Personal Identity and Ethics

First published Mon Jun 30, 2025

We think of ourselves as temporally extended beings. We do not just exist in the moment. Most of us have been around for a few years and will, hopefully, continue to exist in the future. We also believe that we are individuals whose psychology and bodies are distinct from others. For example, our own thoughts and feelings can of course be communicated to others, but in some special way they seem to be ours. These views—our temporally extended existence and our distinctness from other individuals—have given rise to a number of ethical debates.

For instance, if someone committed a terrible crime in the past, but then went through decades of inner reform, are they still deserving of blame and punishment to the same degree as shortly after the crime? Other debates concern the beginning and the end of our existence. Imagine someone issues a directive according to which she does not want further life-extending medical treatments in certain possible scenarios at the end of life. Then, years later, she forgets about the directive due to dementia. Are the relatives and physicians still supposed to respect the directive?

The fact that we think of ourselves as temporally extended individuals that are distinct from others can also raise other questions. We usually care about our own future well-being in a special way. But does this really make as much sense for the very distant future as for the more immediate one? And what does this imply in the realm of morality? Am I really justified in having a special concern for one future person over all others? The extent to which the future well-being of others should matter, if it competes with my own interests, seems to have implications for equality considerations and distributive justice.

For these and other ethical questions, it looks like any answer we come up with will have to make essential reference to personal identity. As this entry will show, there are different accounts of what matters in terms of our persistence through time as individual entities, and these accounts can support competing answers to such ethical questions.

1. Personal Identity

What is meant by ‘identity’, in the sense the term is used in this entry, is our persistence through time (see the entry on personal identity). In other words, it is the numerical sameness of an individual at different points in time.

Numerical identity is not the same as qualitative identity. Identical twins may be qualitatively similar, but they are nonetheless numerically distinct. They are numerically distinct, because they are two distinct individuals that persist through time independently from each other.

The term ‘identity’ in this numerical sense is also to be distinguished from our identity in the social or political sense of the term. While numerical identity refers only to our persistence through time, our identity in the social or political sense can also include national or ethnic affiliations, racialized properties, gender aspects and sexual orientation, or certain characteristic beliefs, commitments, values, attitudes and experiences with respect to how they determine our place in a society. The focus of this entry is on our identity in the numerical sense of the term.

2. The Psychological View

Two of the most common accounts of our identity are the psychological and the biological accounts. The modern psychological criterion of personal identity is often traced back to John Locke (Locke 1694 [1975], see the entry Locke on Personal Identity). In its contemporary form (S. Shoemaker 1970, 1984; Parfit 1973, 1986), it says that

person X at time1 and person Y at time2 are the same person if and only if X is uniquely psychologically continuous with Y.

What is usually meant by psychological continuity is a chain of strong psychological connections (Parfit 1984: 207). These can include recollections of the past, intentions for the future, but also beliefs or desires (Parfit 1984: 205), and perhaps even attitudes and character traits. All of these forms of mental content can persist through time, and the later states causally depend on the earlier ones. The reason for the requirement of unique psychological continuity is to exclude a notorious thought experiment describing “split brain” cases (see the next section) in which someone’s psychology branches and continues in two separate strands. Since numerical identity cannot apply to two separate things, this possibility must be excluded.

The meaning of ‘continuity’ and ‘connectedness’ can be illustrated by appeal to an example from Thomas Reid (Reid 1785 [1975: 114]). In this example, a brave officer remembers stealing fruit from an orchard when he was a child. Later, as an old general, he remembers stealing a standard from the enemy, but he does not recall stealing fruit as a child. In this example, the general has direct memory connections with the brave officer, and the brave officer has direct memory connections with the child, but there is no such connection between the general and the child. If one wants to maintain that the child and the general are identical, one needs to appeal to a transitive notion over and above connectedness: Continuity is defined as a an overlapping chain of direct connections and will therefore extent all the way from the child to the general.

As already mentioned, there may be other direct psychological connections apart from memories. And overall, the extent to which such direct connections obtain may be a matter of degree. The continuity relation, however, must be understood as an all-or-nothing relation. Otherwise, it cannot serve as a criterion that determines conclusively whether an individual has persisted or not.

Some conclude that when it comes to the relationship between personal identity and ethics, what matters is our numerical identity as psychological entities—in other words, our persistence as a single psychologically continuous individual.

3. The Identity Doesn’t Matter View

The view that our numerical identity matters for ethical purposes has been subject to an important challenge. The challenge is based on the above mentioned thought experiment about psychological branching or fission. It can be used to argue that it is not identity as such that matters for practical purposes.

The experiment can run as follows: Suppose that my two triplet sisters have gotten into a terrible accident and have suffered irreversible brain damage. Assume that both of my brain hemispheres are functional duplicates of each other. A crazy brain surgeon transplants one half of my brain into each of my sisters’ heads, and then, after the operation, both of them are fully psychologically continuous with me (Parfit 1984:254f).

What happens in this thought experiment in terms of personal identity? Both of my two surviving siblings are psychologically continuous with me. However, the notion of numerical identity prohibits the possibility that two separate individuals can be identical with a single past individual, making it impossible that both of them are me. Stipulating that only one of them is identical to me would seem arbitrary, which leaves us with the claim that neither of them is identical with me, even though both of them are psychologically continuous with me.

However, since both of them are psychologically continuous with me, I care about their future as if it were mine. For example, if they would have to undergo painful tooth operations right after the branching, I should be as concerned as if that prospect were mine. There is a form of special prudential concern that usually only applies in regard to my own future. One may also call it egoistic concern. Usually, I care about my own future in a special way because it is mine and because this gives me a particular reason to be concerned that does not apply in regard to the future of any other person. Since this kind of special concern also seems to be plausible in regard to the individuals after my branching, this ultimately implies that what matters for prudential concern—and arguably also for moral questions—is psychological continuity, not our persistence as one individual, or numerical identity as such.

The thought experiment has shown that personal identity and psychological continuity can in principle come apart. Furthermore, as illustrated above, psychological continuity can itself be further reduced to the strong psychological connections of which it is supposed to consist (see the previous section). This means that so far we can distinguish the following psychological accounts of what matters: It can be argued that what matters is (a) our numerical identity as psychological beings; (b) psychological continuity; or (c) psychological connectedness. Finally, it can also be argued that (d) both psychological continuity and connectedness matter (Parfit 1984: 215, 313). The latter view implies that continuity is sufficient for special prudential concern, but that gradually more concern is justified if there is also a certain degree of connectedness.

4. The Biological View

The main competition for the psychological account of our identity is the biological view (Olson 1997; DeGrazia 2005). According to the biological account of our identity,

person X existing at time1 is identical to an entity Y existing at any other time if and only if there is biological continuity between X and Y.

By “biological continuity between A and B” it is usually meant that they share the same biological life, or that those parts of the brain or body that are responsible for the continued life-sustaining functions of the organism have not been subject to abrupt radical change. Note that “entity Y” may or may not be a person, which allows that “person X” may be one and the same as an early fetus or a patient in a persistent vegetative state.

This biological criterion of our identity implies that we are essentially human organisms (Olson 1997: 70ff; 2007; Johansson 2016), with or without psychology—a view that is sometimes referred to as animalism. Early fetuses or patients in persistent vegetative states can belong to the same biological life, but do not have the kinds of psychological properties that we usually attribute to a person. Defenders of animalism acknowledge that human organisms usually have psychological states during some parts of their existence, and that these psychological states can be decisive for ethical purposes. At other times of their existence, though, human beings sometimes lack such psychological states.

This acknowledgement prevents certain objections against the view. For example, proponents of the biological view usually say that responsibility ascriptions, which form the foundation of blame and punishment, depend on the presence of psychological states. They can therefore not automatically be accused of certain counter-intuitive positions, such as perhaps that we should punish patients in persistent vegetative states for their past crimes in some way.

A main challenge to the biological account is based on a thought experiment in which part of a brain gets transplanted. Suppose that our cerebrum supports merely our psychology, while the brainstem organizes the life sustaining functions of the organism. Imagine my cerebrum is transplanted into a different living organism and the resulting person turns out to be exactly like me psychologically. Imagine also that my cerebrum-less organism is kept alive (Olson 1997: 43–51; DeGrazia 2005: 51–54). Most people share the intuition that the recipient of my cerebrum would be me simply because he would have my psychology (even if not the same life sustaining functions), and survival of my psychology seems to be what practically matters.

Advocates of the biological view can argue that this challenge is irrelevant in everyday cases (DeGrazia 2005: 60f). They can also argue that a particularly important feature of the biological account is that the relation which determines whether we persist, and the relations that matter for ethical purposes, can come apart. The biological account of our identity focuses on what preserves our identity, while other relations, such as our psychological continuity, may be what matters for ethical or normative purposes, say our self-concern (Olson 1997: 70; 2022).

5. Prudential Concern

One central practical issue is our special prudential self-concern for the future, which—as indicated above—one may also call egoistic concern. There abound philosophical thought experiments to help with an analysis (e.g., Parfit 1984: 200ff and 229ff; for a critical discussion of thought experiments see Wilkes 1988). Most of these hypothetical cases describe a future being who has lost some, but not all of the diachronic relations that usually obtain. With this method, they seek to determine which relation it is that matters for special prudential concern. One example is the case of branching discussed above, in which the two resulting beings cannot be identical with the original one—a scenario that can be combined with the question whether we should be afraid of any severe pain that the two resulting beings might experience. The upshot of these hypothetical scenarios is not the empirical question of which relations must hold for people to actually develop special prudential concern for a future self. Rather, they are supposed to answer the normative question under which conditions one should care about a future self in this special way.

Some challenging cases are not at all hypothetical. For example, the real-life occurrence of dementia can raise the question whether a complete loss of psychological connectedness and continuity (complete memory failure) results in a different person. In practical respects, one may ask whether it is plausible to have special prudential concern for such a potential future entity. Should one set aside money, for example, to make the life of this future being more comfortable? The answer seems to depend on which of the mentioned diachronic relations matters here (Buchanan & Brock 1990: ch. 3; McMahan 2002: ch. 5.3; DeGrazia 2005: ch. 5).

Jeff McMahan wants to say that a late-stage dementia patient is the identical person as the previous healthy adult. In order to be able to hold this view, he argues that memory connections and continuity are not necessary, and that a continuous flow of merely momentary consciousness (along with continuity of certain parts of the brain) is sufficient for identity. This is a further variant of a psychological view (in combination with a physical element). However, an identity criterion does not necessarily answer the question of whether one ought to have special prudential concern for a later dementia patient. Given the severe loss of psychological connectedness, though, McMahan argues that it would be rational to be somewhat less concerned in a special prudential way about this future being. At the same time, he also insists that the presence of continuous momentary consciousness (along with continuity of certain parts of the brain) still warrants some significant concern (McMahan 2002: 495f).

Let’s now take a more detailed look at the claim that psychological continuity and/or connectedness has practical import. Most notably, this has been defended by Derek Parfit (1984: 215, 313). But he left open how much relative weight continuity and connectedness should have.

Giving a lot (or even exclusive) weight to psychological connectedness would have some rather interesting consequences. If continuity is irrelevant, a single life would practically have to be viewed as a succession of overlapping multiple selves. It would make little sense to be prudentially concerned in a special way for very distant future selves. Moreover, since psychological connections are a matter of degree, there would also have to be a discount rate for special prudential concern. As a consequence, it would even make somewhat less sense to care about future selves in the mid-term future. Overall, this could sometimes imply that the ground for special prudential concern will not be much greater than our ground to be concerned about the future of other people. For example, that future dementia patient with my name might not warrant much more of my special concern than any other future person out there.

Let’s next take a look at the impact of psychological continuity. Defenders of this view can point to the sometimes counter-intuitive consequences that would arise if one were to give a lot or even exclusive weight to connectedness. In particular, psychological continuity might do a better job at accounting for the value of personal development or character change (Merricks 2022: ch. 4). Such changes reduce the connections with our past, but since they are often intentional forms of self-development, it might be inappropriate to insist that they generally reduce the foundation for special prudential concern.

The view that both continuity and connectedness matter is an interesting compromise. It would be able to account for self-concern in cases of significant personal change (due to the continuity component), but would also mean that this concern should be somewhat reduced (due to the loss of connectedness).

Next, there is the view that what matters is our psychological numerical identity as such, over and above psychological continuity and/or connectedness. As demonstrated above, identity is a relation that comes with a prohibition against division, while psychological continuity and connectedness can in principle continue in two separate strands. Defenders of the view that what matters is our identity as psychological beings can argue that our unique persistence is important for our self concern. We might care about our uniqueness when it comes to ensuring certain external privileges for ourselves, for example owning a house all by ourselves, instead of having to share it, or being somebody’s one and only marriage partner, or being the only one who won the national championships last year. Arguably, the value of having these social accomplishments in our lives partly depends on there being only one person who has them (e.g., Johnston 1992: 608ff; 1997: 168ff; Wolf 1986: 715; Unger 1990: 275ff).

Finally, proponents of a biological account of our numerical identity tend to agree that psychological continuity and/or connectedness matter more for ethical or normative purposes. However, when it comes to certain issues at the end of life, the question of whether our persistence as a biological organism has come to an end does sometimes appear relevant to people. For example, some people are concerned that, if they should ever end up in hospital due to a potentially deadly accident, physicians might take organs for transplantation from them at a point in time when their existence as a living organism has not yet come to an end.

6. Responsibility

There is a debate on whether our psychological identity, or rather certain other psychological relations, determine which past actions a person can be morally responsible for. Moral responsibility for an action is usually seen as a precondition for praise or blame. It is also taken to be a precondition for punishments or for owing compensation.

John Locke famously argues that personal identity is closely related to moral responsibility (Locke 1694 [1975: 49ff, 39f], see the entry Locke on Personal Identity). This view is reflects the widely held assumption that one can only be directly responsible for one’s own actions, but not for those of other people (Schechtman 1996: 14; Olson 1997: 59). According to this view, responsibility presupposes personal identity (Butler 1736 [1975: 99–105]; Reid 1785 [1975: 107–118]; Glannon 1998: 235ff).

Others argue that what matters for responsibility is merely some form of psychological continuity or connectedness with the past agent (with or without identity). One element of psychological connectedness is memory. Some passages in Locke suggest a memory criterion according to which remembering an event might be necessary for being responsible for it (esp. Locke 1694 [1975: esp. 49, and 46f]). However, it is usually claimed that direct memories are not necessary. For example, one can argue that amnesia, e.g., due to drunkenness, trauma or repression, should not prevent responsibility attributions (e.g., Glannon 2019: ch. 6). If one accepts this, then continuity of memory, rather than direct memory connections would be a more plausible foundation for responsibility.

If what matters involves in part psychological connectedness (as opposed to merely continuity), further issues regarding responsibility can arise. As Parfit argues, connections include not only memories, but also intentions, beliefs, or desires, and they can be a matter of degree. As a result, responsibility may decline in corresponding degrees whenever these psychological connections between an individual now and when he or she performed a past action are weaker (Parfit 1984: 325f).

To some extent, weakening psychological connections are a common feature of everyone’s life. If the extent is moderate, then continuity might nonetheless be preserved. In these kinds of cases, we have to answer the question whether it is the loss of connectedness that matters, or the preserved continuity, since these two positions would have different implications. An interesting illustration, introduced by Parfit, is the case of a Russian nobleman who will inherit vast estates in the future. He intends to give the land to the peasants. However, since he anticipates losing his socialist ideals over the years, he signs a respective legal document that can only be revoked with the consent of his wife, and makes her promise to remain committed to his younger socialist self. Many years later, when he does in fact lose his ideals, his wife wonders whether she is still bound by her promise (and whether she will be blameworthy or praiseworthy if she ignores it). If psychological continuity is relevant here, she would still have to be seen as bound by her commitment. If connectedness is relevant, she might not be. A further alternative would be to argue that both relations matter, so that one could argue that her moral duty to keep the promise has been preserved, but to a somewhat reduced degree (Parfit 1984: 325f).

A severe weakening of both continuity and connectedness seems to be characteristic of dementia cases. This raises the question of whether dementia patients can still be seen as morally responsible (and blameworthy or even punishable) for actions they committed when healthy and competent. A complete loss of these psychological relations might have to result in a loss of responsibility, even if the patient in question has committed murder or genocide in the past. In order to prevent this conclusion, one could perhaps turn to the view that a continuous flow of merely momentary consciousness (McMahan 2002: 495f) is sufficient for responsibility attributions.

The analysis of these questions can also benefit from a differentiation in the notion of responsibility. Moral responsibility in the strong sense of accountability can be understood as requiring a general ability to understand what one has done to another person. This involves not only a grasp of the moral demands in social settings, but also the ability to identify with the past agent who has violated or respected these demands (Wolf 1986; Watson 1996). It has been argued that those with severe dementia can generally not be held accountable for their past actions anymore, even though one can, under certain conditions, still attribute certain actions or attitudes to them (D. Shoemaker 2012, 2015: 205ff). Moral responsibility in the weaker sense of attributability merely requires the possibility of a fitting ascription of certain attitudes to a person.

Similarly, the question whether punishments are still plausible in cases of crimes that were committed a very long time ago (Douglas 2019), perhaps even by people who have developed severe dementia since then, may depend in part on the meaning, purpose and justification of punishments. For example, if one takes legal punishment to be a social symbol of reprobation that is directed at society at large, then punishing the demented might still make some sense, since their understanding of the symbolic message would not be required (Hallich 2021). If it is viewed as a communicative symbol that is (also) directed at the perpetrator, however, then punishing the demented may be a pointless endeavour (Dufner 2013).

7. What Matters at the Beginning of Our Existence

Claims about what matters have also played a role in debates about the beginning and the end of our existence. A prominent debate about the beginning of our existence concern the permissibility of abortion. Some arguments that prohibit the destruction of human embryos or fetuses concern the moral status they have then, irrespective of what they will later develop into. Such arguments often say that they are biological life forms that belong to the human species and are therefore worthy of special protection. Other arguments concern the diachronic relationship between these early life forms and later, born children and adults. These arguments claim that there is a morally relevant diachronic relationship between these early life forms and the later beings they may become, and these diachronic relations bear on the topic of this entry.

An influential argument against abortion is given by Don Marquis (1989). He believes that the primary reason why we may not kill ordinary people is that it deprives them of a valuable future. The victims would lose all the activities, projects, experiences and enjoyments that would have constituted their future. More specifically, it would deprive them of a future they value now, or would have valued at a later time (Marquis 1989: 189f). Marquis argues that it is wrong to kill a being with a valuable future like ours; a fetus has a valuable future like ours; and it is therefore wrong to kill a fetus. Marquis’s future-like-ours-argument has a diachronic component. It presupposes that each of us was once a fetus, so numerical identity is what matters for the permissibility of abortion (Marquis 1989: 192; McMahan 2002: 271; Heathwood 2011: 230). It thus presupposes that biological identity matters. At the same time, though, it seems to presuppose a psychological view of what gives life its value.

A criticism of Marquis’s argument may be to argue that a fetus does not, in fact, have a valuable future like ours. What makes our future valuable to us is that it stands in a particular kind of relationship to us now. More precisely, our future psychological life stands in a particular relationship to our present psychological life. A fetus does not have the kind of future-directed psychological life we do, and we do not have a backward-directed psychological relation to the fetus, so taking away a fetus’s future is different from taking away our future (for early discussions of this kind, see McInerney 1990; Brown 2002; Brill 2003).

This criticism implies that having a valuable future like ours requires some sort of psychological continuity between a fetus and a later person (D. Shoemaker 2009: 133). Since this point could apply irrespective of whether we are numerically identical with fetuses or not, it also supports the further claim that our identity is irrelevant to the ethics of abortion (Conee 1999, D. Shoemaker 2010, on resistance to this point see Chappell 2000 or Heathwood 2011). What matters instead, according to this view, is psychological continuity or perhaps the specific degree of psychological connectedness between a fetus and the person it may become (Parfit 1984: 206, 322).

Overall, one can say that biological views of what matters offer stronger support to a prohibition of abortion than psychological ones. This does not mean that proponents of a biological account of our persistence through time are forced to endorse a prohibition—at least not, as long as they acknowledge that the answer to the normative questions may depend on the presence of psychological, rather than biological relations.

8. What Matters at the End of Our Existence

Death. It has long been thought that death is the end of our existence (as worldly entities). According to this understanding, death means that there is no longer any being who is numerically identical to the one there once was (Kagan 2012: ch. 6).

Traditionally, death was understood as the permanent loss of cardiopulmonary functioning, and it was assumed that the end of ordinary psychological functioning would coincide with that. However, medical progress has led to developments that make it possible for human beings to spend years in conditions that question this assumption, for example persistent vegetative states. This has contributed to the development of the contemporary brain death criterion (Ad Hoc Committee 1968, President’s Commission 1981, for criticism see e.g., Shewmon 2001). This criterion regulates, for example, whether we may take organs for transplantations out of a body.

The brain death criterion in our current regulatory and legislative practice requires the death of the whole brain and marks not only the end of consciousness, but also the end of the brain’s capacity to organize the central life-sustaining functions of the organism. One can argue that this view is supposed to take broad account of psychological and biological accounts of our identity and what matters. The death of the cerebrum means that all consciousness has irrevocably come to an end, and the death of the brainstem means that the central life-sustaining functions of the organism have been irrevocably lost.

Some philosophers have defended a higher-brain death criterion, according to which a person is dead once his or her brain is no longer able to support consciousness (Veatch 1975; Engelhardt 1975; Green & Wikler 1980; Gervais 1986; Zaner 1988; McMahan 2002: 426ff). This view assumes a psychological account of our identity. It implies that someone in a persistent vegetative state is dead—despite the fact that his or her organism is still functioning independently. Though this view has never made it into regulatory and legislative practice, some of its proponents (e.g., Veatch 2019) have argued that it should be possible for patients to be exempt from the default standard of death and be given a personal choice in what counts as their death (e.g., DeGrazia 2005: 157f or Sass 1992 who identifies room for this in advance directives).

Arguably, what is relevant for issues at the end of life is not whether someone’s identity has been preserved. Our identity and what matters for our regulatory and legal practices in regard to our death may come apart (for further discussion see DeGrazia 2003, McMahan 1995, 2002). For example, it can be argued that our death depends on biological identity, while what matters for whether our organs may be taken out, depends on whether our organism’s consciousness has been irrevocably lost.

Advance directives. In the context of issues at the end of life, there is also a prominent debate about the binding force of medical advance directives in case one later develops dementia. This issue is particularly pressing if the advance directive prohibits life-saving treatments. Imagine that Margo writes a formal advance directive when she is still fully competent. In this document she states that if she develops severe dementia she wishes no life-saving treatments against conditions such as pneumonia. She wants the physicians to let her die in such a case. (Palliative treatments that relieve symptoms during the dying process are compatible with such directives, but not curative treatments that may prolong her life.) Later, when she develops such a condition, Margo’s caretakers are unsure what to do, since she appears perfectly happy with her daily life (Dworkin 1993: 220f, 226, see also McMahan 2002: 497).

Under normal circumstances, patients can revise their wishes about prospective medical treatments at any time. This means that their later will usually trumps any earlier expressions of their will. For example, someone might sign up for a tooth operation that is supposed to take place next week, but changes his mind before the operation. In such a case, it is the later, or most recent wish of the patient that physicians must respect. In fact, the opposite rule would appear abhorrent. It would amount to forced treatment. Arguably, though, cognitively impaired dementia patients cannot change their minds about such directives.

One may wonder whether dementia patients are identical to the healthy adults that existed in the past. However, most people seem to believe that dementia patients are identical to those healthy individuals—irrespective of the severe psychological changes they have gone through. This view can be accounted for either by dropping the psychological account of our identity in favour of a biological one, or by lowering the “psychological threshold” for persistence (Buchanan & Brock 1990: ch. 3; McMahan 2002: 69, 499). The latter option means that one has to accept the comparatively weak psychological relations that demented Margo still shares with the earlier adult as identity-preserving. The advance directive we are discussing would thus be demented Margo’s advance directive, that she issued for herself. In that case it is more plausible to argue that it should be respected. However, not a lot of people have explicitly argued that it is identity as such that matters here (for an exception see Dresser 1986).

One can argue that numerical identity is not decisive for the validity of an advance directive, and that other aspects are more important. Many of these arguments go beyond the views that biological continuity, or psychological continuity and/or connectedness are what matters. For example, Ronald Dworkin specifies this claim by arguing that dementia patients cannot form or revise what he calls critical interests (Dworkin 1993: 201f; McMahan 2002: 69, 499; Sumner 2011: ch. 5). Critical interests are interests that are formed on the basis of critical judgements and that concern the value of one’s life as a whole, for example interests in personal relationships or professional achievement. As Dworkin argues, a dementia patient can no longer revise earlier critical interests, and we should respect the advance directive.

Agnieszka Jaworska, however, argues that the advance directive should not necessarily be respected (Jaworska 1999: 135f). Even though demented Margo cannot form critical judgements about her life as a whole anymore (Dworkin 1993: 201f, cf. also McMahan 2002: 69, 499), Jaworska believes that what matters is her remaining “capacity to value” (Jaworska 1999: 109). By this, she means the ability to achieve well-being and a sense of meaning by appreciating things that are in accordance with one’s values. As the case description above indicates, demented Margo enjoys her daily activities, even though they might appear shallow in comparison to the daily activities of healthier adults. This position leads Jaworska to the conclusion that demented Margo’s present values should not be dismissed as easily (Jaworska 1999: 135f).

9. Normative Ethics and Distributive Justice

There is also a debate on the relevance of personal identity for our theories in normative ethics. This debate, mostly initiated by Parfit (1973, 1984, 1986) and Rawls (1971 [1999], 1974), is focused on the separateness of persons and its impact on various ethical theories. Typically, participants in this debate claim that facts about the separateness of persons speak in favour of a particular moral theory, including theories about distributive justice.

By the separateness of persons, authors mean their numerical distinctness. The expression is supposed to emphasize the fact that we are different individuals with our own different lives to lead. We usually think of ourselves as fundamentally distinct from others at any given point in time and also as temporally extended beings. As indicated in the introduction to this entry, our thoughts and feelings at any given point in time can of course be communicated to others, but in some special way they seem to be ours. The same seems to be true of the diachronic relations in our lives. In a special sense, our temporally extended memories, beliefs, desires and intentions, for example, seem to be ours and nobody else’s. If one considers the relations within an individual’s life to be substantial and comparatively strong, then this implies a diachronic form of separateness from others. In other words, the separateness from others is the flip-side of the stronger unity within an individual person’s life.

In a well-known passage in A Theory of Justice, Rawls states that utilitarianism “does not take seriously the distinction between persons”, and therefore needs to be rejected (Rawls 1971: 27 [1999: 24f], see also Gauthier 1963: 126, and Nagel 1970: 134–142). More specifically, the passage says that utilitarianism ignores the difference between a single person and a collection of many people. Although it may be rational for individuals to maximize their own welfare, applying this comparatively distribution-insensitive principle to entire societies ignores the separateness of persons. Rawls also seems to believe that this separateness speaks in favour of his own view (Rawls 1971 [1999: 24f, 167f]), namely a form of contractualist egalitarianism for people’s lives as a whole (for details see the entry on John Rawls). Egalitarianism prefers equal chances and/or a more equal distribution, e.g., in terms of well-being, in a given society to the maximization of the good that utilitarianism aims for.

In contrast to Rawls, Parfit argues that the proper way of thinking about persons, namely his own account of our persistence and of what matters, makes the separateness of persons less important. Parfit believes that it is not our identity as such that matters, but merely psychological continuity and/or connectedness. According to his argument, identity as a deep metaphysical unity relation is irrelevant, and the psychological relations between the various temporal stages of our existence may be much weaker than one might think. Moreover, the weaker the psychological connections between the various temporal stages of our own existence are, the more similar they are to the relations between ourselves and others. If the separateness between ourselves and our peers is therefore less pronounced than we usually think, then the way in which benefits and burdens are distributed between individuals also becomes less important. This weakens the objection against the utilitarian principle (e.g., Parfit 1973; 1984: sec. 111−118; 1986). Distribution would still matter in some ways and to some extent, but not as much as many egalitarians and Rawls think it does. More moderate views could take account of it. According to Parfit, prioritarianism can do the job. Prioritarianism says that additional benefits for the worse-off are morally worth more than additional benefits of equal sizes for the better off (e.g., Parfit 1995; Holtug 2010: ch. 7 and 8). This prioritarian view is related, but not identical with Rawls’s so-called Difference Principle according to which improvements should always be of advantage to the worst-off group. Rawls’s view is geared towards groups rather than individuals, and it grants absolute rather than merely relative priority to the worst-off.

In line with Rawls’s view, it has also been argued that regard for the separateness of persons speaks against aggregation—which is a feature of utilitarianism, but (in specified ways) also of other views. Aggregation means adding up the good of multiple persons and allowing it to outweigh the good of individuals or smaller groups. For example, John Taurek famously argues that aggregation implies treating benefits for a group of people as if they were a single individual experiencing these benefits (Taurek 1977: 307). In case one could either rescue an individual person from drowning or, alternatively, five other people, he subsequently argues that rescuing the greater number would disregard the individual person’s equal claim of receiving a rescue chance. Tossing a coin appears superior to him, because this would grant every individual a fair chance (Taurek 1977; Lübbe 2008). However, authors with more moderate views about aggregation also regularly appeal to the separateness of persons in support of their view. They try to avoid Taurek’s position, and want to limit aggregation only in regard to some scenarios. For example, if one could either distribute lollipops to millions of people or, alternatively, rescue a life, proponents of limited aggregation would usually argue that receiving a lollipop is a trivial joy, and therefore no number of lollipops should be able to outweigh a life. At the same time, they would maintain that individually relevant claims, such as avoiding extremely terrible injuries, should still be subject to aggregation. These ethicists argue that the separateness of individuals speaks in favour of limiting aggregation to relevant claims (e.g., Voorhoeve 2014: 98, 86; Brennan 1995; Steuwer 2021).

Just like Rawls, Robert Nozick also thinks that the separateness of persons provides a positive argument in favour of his own view—even though he holds positions that are very different from Rawls’s. He argues that the separateness of persons supports a libertarian constraint against involuntary re-distributions of the good (Nozick 1974: 29f). He does not only object to re-distributions in favour of the general good (which utilitarianism would support). He also objects against re-distributions from the better-off to the worse-off (which Rawls’s Difference Principle requires). In addition, Nozick also believes that the separateness of persons speaks in favour of deontological side-constraints. Such constraints limit what we may do in order to achieve our ends. They prohibit certain actions even if committing them would prevent a larger number of further actions of the same kind. For example, Nozick argues that it would be wrong to actively kill someone, even if this could prevent a large number of other killings. This prohibition against killing is a side-constraint on the means that we may employ to reduce the number of killings (Nozick 1974: 33f).

Moreover, Sidgwick famously argues that regard for the distinction between persons can lead to rational egoism. If someone is convinced that the quality of his or her own existence is of more fundamental importance for him than experiences of any other individual, then this person will be led to rational egoism. Such a person will always see more reason to aim for his or her own welfare rather than the good of anyone else (Sidgwick 1907: 420, 498). However, Brink argues that some of the relevant psychological relations can actually obtain between separate individuals. People who stand in close personal relationships, for example, can influence each other’s beliefs, desires and character traits. He also seems to assume that these relations are more important than other relations that might only exist within individual people’s lives (such as, perhaps, the distinctly first-personal, phenomenological character of certain memories). If Brink is right, we have (nearly) as much reason for special concern about the well-being of significant others as about our own. This could give rise to what he calls self-extended egoism (Brink 1990, 1997).

It has also been argued that respect for the separateness of persons entails respect for what individuals would, in the form of a general principle, consent to or choose for themselves. For example, in later sections of A Theory of Justice Rawls points out that

[…] a love of mankind that wishes to preserve the distinction of persons [… and] to recognize the separateness of life and experience […] is guided by what individuals themselves would consent to […]. (Rawls 1971: 191 [1999: 167])

In other words, Rawls seems to think that the separateness of persons supports contractualism—along with the egalitarian principles of justice he thinks will result from it (Rawls 1971 [1999: 167]). Similarly, Thomas Scanlon seems to think that taking into account the standpoint of individuals will support his version of contractualism and what he takes to result from it. Scanlon claims that principles that no one can reasonably reject are the basis of what is permitted, which means that every person has a veto that even the consent of all others cannot override (e.g., Scanlon 1998 [2000: 202f, 241, 213ff]). A central motivation for proponents of the contractualist method is often that they expect it to lead to principles that will restrict utilitarian trade-offs and aggregation in the specific way that their own view favours. However, there are of course competing forms of contractualism and, as demonstrated above, also various competing ways of prohibiting or limiting inter-personal balancing and aggregation.

The vast array of different ethical theories and principles that have been defended by appeal to the separateness of individuals seems to demonstrate that an appeal to separateness, by itself, is not specific enough to lend positive support to a particular ethical view (e.g., Rawls 1974; Brink 1993; D. Shoemaker 2007; 2009: 273–4). It can also be argued that conclusions based on separateness often have additional and more radical implications than assumed by the ones drawing these conclusions (McKerlie 1988). Our status as separate individuals can hardly support such conflicting views as egalitarianism, non-egalitarian libertarianism, egoism, and competing forms of limiting aggregation at the same time. This raises the question whether the appeal to separateness may, at best, do a limited amount of work as a negative argument, e.g., against certain features of unrestricted utilitarianism.

10. Methodological Alternatives

Rawls’s famous passage, in which he says that utilitarianism does not take seriously the distinction between persons (Rawls 1971 [1999: 24f]), does not specify what he means by “the distinction between persons”, and other authors are equally inexplicit. This has given rise to a debate over whether the separateness of persons is supposed to be a metaphysical fact or a normative ideal. The normative interpretation is the one that Rawls himself endorses in a subsequent paper (Rawls 1974). According to some versions of the normative view, the dependency relationship between the psychological relations that practically matter and ethics actually runs the other way around than previously assumed in this entry. It might, in fact, run from ethics to the relations that matter.

According to this understanding, different moral theories give rise to different normative ideals of the person, or more specifically, to different normative ideals of personal unity across time—that is, different answers to the What-Matters question. It has been argued that utilitarianism goes well with an understanding of persons as containers for valuable experiences, without much regard for the question of when and to whom these valuable experiences belong. In contrast, a Kantian view is said to require stronger diachronic unity, because Kantians are typically intrinsically interested in providing an account of responsibility for fundamental interests over the span of an entire life (Scheffler 1982a, 1982b; Darwall 1982).

For example, Christine Korsgaard argues that viewing ourselves as agents practically requires us to view ourselves as diachronically unified, irrespective of the actual strength of the various psychological connections between the temporal stages of our lives. We have to view ourselves as unified across time because an agent’s deliberations, acts and rational life plans extent through time. Furthermore, we also have to view ourselves as unified at any given moment in time. This is due to the need of eliminating conflict among our various desires and inclinations in order to be able to act. We only have one body to act with after all (Korsgaard 1989).

A similar line of reasoning motivates narrative accounts of personal identity. According to the narrative criterion of personal identity, what makes an action, experience, or a psychological characteristic the one of a particular individual is its correct incorporation into the self-told story of his or her life (Taylor 1989; Schechtman 1996; DeGrazia 2005; Goldie 2012; Schroer & Schroer 2014). We are not merely passive experiencers of a loosely related chain of experiences in our lives. The force that actively ties the occurrence of our various experiences together, into the experiences of a particular individual, is the creation of our own life story. Viewing ourselves as beings capable of such biographical self-creation gives rise to diachronic unity. According to Schechtman, what is appropriate for the relation between identity and ethics is an answer to the “characterization question”: What are the conditions under which various psychological characteristics, experiences, and actions are properly described as the ones of a particular person (Schechtman 1996: ch. 4). Imagine, for instance, a subject of experiences to whom various experiences merely happened over time. The events would be unified in a purely passive respect, simply as the experiences contained within the life of that subject of experiences. But for that subject to be a person, a genuine moral agent, those experiences must be actively unified, must be gathered together into the life of one narrative ego by virtue of a story the subject tells that weaves them together (Schechtman 1996: 136–162). In this sense, the view that we are creators of our own lives gives rise to diachronic unity.

11. Conclusion

For several reasons, the relationship between personal identity and ethics is complex. First, it is still unclear what the correct theory of identity is. This is partly due to the controversy on whether we are essentially psychological entities or animals. It is also due to the fact that there are various competing psychological views. Second, there is still a significant debate over whether it is identity as such that matters, or whether the psychological or biological relations it consists of are what is relevant for normative and ethical concerns. And finally, as discussed in the last section of this entry, the priority relation between personal identity (or any other relation that arguably matters) and ethics remains unsettled. One can either establish the correct account of what matters as a fixed foundation for the investigation of the impact in ethics, or, alternatively, one can construct the theories of what matters and of our ethical concerns in light of each other, for example by way of a reflective equilibrium.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

The author would like to thank Shelley Weinberg for her expertise on Locke’s theory of personal identity and for carefully proofreading this entry. And special mention goes to David Shoemaker for his inspiring earlier entry, to Jan Schnalke, Karsten Witt and to colleagues from the New Scholars in Bioethics Symposium as well as the Colloquium for Practical Philosophy at Bielefeld, for their thoughts about this entry.

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Annette Dufner <annette.dufner@uni-bielefeld.de>

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