting to avoid the opprobrium that people like the upright Hume direct against the sensible knave, and to secure their own good self-opinion. In situations where there are strong expectations and effective invigilation of cooperative behaviour, the incentives we have to avoid others’ opprobrium and think well of ourselves can potentially be sufficient to prevent us from facing a free rider problem, even though a group of sensible knaves would face one. However, as Hume observes and as is experimentally confirmed, this incentive tends to dissipate as the size of the group increases (Marwell & Ames 1979; Isaac & Walker 1988).

At the same time, there is another kind of incentive beyond narrow self-interest that tends to magnify, not diminish, free rider problems. This is the incentive not to be (and be seen as) a “sucker”—a contributor on whose contributions others take a free ride. This incentive has three main manifestations: aversion to being the object of others’ derision; shame, when that self-conception is internalized; and outward-directed resentment towards the free riders who exploit one’s own cooperative behaviour. In these various forms, aversion to being a sucker can motivate a reluctance to contribute towards the production of a public good, independently of whether the expected benefit associated with contributing outweighs the direct cost of the contribution. This “sucker effect” again creates the possibility that even when the underlying strategic structure does not have features (i)–(iii), we could still actually face a free rider problem (Bougherara et al. 2009).

More broadly, it seems that at least six different psychological factors are involved in determining the strength of the incentives that potential contributors to collective goods-production will have not to contribute, and thus whether a free rider problem is produced. First, there is the positive incentive to gain a material advantage by avoiding the cost of contribution. Second, there is the negative incentive not to be a sucker. In the other direction, there is the restraining influence of pro-cooperative incentives to earn the positive regard of others and oneself. Then, moderating the influence of those competing incentives are three further psychological factors: one’s state of knowledge about how one is situated relative to other agents; one’s rationality in assessing the true strategic structure of the situation; and one’s degree of trust in other agents and institutions—in other agents’ cooperative dispositions, and in institutions’ reliability in imposing the positive and negative incentives for cooperation that they have declared they will impose.

In experimental social science, situations whose strategic structures present collective action problems of various kinds have served as a testing-ground for studies of how these various factors interact to affect observed patterns of cooperation and non-contribution (Andreoni 1988; Fischbacher & Gächter 2010; Kameda et al. 2011). These studies can help to inform proposed strategies for solving free rider problems, to which we will turn in Section 4. It should also be borne in mind that, once we recognize the range of factors that bear on the contributory incentives of individuals, the possibility remains open that investigations of social phenomena at a population-level scale can succeed by applying a “rational choice theory” that models those phenomena as the outcomes of rational self-interested individual choice: this might still turn out to be a theoretically illuminating simplification for some explanatory purposes (Eriksson 2011).

3.3 Public Goods

The most commonly discussed free rider problems arise in relation to the production of public goods. Definitions of public goods vary; but most emphasize one or more of the following eight features:

1. Free Availability: if a public good is available to one member of the group for which it is public, then it is freely available to each other member.
2. Nonexcludability: if anyone is enjoying the good, no one else can be prevented from freely enjoying it without excessive cost to the would-be excluders.
3. Compulsoriness: if anyone receives the good, no-one else can avoid doing so without excessive cost.
4. Joint Consumption: one person's consumption of the good does not diminish the amount available for consumption by anyone else.
5. Nonrivalness: one person's enjoyment of the good does not diminish the benefits available to anyone else from its enjoyment.
6. Equality: if anyone receives the good, everyone receives the same amount.
7. Indivisibility: there can be more than one consumer of the good, and each consumes the total output.
8. Joint Supply: if the good is being consumed, no extra cost is required to supply the good to an additional consumer.

There are entailments between members of this list; but, on the most straightforward reading of them, no two are equivalent.^[2] Broadly speaking, these features belong to three main families. The first three features are refinements of the idea that the good cannot be supplied to one person without making it available to others; the next four are refinements of the idea that one person’s consumption of the good does not impinge on others’ consumption of it; the last feature (joint supply) concerns the cost of extra consumption to the supplier of the good, rather than to other consumers. Paradigm examples of public goods—street lighting, national defence, firework displays, lighthouses, clean air—possess all three kinds of feature. But it is notable that features in the first family can be present without features in the second and third, as in the nonexcludable but rival “common pool goods” discussed by Ostrom and Ostrom (1977): for example, fish stocks in the sea. And features in the second and third families can be present without features in the first, as in the excludable but nonrival “club goods” discussed by Buchanan (1965): for example, a theatre performance.

Features of all of these kinds are relevant to the existence and solubility of free rider problems. Nonexcludability and its cognates are obviously relevant because of their bearing on whether an individual can consume the good without contributing to the cost of producing it; and they also have a bearing on the incentives there may be to avoid being treated as a sucker by other consumers of the good. But nonrivalness and its cognates are potentially relevant too. This can remove the degree of inhibition that may attach to actions that are perceived to harm others: conceiving of free riding as harmless may increase a person’s propensity to engage in it. And the same applies to jointness in supply: the perception that one’s additional consumption imposes no extra burden on the producer of a good may likewise remove a source of reluctance to impose on other people in taking a good for free.

The free rider problem is typically discussed as a problem in relation to the production of public goods: indeed, some discussions build this connection into the definition of the problem. But that temptation should be resisted. A private consumption good—one that has none of the hallmarks of public goods—can itself be produced by a group; and when it is, a free rider problem can arise. For example, consider a publicly funded scheme of health care provision that is not charged to the user. Here, since the provision of the good could be restricted to fee-paying consumers, it is excludable; since the health care consumed by a particular patient is not available for consumption by anyone else, it is rival; and since it costs more to treat an extra patient, it is not in joint supply. However, the incentives there are to evade the tax contributions that resource the service can still create a free rider problem. Free rider problems can arise when goods are collectively produced, whether those goods are themselves public or private. All that is needed is the perception that one can receive the good without having contributed to producing it.

4. Solving Free Rider Problems

As decision theory teaches, when an agent is presented with the question what to do, the rationality of their decision is determined by three main factors: the range of available actions, the different possible outcomes of those actions and their probabilities, and the agent’s preferences or values. The same factors give us three basic possibilities for solving a free rider problem.

The first possibility is to change the available actions. For example, if we face a Tragedy of the Commons, it may be possible to fence the commons, thereby removing the possibility of unrestricted use of a previously free resource.

The second possibility is to change the possible outcomes of the available actions, or the probabilities of those outcomes. This is the Hobbesian solution: by imposing penalties for noncontribution and making it sufficiently likely that those penalties will be applied, we can change the agents’ self-interested calculus so that free riding is no longer worth the risk. This solution, when it is available, can often be effective in solving a free rider problem in its strongest, non-production, manifestation—where it threatens to jeopardize our producing a good at all. However, notice that it really amounts to exchanging one free rider problem for another (more tolerable) one. Since we are now expending extra resources on invigilation and deterrent punishment, we are not producing the good as efficiently as we could have done if we had been sufficiently motivated to produce it without needing the threat of penalties.

The third possibility is to change the agents’ preferences, without making changes of the first two kinds. We could call this the Socratic solution, since Socrates’ reply to his egoistic challengers, if it worked, would be a solution of this kind. If, through attaining philosophical insight, we all came to see free riding as individually bad for us, that could be a way of dissolving the incentives that create the problem. However, there are also some other less ambitious possibilities here. Changing the informational state of the agents, and thereby affecting their trust, could change their preferences in a pro-cooperative direction. So could spreading norms that induce shame for behaving like a sensible knave.

Mapping these three possibilities onto our earlier discussion of the causes of the free rider problem, the first two possibilities encompass ways of changing the underlying strategic structure, while the third covers changes to the psychological factors.

Since the free rider problem is a problem concerning the incentives and behaviour of real-world agents, and not merely a strategic structure in game theory, identifying its potential solutions is a topic for empirical investigation, rather than game-theoretic calculation. Two main ongoing bodies of empirical work have advanced our understanding of the main factors that contribute to facilitating or obstructing those solutions.

Within social psychology, there is an extensive body of work investigating the behaviour of experimental subjects when situated in conditions that present artificially constructed free rider problems. Building on the early work of Maximilien Ringelmann (1913), researchers have sought to measure the “Ringelmann effect”—the observed decrease in productivity of group members as group size increases—and to identify variables that lessen this effect, including goal-setting at the group level, devising internal competition between group members, and increasing the exposure of individuals’ performance to scrutiny by other group members (Forsyth 2019: Ch. 10). Researchers have also systematically studied the conditions under which collections of unaffiliated individuals can be induced to engage in mutually beneficial cooperation: attempts have been made to measure the effects of externally imposed sanctions, increased opportunities for communication, symmetry in the stakes for group members, sequential decision making, and different levels and types of payoff (Jin et al. forthcoming).

Turning to political science and sociology, wide-ranging empirical work has been done to study and explain the social dynamics through which effective and stable solutions to free rider problems are created. A central contribution to this field has been made by Elinor Ostrom and her collaborators in investigating the management of common pool environmental resources, where there is the potential for Tragedies of the Commons (Ostrom 1990). According to Ostrom, self-organizing groups can be effective in solving such problems, without resorting to either state regulation or private ownership, when six main conditions are met: reliable information is available to members of the group about the costs and benefits of different courses of action; individual group members see maintaining the common resource as important for their own achievements; group members see their reputation as a trustworthy reciprocator as important; agents can communicate with each other; informal monitoring and sanctioning is feasible and considered appropriate; and social capital and leadership exist, related to previous successes in solving joint problems (Ostrom 2010). These conditions are more easily satisfied in smaller groups with a strong sense of group identity and cultural cohesion.

A question this leads to is what prospects there are for finding a solution to the problem of sustainable resource use on a global scale. This was a focus of some of Ostrom’s later work, which investigated the interaction between collective action problems at different scales. She maintained that the evidence supported the view that global solutions are not impossible, but are only likely to work well if supported by national, regional and local efforts where the six features are strongly present (Ostrom 2009, 2010).

A further body of relevant work in political science investigates the role of political entrepreneurship as a resource for solving collective action problems (Laver 1980; Shepsle 2010: Ch. 14). Here, the interest is in the ways in which, in contexts where powerful political institutions exist, it can serve the interests of office holders to be seen as a leader of institutional action that furthers the interests of those they represent. When it is in the interests of all group members (including would-be free riders) that public goods are provided, there can be incentives for political entrepreneurs to enhance their own political standing by working to steer institutions in that direction. However, the same dynamics can also lead to the deployment of political entrepreneurship towards fostering inter-group conflict (R. Hardin 1995). Here as elsewhere, the dynamics of real world collective action are complex and nuanced.

5. The Free Rider Problem and Moral Philosophy

Moral philosophy engages with the free rider problem in two main ways. One line of enquiry concerns whether morality itself can be understood as the collection of dispositions and behaviours that we have acquired that allow us to solve the free rider problem and other related collective action problems. That is an external line of enquiry: it looks at morality as a social phenomenon and seeks to explain it by assigning to it a function—of solving the collective action problems we would otherwise succumb to. The second line of enquiry is internal. It asks, from within moral thought, what the moral objections to free riding are and to which forms of free riding they apply.

5.1 The Function of Morality?

Since Hume, it has routinely been observed that the free rider problem is easier to solve in smaller groups, and that this is attributable to the set of dispositions we have to invigilate others’ cooperative behaviour, to disapprove of and sanction free riding, and to seek to avoid others’ opprobrium and our own shame for it—in short, to endorse moral norms that demand cooperative behaviour of ourselves and others. Together with an appreciation of the strategic structure that underlies the free rider problem, this encourages an evolutionary explanation of our pro-cooperative psychological dispositions. It is to the advantage of every member of a group that such dispositions and the norms they sustain are prevalent; so the members of populations containing those dispositions can be expected to survive and reproduce more readily that those that lack them. The pro-cooperative dispositions that underlie moral thought and behaviour are dispositions that we would expect to be favoured by natural selection.

This does not detract from the strategic point that being a sensible knave—ingratiating oneself sufficiently with others to secure access to the benefits of cooperation, but being vigilant for opportunities for advantageous cheating—can be successful. We should therefore expect there to be—as there is—some propensity towards free riding behaviour in human populations. But selection pressures in the evolutionary past can explain the prevalence of pro-cooperation dispositions.

(Notice that this presupposes that Hobbes is mistaken. Hobbes does not want to dispose of morality, but he insists that what theorists of morality fail to recognize is that moral virtues and vices “are but Conclusions, or Theorems concerning what conduceth to the conservation and defence of themselves” (Leviathan: Ch. 15 [1996: 111]). If Hobbes is right, there is no need for evolution to have equipped us with anything in addition to the rational pursuit of self-interest in order to solve the fearful collective action problem we face in the absence of cooperation.)

This then provides the basis for an account of the function of morality. Evolutionary explanations can support the attribution of functions to biological structures, dispositions and behaviours, without requiring that those functions are the result of intentional design. According to one standard view, an object, structure or activity has a function when it has an effect within a system that explains why it exists within that system: going further, Larry Wright influentially maintains that its having such an effect is its function (Wright 1973, 1976). On this view, evolutionary explanations yield biological functions. Following this line of thought, several philosophers draw the conclusion: facilitating mutually beneficial cooperation and thereby solving the free rider problem is the function of morality (Kitcher 2006: 178; Joyce 2006: 208; Prinz 2007: 32; Sinclair 2012: 14).

This line of argument invites questions of three main kinds: debate over them is ongoing. The first concerns the structure of the biological explanation. It is very plausible that pro-cooperative dispositions in humans are non-accidental, and that selection pressures favour those dispositions. However, the structure of that explanation is contested. A major point of contention concerns whether selective pressures operating at the level of the group are needed to explain the transmission of pro-cooperative dispositions. The free rider problem is cited by some philosophers of biology against the view that this can be accounted for by individual selection alone: what is in the interests of the individual is to live in a group in which others’ cooperation confers benefits on all group members, while exploiting opportunities to take advantage of this without contributing oneself (Richerson et al. 2016). But others argue that in-group dynamics in small-group contexts can suffice to explain the emergence of cooperative dispositions and norms while restricting the target of natural selection to the individual, not the group (Sterelny 2016).

The second set of questions concerns the inference from the etiology of pro-social dispositions to a conclusion concerning the function of morality. The Larry Wright view of functions, reducing a function to an effect that explains why something exists, can itself be questioned (Boorse 1976). It can also be questioned whether, from an explanation that appeals to the environmental pressures that existed in the evolutionary past, we can make a good inference to the current function of morality (Smyth 2017). And, beyond this, questions can be raised about the narrowness of the conception of morality that is involved in identifying morality with the behaviours and attitudes supporting cooperation: in particular, morality as it is usually conceived of includes expressions of concern for others’ welfare (for example, in compassion for the weak) and respect for their independent agency (for example, in norms of non-interference) that resist straightforward identification with forms of mutually beneficial cooperation (Cullity 2018).

Suppose that questions of those first two kinds can be satisfactorily resolved, and there is a good argument for identifying the function of morality with facilitating mutually beneficial cooperation. The third kind of question that then arises is: what follows from that? In particular, can we draw any conclusions about the content of morality from a theory of its function? Surely, there are morally better and worse forms of cooperative human endeavour. For any given instance of mutually beneficial cooperation by the members of a group, the question “Is this form of cooperation morally good, bad or indifferent?” can be intelligibly asked, and it is not clear how a theory of the etiologically-generated function of morality is going to constrain the available answers. To be clear, this is not itself an objection to the functional thesis—it is a question about whether that thesis carries any normative moral implications.

5.2 The Moral Evaluation of Free Riding

We began by distinguishing two main manifestations of the free rider problem: the free riding manifestation and the non-production manifestation. In each of these manifestations, it raises a significant question that is internal to morality.

First, consider paradigm cases of free riding on the production of a public good. When the good that a free rider enjoys but does not pay for is nonrival, no one else is made any worse off by the free rider’s consumption of the good. If so, the following question arises: since free riding in these circumstances is harmless, why is it wrong? What moral objection can be raised against it?

A first kind of answer is that there may not be any actual harm, but there is still an expectation of harm associated with the free rider’s action—in the sense that the weighted average of the possible harms associated with the action is greater than zero. After all, as the number of free riders increases, so does the average burden on the diminishing number of contributors, who are sharing the cost of producing the good. However, in a large group, any such expectation of harm associated with the difference between one individual’s consuming the good without contributing and their not consuming without contributing will be very small—especially if the already-produced good is in joint supply, and the free rider is unlikely to be making a difference to others’ behaviour. And carrying some small expectation of harm does not seem sufficient to make an action morally wrong—most morally innocuous actions do so.

Instead, the answer that is commonly given is that what makes free riding wrong is that it is unfair (Cullity 1995, 2008). The complaint it invites is not “Why have you made us worse off?” but “Why have you arrogated to yourself a privilege that you rely on others’ not taking?” If this is indeed a sound moral criticism that can be made of free riding on the production of nonrival public goods, then it apparently furnishes an objection to welfarism—the view that the sole determinant of an action’s rightness or wrongness is its actual or potential impact on others’ welfare.

A major point of contention then concerns how far a criticism of this kind can properly extend. In particular, can it ever be properly directed against those who do not contribute towards the production of compulsory goods—goods that one cannot avoid receiving once they have been produced? As is explained in §6 below, that issue seems to be of great importance in determining whether a plausible foundation can be found for political obligation in an anti-free riding principle of fairness.

We can turn now to the non-production manifestation of the free rider problem—that is, the problem we have when our reluctance to pay for public goods results in the failure to produce them altogether—or, in a Tragedy of the Commons case, in the exhaustion of a common resource through unconstrained use. Here, it is harder to see how any non-contributor treats anyone else unfairly, if all alike are non-contributors. The question “Why have you arrogated to yourself a privilege that you rely on others’ not taking?” no longer applies: there is no free riding, and no apparent unfairness. Is there moral wrongness of any other kind? It becomes hard to see how that can be true if no one is in a position to raise a complaint against anyone else’s treatment of them. This raises an interesting possibility. Perhaps, in the non-production manifestation of the free rider problem, our reluctance to behave cooperatively could produce a catastrophe for everyone, without anyone’s having done anything morally wrong.

However, although that seems to be a theoretical possibility, it is not so clear that it is true of real-life Tragedies of the Commons. Suppose that the popular speculation about the Easter Islanders were right, and they did indeed exhaust their natural resources and thereby destroy their own civilization.^[3] Then none of the unconstrained resource-users would have had a complaint against any other. However, while this point would apply to all those generations of Easter Islanders who were unconstrained resource users, it would not apply to the last generation. They would have an unfairness complaint against the preceding generations, of a different kind—not a complaint that the previous generations were free riding on the contributions of the last generation, but instead a complaint that those previous generations took more than their fair share of a resource pool that, had it been managed sustainably, could have continued to supply them. This complaint will typically apply in any temporally drawn-out Tragedy of the Commons case, as a complaint that can be raised by those who have been deprived of a resource by others’ unrestricted use of it. And it apparently applies in the case of global climate change, which as we saw is worse than a Tragedy of the Commons.

6. The Free Rider Problem and Political Philosophy

We surveyed above some of the most prominent work in political science bearing on the causes and solutions of free rider problems. There are three further topics in normative political philosophy on which the free rider problem has a prominent bearing.

6.1 The Value of the State

Through exercising its power to constrain us and to coordinate (and compel) the pooling of our resources to facilitate the production of important goods, the agency of the state can play an important role as a source of public goods. Some such goods must apparently be provided by the state if we are to possess them at all—for example, the impartial enforcement of public order, criminal justice, and safety and environmental regulation. For others, the power of an effective state is required, given the existence of other states—for example, national defence. And for a broader class of further goods, they are more efficiently provided by the state than they are privately—for example, some forms of public infrastructure (e.g., lighthouses).^[4]

This encourages the public goods theory of the value of the state, according to which the primary justification for the existence of the state comes from its welfare-enhancing role in solving the free rider problem and securing for us the benefits of the large-scale cooperation it would otherwise be difficult to secure (Baumol 1952; for discussion, see R. Hardin 1997). This can be thought of as essentially a normative supplementation of Hobbes’s explanatory theory. Hobbes’s claim is that, in sustaining civil order by supplying incentives that solve a free rider problem, the state serves everyone’s interests. The public goods theory generalizes this claim beyond civil order (a constraint case) to a range of further resource contribution cases, and then adds a value claim to Hobbes’s explanatory one.

However, two issues that theories of this kind raise are worth noting. First, is it really true that absolutely everyone is better off living under the authority of a state? Don’t the Sentinelese get by satisfactorily without one? Don’t some warlords thrive under circumstances of government collapse? And isn’t it credible that some self-reliant Idaho backwoodsmen really would be better off, on balance, with no government provision and no government exaction? Pressing this further, it can be emphasized by skeptics that what is in question is not simply whether the goods and services provided by the state are worth the money extracted to pay for them. The relevant question is whether all of the costs of living under the authority of the state are outweighed by the benefits it produces—where those costs include the loss of freedom entailed by subjection to the authority of the state, and the loss of self-determination and self-reliance entailed by the provision of compulsory goods. And beyond this, the more pressing justificatory question that arises for the inhabitants of most states is not whether to have a state at all; it is which of the various possible states we should have, and which public goods we should produce, in what way. Here, it is clear that there is no candidate that is best for everyone: we face the battle-of-the-sexes problem described earlier, to which a different solution is needed.

The other issue concerns whether a public goods theory of the value of the state is too narrow. Aren’t there other important purposes that are served by the state, beyond merely serving as a vehicle for mutual advantage? It can secure the welfare of others—not only other humans, but also non-human animals—who are not potential parties to mutually advantageous cooperation. And (potentially at least) it can pursue justice, domestically and internationally.

6.2 Political Obligation

There has been recurrent interest in the project of grounding political obligation – the obligation to recognize and obey the authority of the political state – in an anti-free-riding principle. H.L.A. Hart made this claim of the following principle of “mutuality of restrictions”:

when a number of persons conduct any joint enterprise according to rules and thus restrict their liberty, those who have submitted to these restrictions when required have a right to a similar submission from those who have benefited by their submission. (Hart 1955: 185)

Although Rawls (1964) had began by following Hart in this project, he later abandoned it (1971: 336–7). Drawing on Hart’s principle, in A Theory of Justice Rawls refines it as what he dubs the “principle of fairness”:

a person is required to do his part as defined by the rules of an institution when two conditions are met: first, the institution is just (or fair), that is, it satisfies the two principles of justice; and second, one has voluntarily accepted the benefits of the arrangement or taken advantage of the opportunities it offers to further one's interests. (Rawls 1971 [1999: 96])

Rawls claims that the principle of fairness grounds obligations, such as the obligation to keep one’s promises. He distinguishes duties of political obedience from obligations, and treats them as having a different source.

The grounds Rawls had for changing his mind are the ones that distinguish his principle from Hart’s. The benefits conferred by the state are compulsory: one cannot (without excessive cost) avoid receiving them. And the state claims an entitlement to force people to pay for them. It is these two features that are emphasized by Nozick (1974: 90–95) in opposing Hart’s proposed grounding for political obligation. He parodies Hart’s principle with examples of gangs throwing books into people’s houses and then demanding payment, and enthusiasts setting up a public address system to entertain the neighbourhood and then demanding that others take turns as disc jockey. When a compulsory benefit is forced onto you, Nozick argues, there is no unfairness in refusing to pay for it: on the contrary, it is those trying to extort the payment who act unfairly. Rawls’s formulation, which restricts the obligation to cases in which a benefit has been voluntarily accepted, avoids these objections.

Despite this, there has been a revival of interest in Hart’s project of grounding political obligation in an anti-free-riding principle. Its defenders have sought to emphasize the differences between the kind of extortionate behaviour parodied in Nozick’s examples, and the sort of situation in which demanding payment for an unsolicited benefit seems much more reasonable. If our village is under threat from tigers, and it is proposed that we all help to collect wood to build a protective fence, then it seems much more plausible to claim that my refusal to contribute is unfair. This kind of case still involves a compulsory benefit, but differs from Nozick’s examples in several significant-looking respects. The benefit clearly outweighs its cost for each contributor, benefits and costs are distributed fairly, and the benefit is nonexcludable: it can only be produced in a way that makes it available to anyone if it is made available to everyone. Moreover, there is no way of making the receipt of the benefit voluntary: the protective fence can only be produced at all if it is produced as a compulsory good, unlike the goods in Nozick’s examples (Arneson 1982; Cullity 1995; Trifan 2000).

Nozick’s critics claim that these differences are significant because of their relevance to whether it is reasonable to impose demands for payment on beneficiaries. Their underlying thought is that, if each of us deliberated with others in good faith about the principles by which our interaction with each other should be guided, without claiming special privileges for oneself, we must accept that a requirement on each of us to contribute to sustaining important public goods, such as public order and security, is reasonable. It is unreasonable for anyone to propose that we should go without these goods when the cost to each of us of sustaining them is relatively small, and unreasonable to require the cost to be distributed onto others, exempting oneself. The situation is different in Nozick’s examples: there, it is reasonable to insist that benefits of these kinds should be made subject to voluntary agreements.

If that is true, it keeps open the prospect that political obligations can be grounded in an anti-free riding principle (Klosko 1991, 2005; Wolff 1995; Dagger 2000). However, notice that this project requires defending a further and stronger claim. That I am behaving unreasonably does not yet justify others in using force against me. Perhaps the others should simply build their fence and treat me with Humean disdain as a free rider. To justify the use of coercion, the train of thought needs to be extended as follows. When a collectively produced good is important enough, and it is not reasonable to think that we will succeed in producing it without the use of coercive sanctions to enforce cooperation, it may be reasonable to adopt a scheme for producing the good that is backed by such sanctions. According to the revivers of Hart’s project, this is true of important collective goods secured by the state.

That line of argument needs much elaboration and supplementation in order to be convincing. It needs to respond to the objections that the operation of the state does not qualify as the kind of cooperative scheme to which a principle of fair contribution properly applies; that an obligation to contribute does not apply when the question of which benefits a group should be producing is itself contested; and that it is not obvious that every citizen to whom claims of political obligation are addressed does receive a net benefit from the state (Simmons 1979a, 1979b: Ch. 5). More fundamentally, it is objected that an argument from reasonable co-deliberation is unpersuasive as an attempt to establish the legitimacy of using force against those who prefer to be left alone. Perhaps if I were concerned to join the rest of the group, that would commit me to standards of reasonableness in engaging with others. But if I prefer not to associate myself with a group that claims authority over me, can I not complain that it is question-begging for them to invoke the terms of reasonable association within their group as a justification for compelling me to join in?

6.3 Combatting the Free Rider Problem

Whether or not we are attracted to either of those two justificational projects in political philosophy—grounding the value of the state in its efficacy in solving free rider problems to secure public goods, or grounding political obligations in an anti-free-riding principle—there are two further questions that arise for political philosophy.

The first is: what measures is it justifiable to take in punishing and deterring free riding? Again, part of the challenge in answering this question comes from the distinctive features of nonrival goods. If a free riding consumer of nonrival goods does not harm anyone else, the use of coercive measures against the free rider is apparently precluded by Mill’s Harm Principle, on its most straightforward interpretation:

The only purpose for which power can be rightfully exercised over any member of a civilized community, against his will, is to prevent harm to others. (1859 [1991: Ch. 1, p. 14])

This invites the thought: since surely it is legitimate for us to deter free riding (for example, by punishing tax evasion) this makes the Harm Principle itself implausible. Perhaps, instead, we can appeal to the overall potential harm we stand to suffer if free riding goes unsanctioned. Or, in a bigger departure, we might defend the view that there are good moral reasons for punishing wrongdoing against other members of the community, while recognizing in actions such as free riding the possibility of wrongs that are independent of harms. This is a topic to be pursued within the theory of punishment.

Finally, there is this question: what measures is it justifiable for us to take in compelling contributions towards the stable production of a new public good? To tackle this, we need to begin by asking whether the production of the good is worth its full cost, taking into account both its opportunity cost (in terms of forgoing the other goods that might have been produced instead with the same resources) and the cost involved in being subject to coercion. This invites the earlier skepticism about whether there are any goods for which the answer to that question will clearly be Yes in relation to every person who is potentially subject to the coercion. If not, that does not rule out the possibility of a successful justification, but it will require a more extensive argument. Intuitively, if the benefit is widespread enough, and can only be secured by resorting to coercion, it could be unreasonable for me to object to the generally beneficial use of coercive means of securing a public good on the grounds that I do not derive a net benefit myself. The further complication is that, in a polity where there are strongly held conflicting opinions about which practices of public goods production are worthwhile, fair collective decision-making requires us to resolve such disputes democratically. This then leaves us with the challenge of specifying and justifying the constraints on simple majoritarian decision-making that need to be in place before we can justify taking resources off a dissenting minority group in order to benefit the majority.

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• Hardin, Russell, “The Free Rider Problem”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2025 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2025/entries/free-rider/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

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