Giovanni Francesco [Gianfrancesco] Pico della Mirandola

First published Fri Mar 13, 2026

Giovanni Francesco [Gianfrancesco] Pico della Mirandola (1469–1533) was an important philosopher of the Italian Renaissance, nephew of Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, and a tenacious defender of Christianity. Influenced by the friar Girolamo Savonarola, he waged a battle against rational philosophy and against the authority of Aristotle in particular. Author of many works on various subjects, Gianfrancesco studied issues such as prophecy, the function of the imagination and divine love. His best-known work is the Examen vanitatis (1520), which played a role in the history of the early modern revival of skepticism.

1. Life

Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola was born in 1469 (the exact date is unknown). He was the son of Galeotto I Pico and Bianca Maria d’Este, and the nephew of the famous Giovanni Pico della Mirandola. Very little is known about his childhood and education; however, biographies and archival documents contain detailed information about Gianfrancesco’s mature life, his intellectual exchanges and his political and diplomatic activity (Schmitt 1967: 11–30). In March 1491 Pico married Giovanna Carafa. Thanks to the dowry that he received from the marriage, he was able to buy the rights to the domains of Mirandola (near Modena, in northern Italy) from his uncle Giovanni. After the death of his father Galeotto in 1499, Gianfrancesco, who until then had devoted himself to intellectual work, was recalled to his duties as ruler; but his exercise of power was complicated by the claims of his two brothers, Ludovico and Federico. In 1491, the two brothers had formally renounced their claims to the domains. In addition, in the same year Gianfrancesco’s father had obtained the investiture from Emperor Maximilian I of Habsburg, who had also rejected the claims of Galeotto’s brother, Antonmaria. The imperial investiture was confirmed to Gianfrancesco on May 16, 1499, after his father’s death; but Ludovico and Federico denied the validity of the renunciation that they had made in 1491; and, supported by their uncle Antonmaria and their mother Bianca Maria Pico, they attempted to conquer Mirandola militarily. Between 1499 and 1502, a series of attempted sieges followed, none of which was successful. After Antonmaria’s death in 1501, Ludovico and Federico gained support from Gian Giacomo Trivulzio, a Milanese warlord and father of Federico’s wife. Due to Trivulzio’s support, Mirandola surrendered to the siege on August 6, 1502. Gianfrancesco was therefore forced into exile, which lasted until 1511.

In the first months of his exile, Gianfrancesco took refuge in Novi, in the dominions of his cousin Alberto III Pio di Carpi, but soon moved towards Guastalla, Cremona and Pavia, until he reached Innsbruck to meet the emperor, from whom he received a further confirmation of his investiture. With the support of Alberto Pio, Gianfrancesco attempted to reconquer Mirandola in October 1503. The attack was repelled by Bianca Maria and Federico, thanks to the help of the Marquis of Mantua and Gian Giacomo Trivulzio.

In the years between 1505 and 1509, Gianfrancesco made a series of unsuccessful attempts to regain his dominions. Having survived an assassination attempt in 1509 while he was in Rome, he entered the service of the emperor, carrying out diplomatic activities related to the war supported by the League of Cambrai. Ludovico Pico, who was also involved in the war in the service of the pope, was killed in December 1509. This event encouraged Gianfrancesco to try to gain access to Mirandola through diplomatic means. He tried to convince his sister-in-law Francesca Trivulzio, who acted as regent in place of her very young son Galeotto, to allow him to return to his former dominions; furthermore, he tried to cast himself in a good light with the subjects of Mirandola. Since, however, Pope Julius II intended to expel the French from Italy, and since the French were allied with Gian Giacomo Trivulzio and consequently with Mirandola, Gianfrancesco decided to enter the service of the pope once again. The military intervention of the papal troops led to the fall of Mirandola on January 20, 1511. Gianfrancesco’s control over Mirandola was nevertheless hindered by the immediate attempt of the French and Trivulzio to retake it. Having become commander of the French army, Trivulzio reconquered Concordia and Mirandola in June 1511, and Gianfrancesco was forced into exile for another two years.

During this period, Gianfrancesco visited Rome, meeting Pietro Bembo, and fought in the service of the pope at the Battle of Ravenna in April 1512. His diplomatic efforts continued, and, in 1514, an agreement was reached with Francesca Trivulzio, which was mediated by the Bishop of Gurk and Imperial Vicar Matthew Lang. According to the agreement, the domain of the Picos was divided into two parts, between which Gianfrancesco could choose. He chose Mirandola, for which he also had to pay a heavy commission. The agreement did not, however, calm the hostilities.

After regaining possession of his dominions, Gianfrancesco devoted himself to intellectual activity more consistently than during his years of exile. In addition to composing several philosophical and apologetic works and maintaining a correspondence with European intellectuals, he obtained permission in 1519 from Pope Leo X to set up a printing press in his castle. From a political point of view, the years from 1520 to Gianfrancesco’s death were relatively uneventful, with only marginal involvement in the Italian wars near Mirandola. Once his control over Mirandola was established, Gianfrancesco sponsored a vast operation to combat witchcraft and superstitious practices, supporting the activity of the inquisitor of Parma and Reggio Girolamo Armellini; this campaign was not without implications for territorial politics, since it also allowed Gianfrancesco to intervene in the domains of Concordia, which were under the control of his sister-in-law (Pappalardo 2017b: 85–86).

Gianfrancesco died on October 16, 1533, killed by his own nephew Galeotto II Pico, who entered the castle armed. On that occasion, many of Gianfrancesco’s papers and books were burned and lost forever.

2. Works

Gianfrancesco’s life was deeply marked by his commitment to consolidating his status as a ruler. Equally present and fundamental was his intellectual effort, which materialized in numerous works on various subjects, unified by a common underlying and long-lasting intent: to scale down the claims of human reason and to emphasize the incontrovertible truth of Christian doctrine and Sacred Scripture. In parallel, Gianfrancesco cultivated contacts with important European intellectuals and printers. There are, however, some early influences, which marked Gianfrancesco’s intellectual itinerary throughout his entire life. The two most significant influences on him were his uncle Giovanni Pico and the Dominican friar Girolamo Savonarola (Pappalardo 2014: 25–38).

In 1496, Gianfrancesco published in Bologna an edition of the works of his uncle, who died in 1494, prefacing it with a Vita Ioannis Pici (“Life of Giovanni Pico”). Gianfrancesco also included short introductions to the oration that Giovanni wrote to inaugurate the debate on his 900 Conclusiones (“Conclusions”), which has come to be known as the Oration on the Dignity of Man, and to his Disputationes adversus astrologiam divinatricem (“Disputations against Divinatory Astrology”). The edition also included a text in defense of the treatise De ente et uno (“On Being and the One”), in which Giovanni Pico had debated with Antonio Cittadini da Faenza, regarding the correct way to interpret the difference between the two fundamental categories of One and Being, analyzing Plato’s Parmenides and striving to accommodate the Platonic and Aristotelian readings.

There has long been a debate about the extent of Gianfrancesco’s intervention in his uncle’s works. The doubt has particularly concerned the Disputationes adversus astrologiam divinatricem, in which Giovanni attacked the claims of validity of judicial astrology, denying that the stars influence human and earthly life and determine its fate. This text was of great interest to Gianfrancesco, who shared his uncle’s position (Akopyan 2019), but also to Savonarola, who composed a compendium in the vernacular of the Disputationes, entitled Trattato contra gli astrologi (“Treatise against the Astrologers”). It has been supposed that Savonarola’s Treatise was composed a year before the publication of the Disputationes, which would testify to his early acquaintance with Giovanni and Gianfrancesco Pico (Farmer 1998: 174–176; Bacchelli 2008: 143–144). Farmer (1998: 151–179) has been the most open supporter of the thesis that Gianfrancesco intervened heavily in the corpus of Giovanni’s works, suppressing portions of the Commentaries on the Psalms and the 900 Conclusiones, which Giovanni intended to discuss publicly in Rome in 1487. Others (Bacchelli 2008: 147) take a more doubtful position regarding Gianfrancesco’s alleged emendation of Giovanni’s corpus. More recently (Pappalardo 2018), it has been argued that Gianfrancesco did not, in fact, intervene in his uncle’s works.

Linked to Savonarola’s preaching activity are Gianfrancesco’s De morte Christi et propria cogitanda (“On Reflecting on the Death of Christ and One’s Own Death”), written in 1496, and De studio divinae et humanae philosophiae (“On the Study of Divine and Human Philosophy”), both published in Bologna in 1497 (the latter is dedicated to Savonarola). In these works, Gianfrancesco makes explicit his distrust of philosophy, which he considers uncertain. At the same time, he regards the figure of Christ as the incarnation of divine wisdom and revelation as the best instrument to access the truth, unattainable by human thought. These works, which anticipate the most radical results of Gianfrancesco’s masterpiece, the Examen vanitatis doctrinae gentium et veritatis Christianae disciplinae (“Examination of the Vanity of Pagan Doctrine and the Truth of the Christian Discipline”), published in 1520, were influenced by Savonarola’s own skeptical attitude (Popkin 2003: 6–7). Savonarola was burned at the stake in 1498; but even before his death Gianfrancesco had worked to defend the friar’s reputation, publishing several texts against the attacks on him and against his excommunication: Defensio Hieronymi Savonarolae adversus Samuelem Cassinensem (“Defense of Girolamo Savonarola against Samuel of Cassino”, 1497); Opusculum de sententia excommunications iniusta pro Hieronymi Savonarolae innocentia (“Brief Work on the Unjust Sentence of Excommunication and in Support of the Innocence of Girolamo Savonarola”, 1498); Epistola in favore de fra Hieronymo da Ferrara dappoi la sua captura (“Letter in Favor of Brother Girolamo of Ferrara after His Capture”, 1498). Gianfrancesco also wrote a famous biography of Savonarola, which was revised over the years up to 1530, but which remained in manuscript until it appeared in print for the first time in Paris in 1674.

De imaginatione (“On the Imagination”), published in Venice by Aldus Manutius in 1501, belongs to the period of tension over the claims to the dominions of Mirandola. Gianfrancesco’s dedication to the Habsburg Emperor Maximilian I contains, in addition to praise and an attestation of submission, a request for support and assistance against the enemies of the faith and traitors. After being expelled from Mirandola, Gianfrancesco traveled to Germany, where he came into contact with figures such as Willibald Pirckheimer, Johann Reuchlin and Conrad Peutinger. As his letters testify (Schmitt 1967: 23; see also Cao 2004), it was on account of these acquaintances that his works were published in Germany. In 1506–1507 a collection of Gianfrancesco’s texts was printed in Strasbourg; it contained, in addition to already published works, the first edition of De rerum praenotione (“On the Foreknowledge of Things”), the Theoremata de fide et ordine credendi (“Theorems on Faith and the Order of Believing”), the Staurostichon, a poem on the mysteries of the cross, along with a collection of letters, translations and exegeses of works by Justin Martyr and Hilary of Poitier. Other works published during his years of exile are the Hymni heroici tres (“Three Heroic Hymns”) and two other poems, which came out in Milan in 1507. In 1508 he published in Novi De providentia Dei contra philosophastros (“On God’s Providence against the Sham Philosophers”).

During his second exile, Gianfrancesco was most likely too busy to devote himself as much as he would have liked to intellectual and literary activity. It was only in 1513 that Pico was able to publish two more poems, dedicated to Conrad Peutinger. The Oratio de reformandis moribus (“Oration on the Reform of Morals”), dedicated to Pope Leo X, probably dates back to the same year (Schmitt 1967: 26). This work encouraged the pontiff and the Fifth Lateran Council, then in progress, to undertake a moral reform of the Catholic Church. Gianfrancesco was probably not present in person at the council (Vasoli 1998), and the work was printed only in 1520.

From the second half of the 1510s, Gianfrancesco began to publish works on various subjects on a more regular basis. In 1516, the Opus de amore divino (“Work on Divine Love”) was published in Rome, and in 1518 the Epistulae de imitatione (“Letter on Imitation”) appeared, an exchange of letters with Pietro Bembo concerning the principles on which the rhetorical and oratorical canon should be based, and how to imitate it, relying on a treasure trove of Ciceronian concepts. Two of Gianfrancesco’s more specifically philosophical works also appeared in 1518, under the joint title of Physici libri duo: De appetitu primae materiae (“Two Books of Natural Philosophy: On the Appetite of Prime Matter”) and De elementis (“On the Elements”).

When Gianfrancesco was able to set up a printing press in the castle of Mirandola, his publishing activity could be conducted autonomously. The first product of this renewed activity was De veris calamitatum causis nostrorum temporum (“On the True Causes of the Calamities of Our Times”), dedicated to Leo X and published in 1519. In this short work, Gianfrancesco echoed the tones already sounded in the Oratio de reformandis moribus, urging the pontiff to fight the dangers that threatened the Catholic faith. In 1520, Gianfrancesco printed in Mirandola his most important work, the Examen vanitatis doctrinae gentium et veritatis Christianae disciplinae. This treatise, which is heavily dependent on the writings of Sextus Empiricus, whom Gianfrancesco was one of the first to read extensively and to use, is composed of six books. Throughout the work, he attacks various philosophical schools, in particular Aristotelianism, and proposes a version of skepticism that leans towards fideism. His polemical activity demonstrated something that Gianfrancesco had always believed: that only the Christian faith offered full and complete access to the truth.

While supporting the inquisitorial activity in the territories of Mirandola, Gianfrancesco collected materials and ideas that provided the basis for one of his most famous works: the dialogue Strix, sive de ludificatione daemonum (“The Witch, or On the Deception of Demons”), published in Bologna in 1523. In this work, Gianfrancesco staged a dialogue between four characters: a witch, the inquisitor Dicastes, the moderate Phronimus and the skeptic Apistius. The aim of the work is to assert the reality of the phenomena linked to witchcraft, against the tendency to consider them as the product of self-suggestion and the imagination of the people accused of being witches or sorcerers. The Strix was translated into Italian by Leandro Alberti, a friend and supporter of the inquisitorial activity promoted by Gianfrancesco; this translation was published in 1524.

In 1523, Gianfrancesco’s Digressio de animae immortalitate (“Digression on the Immortality of the Soul”) was also published. The Digressio is a short text, probably extracted from a lost commentary on Aristotle’s De anima (“On the Soul”). In this work, Gianfrancesco entered the debate on mortalism, which was particularly lively at the time, to argue that the human soul is immortal and that this can be demonstrated by means of philosophical reasons.

Other minor works were published by Gianfrancesco in 1524: the poem Insulae suae descriptio (“Description of His Island”), and the Depulsoria calumniae Romaniensis oratio (“Oration Repelling the Roman Slander”), in which he defended himself against the claims of the papal curia, which demanded the payment of the debt contracted by him in 1511. In 1524, Gianfrancesco composed a Dialogus de adoratione (“Dialogue on Adoration”), in which he took up again the issue of the function of the imagination, which he had previously addressed in De imaginatione, with the aim of toning down the dissent over the correct way to adore sacred images and demonstrating the epistemological foundations of this activity. De adoratione remained in manuscript.

The Compendio delle cose admirabile di sor Caterina da Raconisio (“Compendium of the Praiseworthy Deeds of Sister Caterina da Raconisio”), the original Latin of which is lost, is dated to 1532. In this work, Gianfrancesco collected data and stories relating to the miracles and mystical life of Caterina Mattei, a beatified Dominican nun known as Caterina da Racconigi, with whom he had been acquainted since 1526 and whom he had hosted in 1529 in Mirandola.

3. Christian apologetics

From the beginning of his intellectual activity, Gianfrancesco’s primary aim was to defend the validity of the Catholic religion, to proclaim its spiritual nature and to limit the field of enquiry of rational philosophy (Moreschini 1998 and 2017). In this sense, his relationship with his uncle Giovanni Pico was characterized by personal and intellectual closeness, but also by important theoretical differences. While Giovanni had attempted to offer a method of conciliation not only between the different philosophical currents, but also between philosophy and religion, Gianfrancesco preferred to emphasize those aspects of his uncle’s thought that were most favorable to Christianity (Schmitt 1965; Pappalardo 2014: 25–38). His intellectual proximity to Savonarola undoubtedly played a role in directing Gianfrancesco’s thought. Giovanni also had relations with Savonarola, who allegedly wanted to enlist him in the ranks of his movement, the “piagnoni” (Garfagnini 1997). In a famous letter addressed to Gianfrancesco and sent from Ferrara on May 15, 1492, Giovanni made clear that, at a relatively late stage of his life, he had partly abandoned his previous concordist intentions and invited his nephew to embrace spirituality, prayer and meditation (Giovanni Pico 2018: 81–85).

Traces of this spiritualist perspective, which also makes use of a treasure trove of philosophical notions and concepts, can be found in De morte Christi, written under the direct influence of Savonarola. In this work, Gianfrancesco’s apologetic intent is combined with his pedagogical and prescriptive aims. The main theme is the importance of a proper and concentrated fixation of the mind on the image of Christ crucified (I, 5). According to Gianfrancesco, it is impossible to obtain a full understanding of the divinity’s goodness and essence. If, however, the faculty of imagination is directed to the image of Christ, many benefits can be gained, especially in relation to the regulation of the ethical and emotional sphere (I, 7). Gianfrancesco adapts and discusses many philosophical concepts proposed by Aristotle, Averroes and the medieval Latin scholastics; but he also takes into consideration elements drawn from the ethical thought of Cicero, the medical theories of Galen and the maxims of the ancient prophets. He focuses especially on the notion of habitus, to argue that fixation on the image of Christ can become a permanent disposition and, in this way, stimulate virtue and guarantee the obtaining of divine grace. The emotional aspect is fundamental in this process: not only because this mental exercise generates pleasure, but also because it stimulates an elevated form of love, which differs from carnal love, taking on a fully spiritual character. In this work, he also argues that being a devout Christian and being a true philosopher are one and the same thing. As already suggested by the title, another central theme of De morte Christi is the relationship that the Christian must have with the thought of death. Thinking about death is not to be avoided; on the contrary, it must be constantly meditated on, because in this way it is possible to avoid falling into vice and sin. Therefore, Christ himself becomes a model to be imitated of acceptance and endurance of death.

The theme of love directed towards God is taken up again in De amore divino (1516). In this work, Gianfrancesco explores the subdivision of the species of love proposed by philosophers and theologians. More specifically, he demonstrates that love for God can have a sense-based origin, arising from the perception of corporeal beauty. But he also explains that the highest happiness is found only in love directed towards the divinity. His persuasive intent is apparent in the chapter dedicated to analyzing how philosophers can be convinced of the true nature of divine love (II, 4). Yet, although Gianfrancesco provides a series of proofs drawn from natural reason, the last three books of the work contrast them to examples drawn from sacred sources, from patristics and from the lives of saints.

Gianfrancesco’s attempt to promote Christianity also includes his efforts to defend Savonarola and present him as a saint and a prophet enlightened by divine grace. In his Vita Hieronymi Savonarolae (“Life of Girolamo Savonarola”), several traits emerge that characterize the friar’s sanctity and the simple Christian life he led. Gianfrancesco did not hide the philosophical interests cultivated by Savonarola, who made use of Aristotelian and Platonic notions and concepts in his works and sermons. Nevertheless, he attributes to him doubts regarding the sufficiency of acquiring a culture that was merely philosophical and bookish and, above all, the belief that philosophy is futile (chapters 2–4). This distrust also animated Gianfrancesco’s research. Indeed, he attributed to Savonarola a maxim that also guided his own work: according to him, Savonarola used to warn his disciples not to choose the authors to read based on pleasure or delight, but by rationally evaluating their usefulness. This was accompanied by the warning not to accept the authority either of philosophers or of theologians (chapter 10). In this way, Gianfrancesco expressed his own distrust of rational theology, which was also based on philosophical foundations. Furthermore, in Savonarola Gianfrancesco found many elements that he himself analyzed in detail. Among these, that miracles can only be performed by people with pure faith and that truly devout people cannot be subjugated by evil demons (chapter 31). In De imaginatione and De rerum praenotione, Gianfrancesco explored these issues in depth. In De imaginatione he explains how an inadequately guided imagination can be distorted and deceived by demons. On the other hand, even true prophecy, which is divinely inspired, is put into action by the imagination, as with the Book of the Apocalypse. In Gianfrancesco’s life of Savonarola, the same concepts are employed to define the friar’s prophetic charisma (chapter 27).

The distinction between true and false prophecy is at the heart of De rerum praenotione (Vasoli 2006: 524–538). In this work, Gianfrancesco argues that the noblest prophecy is that which does not require any corporeal support; at the same time, however, he maintains the possibility that images of future things are formed in the organ of imagination and that some kind of knowledge of the future can be obtained through natural means (II, 1). In several of his works, he thus tempers instances offered by the philosophical tradition and concepts considered more suitable to Christian doctrine. The first book of De rerum praenotione is concerned with the definition of prenotion or foreknowledge, that is, the ability to predict the future. He insists that prophecy must be clearly distinguished from superstition and that prediction can also be abused, especially when it is practiced by false prophets. The second book is dedicated to contesting medieval philosophical theories. Gianfrancesco focuses above all on important exponents of Arab philosophy: Avicenna, who spoke of prophecy and the receptive role of the imagination; al-Ghazali, who proposed a theological reading of philosophical issues related to prediction of the future; and Averroes, who discussed the premonitory function of the soul based on Aristotelian texts. Gianfrancesco’s intent is, in any case, to demonstrate that there are different ways to predict the future. The third book of De rerum praenotione deals with prediction carried out by natural means. Among the species of premonition of this type, Gianfrancesco lists the ability of farmers, sailors, and doctors to predict the effects starting from the causes or from certain significant signs. In this case, the prediction is the result of the possession of a specific art, and this does not make it invalid. Gianfrancesco’s polemical target is instead mendacious prophecy, which seeks to replace divinely inspired prophecy and is produced by demons. The fourth book consequently focuses on idolatry and superstition. The fifth book contains a powerful criticism of astrology, based in part on arguments already elaborated by Giovanni Pico in his Disputationes. Gianfrancesco wrote a short compendium of this book in 1510, known as Quaestio de falsitate astrologiae (“Question on the Falsity of Astrology”) (Cavini 1973). This Quaestio is relevant to the general assessment of the progress of Gianfrancesco’s thought, as it contains the first explicit attestation of his interest in Sextus Empiricus, which would later be put fully into practice in the Examen vanitatis. The sixth book examines chiromancy, geomancy, haruspicy, and everything that Gianfrancesco, by his own definition, calls “superstitious”. Dreams considered premonitory also fall into this category. In the seventh book, Gianfrancesco devotes considerable attention to contesting magical practice. Here he takes a historical perspective, putting forward significant criticisms of Proclus’ Neoplatonism and of al-Kindī’s theory of the rays emanating from the body of the sorcerer. Al-Kindī’s theory of rays, which was influential up to the Renaissance, was adapted by Marsilio Ficino, based on the productive function of the inner faculties of the soul (especially, the imagination), combining it with Avicennian doctrines within a Neoplatonic theoretical framework. Fighting against such theorizations, Gianfrancesco attempted to demonstrate that magic was demonic and, hence, despicable. Ficino is, in fact, a polemical target of Gianfrancesco in several of his works (Granada 1997; Walker 1958 [2000: 146–150]; Molinarolo 2022: 133–152), also and above all for his conception of natural religion, proposed in De Christiana religione (“On the Christian Religion”) and already contested by Gianfrancesco in De imaginatione. Other polemical targets of his are Pietro d’Abano, certain exponents of the medieval Jewish philosophical tradition, including Maimonides (Bacchelli 2001: 22–24), and several Eastern ethical-religious traditions (Hindus, Brahmins, and Gymnosophists). The eighth and ninth books contain a confirmation of the argument conducted throughout the work: the preeminence, rectitude and purity of divine prophecy.

In De rerum praenotione, many issues that Gianfrancesco had partly examined in his previous works are more clearly thematized and analyzed. It should especially be noted that his theorizing is always accompanied by a careful consideration of the existence and impact of the events he describes. Thus, the miraculous practices described in De morte Christi and De rerum praenotione are identified in people close to Gianfrancesco and esteemed by him, such as Savonarola and Caterina da Racconigi (Pagnotta 2010: V–LXVIII; Zarri 2019). Theoretical study and hagiography are therefore complementary: he carries out both with a precise apologetic, persuasive and prescriptive intent.

In his endeavor to promote the prosperity of Christianity and the Roman Church, Gianfrancesco strove to influence the pope, expressing his opinions on ecclesiastical politics. The content of the Oratio de reformandis moribus is consistent with the ethical dimension emphasized by Gianfrancesco in his earlier works. In the Oratio, he addresses Pope Leo X, encouraging him to reform the Church. According to Gianfrancesco, the Church of his time is prey to every kind of evil, willed by God, who communicates his will through signs, warnings and natural disasters. This thread also runs through De veris causis calamitatum nostrorum temporum (Schmitt 1970). According to both of these short works, the path to salvation consists in embracing virtue. Gianfrancesco’s criticism of the clergy as no longer an example of sanctity and moral rectitude ensured that his Oratio would exert an influence in the Protestant world of the early modern age.

An example of the analysis of a miraculous and supernatural sign and the political meaning that Gianfrancesco attributes to such phenomena is found in the poem Staurostichon. In 1501, an unusual rainstorm in Germany was said to have marked the clothes and bodies of people with red crosses. This event was soon interpreted as a rain of divine blood, and Gianfrancesco, in the poem, presents it to Emperor Maximilian I as a divine miracle and a demonstration of the truth of biblical prophecy. In this way, on the basis of doctrines expressed by Savonarola (Lucioli 2012; Piana 2019), Gianfrancesco also provides a justification for Maximilian’s imperial power. The Staurostichon, like the rest of Gianfrancesco’s poetic works, testifies to his conviction that a Christian and inspired poetry is possible—a belief that had been challenged by one of his main sources, Savonarola. According to Gianfrancesco, writing poetry can have an important didactic function, as it enables the foundational elements of the Christian doctrinal tradition to be conveyed in an accessible form (Moreschini 2017: 167–171).

4. Human and divine philosophy: the revival of skepticism

In the general framework of his apologetics of Christianity, Gianfrancesco developed an attitude towards rational philosophy that was always present in his writings, but which was not always expressed in the same way. His distrust of the claim of philosophers to guarantee access to truth by relying on human sources and long-established authorities became apparent relatively early. Yet Gianfrancesco himself made use of philosophical theses, concepts, terms and demonstrations. In De studio divinae et humanae philosophiae, he clearly distinguishes between a human and a divine philosophy (Schmitt 1967: 37–43). Human philosophy includes everything that can be learned from books and the arts. Scholasticism and secular philosophy fall into this category. The notion of “divine philosophy” includes Christian revelation and the wisdom that derives from it, transmitted by the Sacred Scriptures. For this reason, as in De morte Christi, Gianfrancesco identifies Christianity as the only true philosophy. The function of human sciences, arts and philosophies is therefore to assist divine philosophy, but they cannot be considered sufficient to obtain the truth (Prooemium). Furthermore, not all sciences are equally useful: the best, serving as a support to Sacred Scripture, are physics, logic and metaphysics (I, 6). Arts such as history and dialectics can be useful to refute heresy (I, 7). The example of illustrious men such as St. Francis and Savonarola, however, demonstrates the self-sufficiency of the study of Scripture for the salvation of the Christian (II, 8).

In the course of his intellectual activity, Gianfrancesco formulated a specific and fundamental argument that explained why it is neither appropriate nor wise to rely on human philosophy. This argument consists in the identification of varietas (variety) with falsitas (falsehood). Humans do not agree on the answers to philosophical questions, regardless of their importance or impact, and elaborate multiple currents of thought, conveyed by competing schools and often in opposition to one another. In the face of this multiplicity, we cannot fail to recognize the substantial falsity of the various philosophical currents, incapable of providing a single and univocal truth. Truth does not manifest itself in uncertainty. This position, which is already found in Gianfrancesco’s works prior to the Examen vanitatis, implies a series of argumentative choices. First, in De imaginatione he implicitly equates the multiplication of philosophical currents with the proliferation of heretical sects. Second, he structurally attacks ancient philosophical currents (chapter 7). Gianfrancesco’s proto-historiographical perspective (Robichaud 2019) has an important methodological and informative value; above all, however, it responds to his need to demonstrate the inconsistency of philosophical schools by retracing their history and demonstrating that the reference to them, as bearers of ancient authority, masks the impossibility of developing an autonomous path to truth. From the time of De studio, therefore, Gianfrancesco was well aware of the need to establish a sound criterion: for him, this criterion was purely fideistic.

In the Examen vanitatis, the themes previously outlined in his youthful De studio are extended and expanded. This imposing work is divided into six books. In the first book, Gianfrancesco describes the origins and development of what he calls doctrina gentium (“pagan doctrine”), that is, worldly and secular philosophy. His reconstruction is certainly not neutral: Gianfrancesco challenges the maxims and main statements of the different philosophical schools in order to give a historical foundation to his own equivalence between uncertainty and falsity. At the same time, Gianfrancesco immediately makes it clear that revelation, certified by supernatural signs and symbols, is the only way to the truth. The second book continues along the same line of argument, introducing the analysis of the importance of conducting an ethically upright Christian life. In this book, moreover, we find the detailed reconstruction and the specific confutation of the main ancient philosophers, from the Presocratics to Plato, from the Aristotelians to Epicurus and the Stoics. The third book addresses the distinction between the sciences (mathematics, metaphysics, geometry, physics etc.) and the arts.

Starting from the fourth book, a new section of the Examen vanitatis begins, mainly directed against Aristotle (Schmitt 1967: 55–159; Vasoli 2001). Gianfrancesco was aware that Aristotle had been the philosophical authority of reference for centuries, whether he was attacked or followed. This awareness is manifested in some argumentative passages, in which he rhetorically apologizes for the attacks he directs at Aristotle (IV, prooemium). His criticisms, nevertheless, are radical. In the fourth book, Gianfrancesco attempts to demonstrate that Aristotle’s philosophy is not compatible with the message conveyed by the Sacred Scriptures and attacks the long ancient and late antique Aristotelian tradition. Furthermore, Gianfrancesco examines Aristotle’s expository style, which he maintains is intrinsically obscure and contradictory. The fifth book is dedicated to the Aristotelian art of demonstration, presented in the Organon and, more specifically, in the Analytics. It is in this context that one of the most decisive attacks on the Aristotelian system of knowledge emerges, based on considerations of a gnoseological and epistemological nature. If it is true that knowledge, according to Aristotle, originates in the activity of the senses, since the intellect can only base its activity on what has been presented to it by the senses, then knowledge is structurally and inevitably unreliable. Gianfrancesco argues that not only the five external senses, but also the internal senses (especially the imagination), are unreliable—an argument that he had already advanced in De studio and De imaginatione. The sixth and final book of the Examen is dedicated to a thorough examination of several Aristotelian physical theories, including the theory of motion, of the void and of natural generation. In this context, Gianfrancesco also challenges the Aristotelian doctrine regarding a question of great theological consequence: the theme of divine intensity.

The Examen vanitatis thus summarizes and expands the arguments of Gianfrancesco’s previous works, showing the continuity of his thought. The major novelty of this work is his extensive use of the writings of Sextus Empiricus. Gianfrancesco reports numerous and extensive passages from Sextus (Cao 2007) and, for this reason, the Examen vanitatis also played an important role in the dissemination of his writings. Sextus Empiricus was relatively little known until then (Cao 2001; Floridi 2002), and the Examen vanitatis served as an important vehicle at the dawn of the rebirth of skepticism in the early modern age (Popkin 2003: 19–27). Gianfrancesco’s skepticism certainly does not deny the existence of truth, nor does he accept all the doctrines of the skeptical school. Among the traditional elements of this philosophical tradition rejected by him is, for example, the epochē, that is, the suspension of judgment while waiting for the determination of a reliable and certain criterion to reach the truth. For Gianfrancesco, a criterion already exists: revealed divine truth. Consequently, that characteristic feature of skeptical reflection in general, and of Sextus Empiricus in particular, is regarded as useless and meaningless (Cao 2007: 278–280 and 286).

From reading the Examen, one can easily deduce Gianfrancesco’s deep distrust of Aristotle. Nevertheless, by scrolling through his writings, it is possible to see that he does not always maintain the same level of opposition towards Aristotle. In De providentia Dei contra philosophastros (1508), Gianfrancesco effectively opposes the tradition of those whom he calls “sham philosophers”. In this work, written prior to the Examen, his aim is still to determine the correct way in which philosophy can be used in favor of Christianity. Hence, he is open to the possibility of including Aristotle within this framework (Ramberti 2012). He portrays Aristotle not only as the provider of a pre-Christian theory of providence, but also as a competitor to the doctrine of pia philosophia proposed by the Florentine humanists, especially Ficino. Gianfrancesco is completely opposed to the idea of a centuries-long continuity between pre-Platonic and Platonic philosophy and Christian doctrine. Consequently, he does not hide his doubts regarding the claims of philosophy. At the same time, in the seventh chapter of De providentia Dei, Gianfrancesco defends Aristotle from those who have interpreted him incorrectly, arguing that he did indeed acknowledge the gods and religious piety.

A further example of Gianfrancesco entering into philosophical debates, always to defend Christianity, is found in his Digressio de animae immortalitate (1523). This work proves that he had undertaken to write a commentary on Aristotle’s De anima. Although his commentary is lost, he published an extract in which he attempted to demonstrate that the immortality of the soul is effectively demonstrable through philosophy. The aim of this work was presumably to intervene in the debate opened by the mortalist positions of Pietro Pomponazzi, whose Tractatus de immortalitate animae (“Treatise on the Immortality of the Soul”) of 1516 had stirred heated reactions (Molinarolo 2024). The method adopted by Gianfrancesco consists in recovering the readings of important exponents of the late antique commentary tradition on Aristotle (especially John Philoponus). Referring to a composite tradition of Aristotelianism and Neoplatonism, he discusses the epistemological problem at the basis of the mortalist theory (the dependence of the intellect on the imagination and the separability of the intellect from the body at the moment of death) by demonstrating that the intellect also has an operation that is entirely its own and that it will be able to continue to exercise for eternity even without being tied to materiality.

Evidence of Gianfrancesco’s interest in long-standing exegetical problems in the Aristotelian tradition is also present in his Physici libri duo. The first of these two short works (De appetitu primae materiae) concerns the correct definition of matter in relation to the notion of privation and the reception of form. To discuss the problem, Gianfrancesco examines Aristotle’s theses on the basis of the commentaries of Themistius and Averroes, which he compares with the interpretations of Boethius and Albert the Great. In De elementis, Gianfrancesco deals with the theme of natural generation, examining the Aristotelian theory of the mixture of elements and the relationship between these fundamental components of natural bodies and the compound that results from their union.

5. Moralization, imagination, sorcery

As a ruler-philosopher and apologist for Christianity, Gianfrancesco was above all a moralizer. His concern for the moralization of human life is apparent in De imaginatione (1501). Although the work is presented as a philosophical investigation into the definition and functions of the imaginative faculty of the soul, Gianfrancesco’s ultimate intent is to propose an almost mystical theory of the spiritual elevation of the soul. He maintains that the imagination has great power: as a faculty that mediates between sensation and intellection, depending on the way it is conducted, the imagination can make men similar to beasts or elevate them to the intellectual dimension. He gives a definition of the imagination that implicitly takes into account the long tradition of the theory of the soul: from Plato and Aristotle, to Avicenna and Latin scholasticism (chapters 1–4; see Pappalardo 2019a and Molinarolo 2022). Gianfrancesco particularly emphasizes the important role that the imagination plays in the genesis of opinion (Pappalardo 2012), relying on Alexander of Aphrodisias’ De anima (“On the Soul”), in the Latin translation of Girolamo Donato and on Epictetus’ Enchiridion, in the Latin translation of Angelo Poliziano. Finally, Gianfrancesco underlines the strong influence that the imagination exerts on the body and emotions. Although he stresses its great power, he also explains that the imagination can fall into error; for this reason, it needs watchful guidance and treatment, as one would care for a sick person. De imaginatione takes up issues already dealt with in De morte Christi: correcting the imagination and presenting it with accurate and adequate images enables Christians to moderate their own lives.

In the body of Gianfrancesco’s theoretical writings, witchcraft played a crucial role (Zambelli 1991: 177–210). Moreover, he put his own beliefs into practice in the inquisitions that he implemented when he regained control of Mirandola. Everything that Gianfrancesco had elaborated since the 1490s, under the influence of Savonarola, in defense of the validity and uniqueness of Christian truth and contesting human philosophies, found an outlet in his support for witchcraft trials. Gianfrancesco refers to this issue in De imaginatione (chapter 8). He explains that demons can distort the senses and the imagination of witches. This perspective, only hinted at here, was later explored in the Strix. In this work, Gianfrancesco addresses the problem of whether the witch’s deception by superior demonic entities absolves her of responsibility. Gianfrancesco also warns of another risk: that witchcraft phenomena could be regarded as purely mental. In this case, a fundamental element of support for the Christian religion would be missing: the existence of the devil and his ability to act on the natural world. It is consequently essential for Gianfrancesco to demonstrate that believing in witches means believing in God (Pappalardo 2017a). It has even been argued that the Strix should be conceived as his attempt to convince himself, before trying to persuade others (Stephens 2003). The Strix therefore tempers the radical skepticism theorized in the Examen, counterbalancing its possible destructive effects on the Christian religion. There is, in fact, tension between the two works, as the Strix is based on demonstrations founded on sense-based knowledge that the Examen had attempted to invalidate (Stephens 2016 and 2019). Gianfrancesco clearly distinguishes between popular credulity and what instead should be believed on solid grounds and incontrovertible evidence. The Strix is in continuity with a long medieval and Renaissance debate regarding witchcraft, culminating in the publication of the Malleus maleficarum (“The Hammer of Witches”), a work of 1487 by Heinrich Kramer and Jacob Sprenger in which the types of witchcraft were defined and, above all, instructions were given for persecuting witches and convincing them to confess (Pappalardo 2017b). The Strix thus became a sort of manifesto and theoretical explanation of the moralizing, but in fact persecutory, campaign that Gianfrancesco, in support of the inquisitor Girolamo Armellini, had conducted against his own subjects. Like other works by Gianfrancesco, the Strix had success in Protestant circles: it was republished in Strasbourg in 1612, with a preface by the demonologist Martin Weinrich.

Bibliography

For a complete list and description of Gianfrancesco Pico’s works, including his poems and the early modern printed editions of his texts, see Schmitt 1967: 191–229. His main works are listed below:

  • 1496, Vita Ioannis Pici, in Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, Opera, Bologna: Benedetto Faelli
  • 1496, Defensio de ente et uno, in Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, Opera, Bologna: Benedetto Faelli
  • 1496, De morte Christi et propria cogitanda
  • 1497, De studio divinae et humanae philosophiae
  • 1497, Defensio Hieronymi Savonarolae adversus Samuelem Cassinensem
  • 1498, Opusculum de sententia excommunications iniusta pro Hieronymi Savonarolae innocentia
  • 1498, Epistola in favore de fra Hieronymo da Ferrara dappoi la sua captura
  • 1501, De imaginatione liber
  • 1506–1507, Theoremata de fide et ordine credendi
  • 1506–1507, De rerum praenotione
  • 1508, Liber de providentia Dei contra philosophastros
  • 1516, Opus de amore divino
  • 1518, Physici libri duo
  • 1518, Epistolae de imitatione
  • 1519, Liber de veris calamitatum causis nostrorum temporum
  • 1520, Oratio de reformandis moribus
  • 1520, Examen vanitatis doctrinae gentium et veritatis Christianae disciplinae
  • 1523, Strix, sive de ludificatione daemonum
  • 1523, Digressio de animae immortalitate
  • 1524, Depulsoria calumniae Romaniensis
  • 1524, Dialogus de adoratione
  • 1530, Vita Hieronymi Savonarolae
  • 1532, Compendio delle cose admirabile di sor Caterina da Raconisio

The complete works of Gianfrancesco Pico, including his correspondence, have been published in:

  • Pico, Gianfrancesco, Opera omnia, Basel: Henricus Petri, 1573; repr. Hildesheim: Olms 1969, 2005
  • Pico, Gianfrancesco, Opera omnia, Basel: Henricus Petri, 1601

Modern editions and translations of Gianfrancesco Pico’s works

  • 1930, On the Imagination: The Latin Text with an Introduction, an English Translation, and Notes, Harry Caplan (ed./trans.). New Haven, CT: Yale University Press. [On the Imagination available online]
  • 1943, Operecta dello m. S. Johanfrancesco Pico della Mirandola in defensione della opera di Piero Bernardo da Firenze Servo di Jesu Cristo, Paolo Cherubelli (ed.), Florence: Rinaldi
  • 1954, Le epistole De imitatione, Giorgio Santangelo (ed.), Florence: Olschki
  • 1984, Über die Vorstellung. De imaginatione, Charles B. Schmitt, Katharine Park and Eckhard Kessler (eds.), Munich: Wilhelm Fink
  • 1994, Ioannis Pici Mirandulae viri omni disciplinarum genere consumatissimi vita per Ioannem Franciscum illustris principis Galeotti Pici filium conscripta, Bruno Andreolli (ed.), Modena: Aedes Muratoriana
  • 1999, Vita Hieronymi Savonarolae, Elisabetta Schisto (ed.), Florence: Olschki
  • 2005, De imaginatione. De l’imagination, Christophe Bouriau, and Pierre-François Moreau (eds.), Chambery: Editions Comp’act
  • 2010, Compendio delle cose mirabili di Caterina da Racconigi, Linda Pagnotta (ed.), Florence: Olschki
  • 2012, La strega, ovvero degli inganni dei demoni, Ida Li Vigni (ed.), Milan-Udine: Mimesis
  • 2017, Dialogus de adoratione, Alessia Contarino (ed.), Florence: Olschki
  • 2017, Strix, sive de ludificatione daemonum, in Lucia Pappalardo, La Strega (Strix) di Gianfrancesco Pico, Naples: Città Nuova
  • 2022, L’immaginazione, Francesco Molinarolo (ed.), Pisa: Edizioni della Normale

Modern edition of Giovanni Pico’s letters

  • Pico, Giovanni, 2018, Lettere, Francesco Borghesi (ed.), Florence, Olschki

Secondary literature

  • Akopyan, Ovanes, 2019, “Praenotio, Prisca Haeresis, and Astrology: Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola between Savonarola and Giovanni Pico”, Renaissance and Reformation/Renaissance et Réforme, 42(4): 135–158. doi:10.33137/rr.v42i4.33711
  • Bacchelli, Franco, 2001, Giovanni Pico e Pierleone da Spoleto. Tra filosofia dell’amore e tradizione cabalistica, Florence: Olschki.
  • Bacchelli, Franco, 2008, “Appunti per la storia del testo delle Disputationes adversus astrologiam divinatricem di Giovanni Pico”, Dianoia: annali di storia della filosofia, 13: 141–159. doi:10.1400/110309
  • Bouriau, Christophe, 1998, “Jean-François Pic de la Mirandole: L’imagination entre ciel et terre”, Revue Philosophique de la France et de l’Étranger, 188(4): 463–482.
  • Cao, Gian Mario, 2001, “The Prehistory of Modern Scepticism: Sextus Empiricus in Fifteenth-Century Italy”, Journal of the Warburg and Courtauld Institutes, 64(1): 229–280. doi:10.2307/751563
  • –––, 2004, “Pico della Mirandola goes to Germany, with an edition of Gianfrancesco Pico’s De reformandis moribus oratio”, Annali dell’Istituto storico italo-germanico in Trento, 30: 463–525.
  • –––, 2007, “Scepticism and Orthodoxy: Gianfrancesco Pico as a Reader of Sextus Empiricus with a Facing Text of Pico’s Quotations from Sextus”, Bruniana & Campanelliana, 13(1): 263–366. doi:10.1400/78043
  • –––, 2009, “Inter Alias Philosophorum Gentium Sectas, et Humani, et Mites: Gianfrancesco Pico and the Sceptics”, in Renaissance Scepticisms (International Archives of the History of Ideas 199), Gianni Paganini and José R. Maia Neto (eds), Dordrecht: Springer, 127–147. doi:10.1007/978-1-4020-8518-5_7
  • Cavini, Walter, 1973, “Un inedito di Giovan Francesco Pico della Mirandola. La Quaestio de falsitate astrologiae”, Rinascimento, II s., 13: 133–171.
  • Costa, Gustavo, 1990, “Love and Witchcraft in Gianfrancesco Pico Della Mirandola: La Strega between the Sublime and the Grotesque”, Italica, 67(4): 427–439. doi:10.2307/479089
  • Farmer, Stephen A., 1998, Syncretism in the West: Pico’s 900 theses (1486). The Evolution of Traditional Religious and Philosophical Systems. With Texts, Translation and Commentary, Tempe: Medieval & Renaissance Texts & Studies.
  • Floridi, Luciano, 2002, Sextus Empiricus: The Transmission and Recovery of Pyrrhonism (American Classical Studies), New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780195146714.001.0001
  • Garfagnini, Gian Carlo, 1996a, “Il messaggio profetico di Savonarola e la sua recezione. Domenico Benivieni e Gianfrancesco Pico”, in Studi savonaroliani. Verso il V centenario, Gian Carlo Garfagnini (ed.), Florence: SISMEL-Edizioni del Galluzzo, 197–211.
  • –––, 1996b, “La Vita Savonarolae di Gianfrancesco Pico”, Rinascimento, II s., 36: 49–71.
  • –––, 1997, “Savonarola tra Giovanni e Gianfrancesco Pico”, in Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, Convegno internazionale di studi nel cinquecentesimo anniversario della morte (1494–1994) (Mirandola, 4–8 ottobre 1994), 2 vols., Gian Carlo Garfagnini (ed.), Florence: Olschki, I, 237–278.
  • –––, 2008, “La questione astrologica tra Savonarola, Giovanni e Giovan Francesco Pico”, in Nello specchio del cielo. Giovanni Pico della Mirandola e le Disputationes contro l’astrologia divinatoria, Marco Bertozzi (ed.), Florence: Olschki, 117–141.
  • Granada, Miguel A., 1997, “Jean-François Pic de la Mirandole et l’apologétique: un programme non ficinien”, in Savonarole: enjeux, débats, questions, Actes du colloque international (Paris, 25–27 janvier 1996), Anna Fontes, Jean-Louis Fournel, and Michel Plaisance (eds), Paris: Université de la Sorbonne Nouvelle, 275–290.
  • Jacobelli, Jader, 1993, Quei due Pico della Mirandola. Giovanni e Gianfrancesco, Rome-Bari: Laterza.
  • Lucioli, Francesco, 2012, “Poesia e profezia nello Staurostichon di Giovan Francesco Pico della Mirandola”, Archivio italiano per la storia della pietà, 25: 275–301.
  • Molinarolo, Francesco, 2022, “Lo spettro della fantasia: teoria dell’anima, etica e apologetica nel De imaginatione di Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola”, in Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola, L’immaginazione, Francesco Molinarolo (ed.), Pisa: Edizioni della Normale, 7–168.
  • –––, 2024, “Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola e il dibattito sull’immortalità dell’anima del primo Cinquecento”, Rivista di Filosofia Neo-Scolastica, 116(3): 637–654. doi:10.26350/001050_000370
  • Moreschini, Claudio, 1998, “Aspetti della difesa del Cristianesimo nell’attività letteraria di Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola”, in Giovanni e Gianfrancesco Pico. L’opera e la fortuna di due studenti ferraresi, Patrizia Castelli (ed.), Florence: Olschki, 261–290.
  • –––, 2017, Rinascimento cristiano. Innovazioni e riforma religiosa nell’Italia del quindicesimo e sedicesimo secolo, Rome: Edizioni di Storia e Letteratura.
  • Muccillo, Maria, 2007, “La concezione dell’immaginazione nel Rinascimento tra platonismo e aristotelismo (Marsilio Ficino e Giovan Francesco Pico della Mirandola)”, in La mente, il corpo e i loro enigmi: saggi di filosofia, Guido Coccoli, Anna Ludovico, and Caterina Marrone (eds.), Rome: Stamen, 11–36.
  • Pagnotta, Linda, 2010, “Introduzione”, in Gianfrancesco Pico, Compendio delle cose mirabili di Caterina da Racconigi, Linda Pagnotta (ed.), Florence: Olschki, V–CVII.
  • Pappalardo, Lucia, 2008, “Giovan Francesco Pico della Mirandola e la filosofia: dal De imaginatione all’Examen vanitatis”, Schola Salernitana, 13: 245–265.
  • –––, 2011, “Le strategie dell’apologetica cristiana nelle opere giovanili di Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola: il De studio divinae et humanae philosophiae”, Archivio di storia della cultura, 24: 3–30.
  • –––, 2012, “Fantasie e verità. Note sull’immaginazione in Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola”, Atti dell’accademia di scienze morali e politiche, 122: 163–191.
  • –––, 2014, Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola: fede, immaginazione e scetticismo, Turnhout: Brepols.
  • –––, 2017a, “Credere alle streghe per credere a Dio. A margine della Strix sive de ludificatione daemonum di Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola”, Rinascimento, II s., 57: 201–229.
  • –––, 2017b, La Strega (Strix) di Gianfrancesco Pico. Introduzione, testo, traduzione e commento, Naples: Città Nuova.
  • –––, 2018, “Giovanni Pico ‘riscritto’ da Gianfrancesco? Magia e astrologia tra Disputationes e De rerum praenotione”, Archivio di storia della cultura, 31: 53–79.
  • –––, 2019a, “Fantasie, assenso, opinioni. Su Platone, Aristotele, Poliziano”, Studi Filosofici, 42: 7–27.
  • –––, 2019b, “Fabulae and Imaginatio in Gianfrancesco Pico’s Thought”, Renaissance and Reformation/Renaissance et Réforme, 42(4): 61–83. doi:10.33137/rr.v42i4.33708
  • Piana, Marco, 2019, “Written in Blood: Blood Devotion in Gianfrancesco Pico’s Staurostichon”, Renaissance and Reformation/Renaissance et Réforme, 42(4): 85–102. doi:10.33137/rr.v42i4.33709
  • Popkin, Richard H., 2003, The History of Scepticism: From Savonarola to Bayle, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Raith, Werner, 1967, Die Macht des Bildes. Ein humanistisches Problem bei Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola, Munich: Wilhelm Fink.
  • Ramberti, Rita, 2012, “Aristotele flagello dei ‘philosophastri’ nel De providentia Dei di Giovanfrancesco Pico della Mirandola”, Bruniana & Campanelliana, 18(1): 123–138.
  • Robichaud, Denis J.-J., 2019, “Tearing Plato to Pieces: Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola and Marsilio Ficino on the History of Platonism”, Renaissance and Reformation/Renaissance et Réforme, 42(4): 103–133. doi:10.33137/rr.v42i4.33710
  • Rowan, Steven and Gerhild Scholz Williams, 1982, “Jacob Spiegel on Gianfrancesco Pico and Reuchlin: Poetry, Scholarship and Politics in Germany in 1512”, Bibliothèque d’Humanisme et Renaissance, 44(2): 291–305.
  • Schmitt, Charles B., 1963, “Henry of Ghent, Duns Scotus and Gianfrancesco Pico on Illumination”, Mediaeval Studies, 25: 231–258. doi:10.1484/J.MS.2.306816
  • –––, 1964, “Who Read Gianfrancesco Pico Della Mirandola?”, Studies in the Renaissance, 11: 105–132. doi:10.2307/2857037
  • –––, 1965, “Gianfrancesco Pico’s Attitude toward his Uncle”, in L’opera e il pensiero di Giovanni Pico della Mirandola nella storia dell’Umanesimo, Convegno internazionale (Mirandola, 15–18 settembre 1963), 2 vols., Florence: Istituto Nazionale di Studi sul Rinascimento, II, 305–313.
  • –––, 1967, Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola (1469–1533) and his Critique of Aristotle, The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • –––, 1970, “Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola and the Fifth Lateran Council”, Archiv für Reformationsgeschichte, 61: 161–178.
  • Schneider, Wolfgang C., 2016, “Auf dem Weg zum inneren Bild. Verstehen und Bildwerdung bei Cusanus und Gianfrancesco Pico mit Blicken auf Jan van Eyck und Hieronymus Bosch”, Allgemeine Zeitschrift für Philosophie, 41(3): 255–287.
  • Secret, François, 1976, “Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola, Lilio Gregorio Giraldi et l’alchimie”, Bibliothèque d’Humanisme et Renaissance, 38(1): 93–110.
  • Stephens, Walter, 1998, “De dignitate strigis: la copula mundi nel pensiero dei due Pico e di Torquato Tasso”, in Giovanni e Gianfrancesco Pico. L’opera e la fortuna di due studenti ferraresi, Patrizia Castelli (ed.), Florence: Olschki, 325–349.
  • –––, 2003, “Gianfrancesco Pico e la paura dell’immaginazione: dallo scetticismo alla stregoneria”, Rinascimento, II s., 43: 49–74.
  • –––, 2016, “Skepticism, Empiricism, and Proof in Gianfrancesco Pico Della Mirandola’s Strix”, Magic, Ritual, and Witchcraft, 11(1): 6–29. doi:10.1353/mrw.2016.0006
  • –––, 2019, “Learned Credulity in Gianfrancesco Pico’s Strix”, Renaissance and Reformation/Renaissance et Réforme, 42(4): 17–40. doi:10.33137/rr.v42i4.33705
  • Vasoli, Cesare, 1965, “Pietro Bernardino e Gianfrancesco Pico”, in L’opera e il pensiero di Giovanni Pico della Mirandola nella storia dell’Umanesimo, Convegno internazionale (Mirandola, 15–18 settembre 1963), 2 vols., Florence: Istituto Nazionale di Studi sul Rinascimento, II, 281–299.
  • –––, 1998, “Gianfrancesco Pico e l’Oratio de reformandis moribus”, in Giovanni e Gianfrancesco Pico. L’opera e la fortuna di due studenti ferraresi, Patrizia Castelli (ed.), Florence: Olschki, 229–260.
  • –––, 2001, “Giovan Francesco Pico e i presupposti della sua critica ad Aristotele”, in Renaissance readings of the Corpus Aristotelicum. Prooceedings of the Conference held in Copenhagen (23–25 April 1998), Marianne Pade (ed.), Copenhagen: Museum Tusculanum, 129–146.
  • –––, 2006, “Divinazione astrologica e profezia: un dibattito tra la fine del Quattrocento e gli inizi del nuovo secolo”, in Cesare Vasoli, Ficino, Savonarola, Machiavelli. Studi di storia della cultura, Turin: Aragno, pp. 489–538.
  • Walker, D. P., 1958 [2000], Spiritual and Demonic Magic from Ficino to Campanella (Studies of the Warburg Institute 22), London: Warburg Institute, University of London. New edition University Park: The Pennsylvania State University Press, 2000.
  • Zambelli, Paola, 1991, L’ambigua natura della magia. Filosofi, streghe, riti nel Rinascimento, Milan: il Saggiatore.
  • Zarri, Gabriella, 2019, “A Compendium of the Wondrous Deeds of Caterina Da Racconigi: Hagiography or Philosophical Treatise?”, Renaissance and Reformation/Renaissance et Réforme, 42(4): 41–59. doi:10.33137/rr.v42i4.33707

Other Internet Resources

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