Identity Over Time

First published Fri Mar 18, 2005; substantive revision Mon Jan 12, 2026

The problem of identity through time can be introduced by noting that the following two statements both seem true but, on the assumption that change is real, appear to be inconsistent:

If an object really changes, then there can’t literally be one and the same thing before and after the change.
If there isn’t literally one and the same object before and after a change, then no one object has really undergone any change.

Traditionally, this puzzle has been solved in various ways. Aristotle, for example, distinguished between “accidental” and “essential” changes. Accidental changes are ones that don’t result in a change in an objects’ identity after the change, such as when a house is painted, or one’s hair turns gray, etc. Aristotle thought of these as changes in the accidental properties of a thing. By contrast, change with respect to the essential properties of an object don’t preserve the identity of the object. These “changes” are, in fact, destructions of the earlier thing, such as when a house burns to the ground and ashes remain. Armed with these distinctions, Aristotle would then say that, in the case of accidental changes, (1) is false—a thing can really change one of its “accidental properties” and yet literally remain one and the same thing before and after the change. (See the entry on essential vs. accidental properties.) Which properties a thing has accidentally and which essentially depends on what kind of object it is, on what its form is. According to this view known as hylomorphism, an object is more than its matter; it is a combination of matter and form.

Of course, this solution to the puzzle depends on there being a coherent distinction between accidental and essential changes, and between accidental and essential properties. Some philosophers find this distinction problematic and have developed other solutions that don’t require this distinction. Others appeal to the distinction but claim to discard its problematic features. In what follows, we discuss these solutions to the puzzle, along with other puzzles that arise when considering the identity of objects over time.

1. Introduction

As a number of philosophers have remarked, one of the many puzzles about identity, given its apparent simplicity, is why it proves so puzzling. Indeed, one pervasive sentiment is that identity cannot pose any philosophical problems. Anything that looks like a problem about identity must really be a problem about something else. David Lewis gives striking expression to this sentiment when he says:

More important, we should not suppose that we have here any problem about identity. We never have. Identity is utterly simple and unproblematic. Everything is identical to itself; nothing is ever identical to anything except itself. There is never any problem about what makes something identical to itself; nothing can ever fail to be. (Lewis 1986, 192–193)

Despite that, problems about identity appear to play a central role in a large number of philosophical issues whose discussion dates back to the ancient world. One of the most venerable concerns identity and change. Something undergoes change, yet continues to exist and be itself. The same pan is at one time cold, another time hot. How can something be both identical and different from one time to another? At first sight this problem evaporates once we draw a well-known distinction between numerical and qualitative identity. To say that $a$ and $b$ are qualitatively identical is to say that $a$ exactly resembles $b$. To say that $a$ and $b$ are numerically identical is, at least, to say $a$ and $b$ are one thing and not two (despite the misleadingly plural grammar). Whether $a$ and $b$ can have all their properties in common without being numerically identical is controversial. However, change seems to be the case when $a$ is numerically identical with $b$ without being qualitatively identical with it, that is, when $a$ and $b$ have different properties at different times.

Some find the idea of the very same thing having different properties at different times problematic. (See the problem of temporary intrinsics discussed below.) Setting that general problem aside, there are special cases of it that generate some of the most intractable issues about identity. One results from persisting things putatively having different parts at different times. Consider an object capable of changing its parts, such as a cup at a time when its handle is still attached. At that time the cup appears to consist of the following two parts: a smaller one, its handle, and a larger one consisting of the rest of the cup. Call the larger of these parts the truncated cup. The cup, otherwise unscathed, proceeds to lose its handle. At the earlier time, with its handle still intact, the cup is surely distinct from the truncated cup. Later, after the removal of the cup’s handle, the cup spatially coincides with the truncated cup. Each object is, at the later time, composed from exactly the same atoms. As one philosopher has put it about a different example, at the later time the cup and the truncated cup are as alike as one pea in a pod (Denis Robinson, in conversation). Should we say that the cup and truncated cup are earlier distinct, but later identical? The problem is that saying so arguably conflicts with a fundamental principle governing identity called Leibniz’s Law.

Leibniz is responsible for articulating two principles that, he claims, are constitutive of identity. The first, more controversial, of these, called the identity of indiscernibles, says that qualitative indiscernibility implies identity. The second, often referred to as Leibniz’s Law or the Indiscernibility of Identicals, says that identity implies qualitative indiscernibility. According to Leibniz’s Law, if $a$ is identical with $b$, every quality of $a$ will be a quality of $b$. (See the entry on identity of indiscernibles.)

Here are two ways in which, it seems, saying that the cup is earlier distinct from, but later identical with, the truncated cup conflicts with Leibniz’s Law. Ostensibly one of the cup’s later properties is having earlier had a handle. That is a property the truncated cup never has. So, identifying the later cup and truncated cup appears to violate Leibniz’s Law. There is, at least, one property, having formerly had a handle, that the cup and truncated cup never have in common.

Here is a second way in which the claim that the cup and truncated cup are sometimes, but not always, identical appears to violate Leibniz’s Law. Let us bestow a name on the cup. Call it ‘Cup’. Let us also call the truncated cup ‘Tcup’. We are envisaging that Cup is sometimes, but not always, identical with Tcup. Leibniz’s Law tells us that Cup and Tcup share all their properties at any time they are identical. Some properties are referred to as modal properties. A modal property is the property of possibly or necessarily having some further property. Modal properties include such properties as being possibly red, necessarily extended, possibly taller than a giraffe, or necessarily cup shaped. Arguably one of Cup’s modal properties is the property of being necessarily identical with Cup. Suppose Cup and Tcup are at some time identical. In that case, by Leibniz’s Law, Tcup will, at some time, share with Cup the modal property of being necessarily identical with Cup. So, if Cup is ever identical with Tcup, then Tcup has the modal property of being necessarily identical with Cup. But if Tcup is necessarily identical with Cup, there can be no time when Tcup is distinct from Cup.

Let us say that the identity of $a$ with $b$ is temporary if $a$ is sometimes, but not always, identical with $b$. Later we shall look at other types of puzzle cases that provide some motivation for countenancing temporary identity. Despite the existence of such cases, the majority of philosophers are reluctant to allow temporary identity principally because of the putative conflict with Leibniz’s Law. Instead, to deal with puzzles about identity through time a wide range of alternatives have been proposed. These include: maintaining that Cup is later constituted by Tcup (where constitution does not imply identity); denying that Tcup is earlier a proper part of Cup; maintaining that Cup and Tcup are never identical, but only share a later temporal part in common; maintaining that Cup and Tcup are never identical but are two distinct things that take up the same space, coinciding fully after the handle loss, holding that the identity between the earlier Tcup and later Cup is not literal, but only loose and popular.

Leibniz’s Law, while not controversial, would seem to be at odds with change since change requires a qualitative difference alongside numerically identity. This appearance is dispelled one we distinguish synchronic and diachronic numerical identity. By synchronic identity we mean numerical identity holding at a single time. By diachronic identity we mean numerical identity holding between something existing at one time and something existing at another. Leibniz’ Law straightforwardly holds for synchronic identity. One question is whether synchronic and diachronic identity are different kinds of identity. Some philosophers are willing to countenance different kinds of identity. Others are reluctant to do so. One philosopher who is willing to postulate a multiplicity of different kinds of identity is Peter Geach. Geach, among others, has addressed puzzles about both synchronic and diachronic identity by denying that there is a single absolute relation of identity rather than a host of relative identity relations. On this view we cannot simply say that $a$ is identical with $b$. Instead there must be a concept of a kind of thing, a so called sortal concept, that serves to answer the question: $a$ is the same what as $b$? This is so, according to the champions of relative identity, because the following can happen: $a$ and $b$ both fall under the sortal concepts $F$ and $G, a$ is the same $F$ as $b$, but $a$ is not the same $G$ as $b$ (Geach 1967, and see the entry on relative identity).

Consider the case of Cup and Tcup. Is Cup at the later time $t'$ identical with Tcup? Is Tcup at $t'$ identical with Tcup at $t$? A relative identity theorist would deny that these questions have answers. For such a theorist to have an answerable question we would need to replace, for example, the first with: At $t'$ is Cup the same cup as Tcup?

How could insisting on the relativity of the answer to an identity question to a kind help with the diachronic identity puzzle posed by Cup and Tcup? Here is one way that it could. Suppose that nothing is a cup when it is a proper part of a cup. Then Tcup fails to qualify as a cup at $t$ when it is a proper part of Cup. In that case a relative identity theorist can say the following. At the later time $t'$ Cup is the same cup as Tcup. Since Tcup is not a cup at the earlier time $t$, neither Cup nor Tcup at $t'$ is the same cup as Tcup at $t$. Moreover, for any kind $K$, Cup is not the same $K$ as Tcup at $t$. Identifying Cup with Tcup as the same cup at $t'$ places us under no constraint to identify Cup with one of its proper parts, Tcup, at $t$.

Some of those who reject relative identity nevertheless accept that $a$ cannot be identical with $b$, unless there is a more specific answer to the question whether $a$ is the same thing as $b$. Many philosophers distinguish between two kinds of concepts which are applicable to whatever can persist through time. One kind is illustrated by the concepts of gold (as opposed to a quantity or piece of gold), snow, or rain. In the case of any such concept $F$, there is no answer to the question: how many $F$s are there? In contrast, in the case of other concepts such as the concept of a horse, a tall person, an artwork, or a statue there is an answer to the question: how many $F$s are there? For example, though we may not know it, there is an answer to the question: how many statues are there? Concepts of this last kind are often referred to as sortal concepts. Those who take the view that the question whether $a$ is the same as $b$ is illegitimate, unless it is construed as elliptical for the question whether $a$ is the same thing of such and such a kind as $b$ typically also hold the following views. We should distinguish between two types of sortal concepts: phase sortals and substance sortals. A phase sortal such as child, utensil or prize is a concept that something can cease to fall under without ceasing to exist. If, in contrast, something falls under a substance sortal, it must always do so. If $a$ at some time $t$ is the same as $b$ at the same, or a different time $t'$, it must, say advocates of the view in question, be that, for some sortal $S, a$ at $t$ is the same $S$ as $b$ at $t'$. For example, if John’s favorite artwork at $t$ is identical with Sally’s most valuable possession at $t'$, there must be a substance sortal, the concept of a statue as it may be, under which John’s favorite artwork at $t$, and Sally’s most valuable possession at $t'$ both fall. Moreover, a substance sortal is said to go together with a criterion of identity where a criterion of identity associated with substance sortal $S$ is, inter alia, a criterion for some earlier $S$ being the same $S$ as some later $S$.

Finally, there are a group of issues that fall under the heading of the dispensability of identity. According to one tradition that goes back, at least, to Wittgenstein’s Tractatus, we can theoretically dispense with identity talk without loss of information. Some, but by no means all, who take this view, do so because they hold that the predicate ‘is identical with’ corresponds to no genuine property. Issues about the dispensability of identity engage with issues about identity across time in the following way. This section opened with a quote from David Lewis claiming that there is never any philosophical problem about identity. The case of Cup and Tcup raises what is ostensibly a problem about identity across time. That problem only arises, it seems, because the later Cup is putatively identical with the earlier Tcup. If the problem is not, in part, about that putative identity holding, what is it about?

According to a four dimensionalist like David Lewis, a table is extended through the time of its life, and constituted from temporal parts which are themselves short lived tables. As a four dimensionalist Lewis would not hesitate to give the following answer to the above question. The problem is not about identity, but at least partly about whether a cup-like object that exists only at $t'$ is suitably related to a cup-like object that exists only at $t$ so that both cup-like objects are temporal stages or parts of one four-dimensionally extended cup. As well, Lewis would distinguish the four-dimensional object Cup from the four-dimensional object Tcup, noting that they are two objects that share the same extended temporal part after the breakage. (Lewis 1986, and see entry on temporal parts.)

Some philosophers are not prepared to endorse four dimensionalism but would nevertheless agree with Lewis that Cup and Tcup are distinct objects. While maintaining that they are three dimensional objects and hence do not extend through time, these philosophers would say that even after the breakage Cup and Tcup are two distinct, coinciding objects. The biggest cost the Coincidence view, as it is sometimes called, is that it contradicts the idea that more than one thing cannot exist at the same place at the same time (Thomson 1983, 1998).

It remains to be seen whether the putative problem about Cup and Tcup’s identity through time can be reformulated so that a) it is no longer a problem about identity through time, b) does not require adopting four dimensionalism, and c) maintains the common sense idea that in one place at one time there can only be one thing.

2. Identity and Change

2.1 Diachronic and Synchronic Identity

It is customary to distinguish (numerical) identity at a time from (numerical) identity across time. An example of an identity holding at a single time is: the table in the next room is (now) identical with my favorite table. An example of an identity holding across different times is: The table in the next room is identical with the one you purchased last year. Diachronic identities pose some of the most intractable problems about identity. Before looking at those problems, and some of the most frequently proposed solutions to them, let us ask whether there is anything that distinguishes identity from other relations.

The most commonly agreed on distinguishing feature of identity is that it conforms to the Indiscernibility of Identicals, what was earlier called Leibniz’s Law. Taking ‘$\forall F$’ to be a quantifier ranging over properties, here is one way to formulate Leibniz’s Law:

\[\tag{LL} \forall x\forall y[x=y \rightarrow \forall F(Fx \rightarrow Fy)] \]

LL, understood to range over identity properties, if any, such as being identical with $a$, says that if $x$ is identical with $y$, then any property of $x$ is a property of $y$.

2.2 Identity as an Equivalence Relation

A relation is a property with more than one subject place. When $a$ and $b$ stand in relation $R, a$ has the property of being R-related to b. A relation $R$ is reflexive if each thing stands in $R$ to itself. It is symmetrical if $a$’s standing in $R$ to $b$ implies that $b$ stands in $R$ to $a$. It is transitive if $a$’s standing in $R$ to $b$ and $b$’s likewise standing in $R$ to $c$ together imply that $a$ stands in $R$ to $c$. Identity is trivially reflexive. Each thing trivially stands in the relation of identity to itself. That identity is also symmetrical and transitive follows from Leibniz’s Law. Suppose identity fails to be symmetrical, and for some $a$ and $b, a$ is identical with $b$, but $b$ is not identical with $a$. In that case, $a$ has a property, being identical with $b$, which $b$ fails to have. Suppose identity is not transitive, and, for some $a, b$ and $c, a$ is identical with $b$ and $b$ is identical with $c$, but $a$ is not identical with $c$. In that case $b$ has a property, being identical with $c$, that $a$ lacks.

2.3 Leibniz’s Law and the Possibility of Change: The Problem of Temporary Intrinsics

Identity through time generates a number of problems posed by puzzle cases such as the case of Cup and Tcup. Later we will review a number of solutions to those problems offered in the literature. One problem about identity through time is not raised by considerations of puzzle cases. It arises simply because persisting things can change their intrinsic properties. For that reason it has been labeled by David Lewis the problem of temporary intrinsics (Lewis 1986, 202–205).

A decent test for distinguishing between extrinsic and intrinsic properties is this. A property $F$ is an extrinsic property of an object $o$ if $o$ having $F$ implies that something distinct from, and not a proper part of, $o$ exists. For example, being married to Sally is an extrinsic property of John’s since John can only have that property if something, Sally, distinct from, and not a proper part, of him exists. A property $F$ is an intrinsic property of $o$ if and only if $o$ having $F$ is compatible with nothing apart from $o$ and its proper parts existing, and also compatible with something apart from $o$ existing. For example, the property of being round is an intrinsic property because a surface $S$ having that property is compatible with nothing other than $S$ and its proper parts existing. Here is one reason why this is only a rough way of drawing the distinction between intrinsic and extrinsic properties. It looks as though the property of existing in complete isolation, which Lewis calls loneliness, is extrinsic. Nevertheless being, in this sense, lonely is not only compatible with, but requires that nothing else exists. (For more discussion, see the entry on intrinsic vs. extrinsic properties.)

Suppose some object, a metal plate we will call Plate, changes from being round at $t_1$ to being square at $t_2$. How can that be? After all, though something can have a round part and a square part, nothing can be round and square. No problem, you might say. Nothing can be round and square at a single time, place and world. But something can be round at one time and square at another.

According to Lewis the original problem of temporary intrinsics remains, unless we can show how something can have incompatible properties at different times. To show how that can be so we need to give at least a partial answer to the following question. What is it for something to have a property at a time?

2.4 Candidate Solutions

Lewis considers three answers to this question. According to the first, for some object $O$ to be $F$ at $t$ is for the relation of being $F$ to tenselessly, or timelessly, hold between $O$ and time $t$. For example, for Plate to be round at $t_1$ is for the two-place relation of being round at to hold between Plate and $t_1$. Something can stand in the relation of being round at to the earlier time $t_1$ without standing in that relation to the later time $t_2$. So there is no reason to think that standing in the relation of being round at to $t_1$ is incompatible with standing in the relation of being square at to $t_2$. By transmuting the ostensibly one-place relational properties of being round and being square into the two-place relational properties of being round at and being square at we can show how something can be round at one time and square at another.

Lewis’ principal objection to this first solution is that it illicitly transforms intrinsic properties into extrinsic ones. He takes it as evident that properties such as being round and being red are intrinsic. Why so? Call the view that putatively one-place intrinsic properties are two-place relational properties the relational view. Why does Lewis so adamantly reject that view? One difficulty with answering this question is a difficulty about locating the source of Lewis’ disquiet with the relational view.

Is it that Lewis rejects the relational view because it treats putatively intrinsic properties as extrinsic, or because it discerns an extra place in a putatively monadic (one-place) property? That it is the latter is suggested by the following. The problem of temporary intrinsics appears to arise because nothing can have the intrinsic properties of being round and being square, unless it has those properties at different times. The same goes for pairs of extrinsic properties. The property of being the same height as the Eiffel Tower is extrinsic as is the property of being different in height from the Eiffel Tower. Something can change from being the same height as the Eiffel Tower to being different in height from that structure even though nothing can simultaneously have the properties of being the same height as, and being different in height from, the Eiffel Tower. Suppose we say that something can be the same height as the Eiffel Tower at some time $t_1$ without being the same height as the Eiffel tower at some distinct time $t_2$. In that case we appear to be confronted with the same problem as the one that originally raised the problem of temporary intrinsics. We are confronted with the task of explaining what it is for something to have, in this case, the property of being the same height as the Eiffel Tower at time $t_1$. If we respond, it is for the three-place relation of being the same height as at to hold between some object, the Eiffel Tower, and time $t_1$ we are, treating an ostensibly two place relation as a three place one even though we are not treating an intrinsic property as extrinsic.

Lewis considers an second explanation of what it is for an object to have a property at a time that might be called the ‘according to’ explanation. We are used to something having a property according to one story, but failing to have that property according to another. If we think of a time as a set of propositions describing what holds at that time, we can say that according to one such set Plate is round, but according to another it is square. Even a cursory assessment of this explanation requires exploring what propositions are and which propositions exist, and exactly what it takes for a sets of propositions to be a time.

Nevertheless we can still acknowledge some benefits of the according to explanation when it is combined with a view about existence and time that has received considerable discussion in recent years. The view is called Presentism. On the Presentist view the only things that exist without qualification are things that presently exist. Suppose $t_1$, a time when Plate is round, is the present. In that case if Plate is ever square, it either was, or will be. What is it for Plate to be round? Given that plate is presently round what makes it the case that Plate is round is not just that Plate is round according to some set of propositions about the present. Instead what makes it the case that Plate is presently round is that Plate exists and is round. So, what makes it the case that Plate, say, will be square? Not, the Presentist will say, this: Plate tenselessly or timelessly exists, and will be square. So what makes it the case that Plate will be square? Perhaps this. What makes it true that Plate will be square is that Plate is square according to some relevant future-tensed presently existing propositions. (A natural way to think of these is as presently existing future-tensed truths.)

Here is one reason why we might think that Presentism does not, in the end, help with the problem of temporary intrinsics. Suppose that, at $t_1$, we send a spherical object forward in time to $t_2$. At $t_2$ the shape of the spherical object changes so that it becomes cylindrical. Retaining its cylindrical shape the object is sent back to $t_1$. Even if Presentism is true, at $t_1$ we have an object with incompatible intrinsic properties. Some presentists might find this thought experiment inconceivable since, according to presentism, there is ever only one real time, whereas time travel would seem to require the existence of a destination distinct from the moment of departure. Despite this apparent tension some philosophers argued that Presentism does not contradict the possibility of time travel (see entry on time travel, especially 4.1.)

Of course, to embrace this combination of an according to explanation with Presentism is to embrace just one of a number of options available to the Presentist for giving the truthmakers of future and past tense propositions.

Whether or not a Presentist wishes to take over in this way the ‘according to’ explanation, Presentism provides a solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics. Presentists can deny that it follows from something at one time being round that will at another time be square that there exists something both round and square.

Lewis, we saw, denies that a sentence such as ‘Plate is square at $t_1$’ states something true just in case Plate stands in the square at relation to $t_1$. In his original exposition of the problem of temporary intrinsics, Lewis does not consider a variety of other ways of understanding sentences attributing ostensibly intrinsic properties to objects at times. Here is one. Many take it that a relation of instantiation holds between a property and its instances. Suppose instantiation is not a two place, but, at least, a three place relation holding between an object, property and time. If so, Plate is round at $t_1$ if and only if Plate stands in the instantiation relation to the (non-relational) property of roundness and $t_1$. Moreover Plate standing in the instantiation relation to roundness and $t_1$ is clearly consistent with Plate failing to stand in the instantiation relation to roundness and the different time $t_2$.

The key difference between this view and the relational view that Lewis considers is the following. On the relational view we take an ostensibly non-relational property such as being circular to be relational and extrinsic. (It is extrinsic because having it requires an object to stand in a relation to a time.) On the instantiation view we are taking something, the instantiation relation, that is already an extrinsic relation to have an extra place. So, our intuitions about what counts as an intrinsic non-relational property are not violated.

Alternative ways of taking ‘$a$ is red at $t$’ include treating ‘at $t$’ as an adverbial modifier, or as a sentential operator. According to the first ‘at $t$’, better written as ‘at $t$-ly’, is an adverbial modifier specifying the way in which something has a property. So ‘Plate is round at $t_1$’ is true just in case Plate has roundness at$-t_1$-ly. Plate, on this view, can be round at $t_1$, but square at $t_2$ because Plate can have roundness at $t_1$-ly without having roundness at$-t_2$-ly (See Johnston 1987, Haslanger 1989).

According to the temporal operator view ‘at $t_1$’ and ‘at $t_2$’ should be understood as the temporal operators: ‘at $t_1$ it is true that …’ and ‘at $t_2$ it is true that …’. Just as ‘it is possible that Plate is round’ is consistent with ‘it is possible that Plate is square’ so ‘at $t_1$ it is true that Plate is round’ is consistent with ‘at $t_2$ it is true that Plate is square’.

Solutions to the problem of temporary intrinsics abound. Here is another that treats being true and being false as three place relations between propositions, facts and times. Consider the propositions:

(i) Plate is round,

And:

(ii) Plate is square.

We should distinguish between a property of a proposition, and a property that is a constituent of a proposition. Being a proposition is a property of (i), but is not a constituent of (i). In contrast, being round is a constituent of (i), but is not a property of (i). Propositions have no shape. Can we hold that (i) and (ii) are both true compatibly with taking roundness and squareness to be intrinsic properties?

It is plausible to suppose that that the truth value of a proposition such as (i) or (ii) depends on the existence of something distinct from that proposition. Since that is so, let us, as some adherents of a correspondence theory of truth would do, allow that if (i), say, is true, it has a relational property of being true. For example being true may be a relation that holds between (i) and the fact that Plate is round.

How many places are there in what we may call the truth relation? It is often thought to be a two place relation. Suppose that is wrong, and truth is a three place relation holding between a proposition, fact and time. In that case, the three place relation of truth can hold between (i), the fact that Plate is round, and $t_1$, without holding between (i), the same fact and $t_2$.

Of course whether this is a solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics depends on what that problem is. It is a solution if the problem is to explain time indexing without turning intrinsic into extrinsic properties. After all, no correspondence theorist would allow that truth is an intrinsic property. (On the correspondence theory, see entry on truth.) It is not a solution if the problem is to explain time indexing without adding extra places to, it may be, relational properties.

Alternatively, we can follow Haslanger in Haslanger 1989 and Lowe in Lowe 1987 and treat the relevant propositions as tensed. A change in an intrinsic property corresponds, on this view, to a change in the tense of a proposition attributing that property.

Lewis (2002) objects to this last solution on the grounds that a tensed proposition should itself be identified with a relational property. But, such identification leaves it unexplained how something can change its non-relational intrinsic properties. Ben Caplan in Caplan 2005 has replied to Lewis that Lewis’s objection depends on a view about propositions that is not compulsory.

Lewis favors a different solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics (Lewis 1986). Whether or not there is a problem with the same object being round and square, there is no problem with the same object having a round part and a square part. To solve the problem of temporary intrinsics, Lewis invokes the view that, in addition to their spatial parts, objects have temporal parts, the shortest lived, instantaneous, ones of which are called stages. This allows him to hold that Plate is round at $t_1$ and square at $t_2$ because Plate has a round part at $t_1$ and a square part at $t_2$. Plate’s round $t_1$ part exists only at $t_1$, and Plate’s square $t_2$ part exists only at $t_2$. Hence there is no problem posed by either temporal part changing its shape. Plate itself is an object consisting of a suitably interrelated sequence of such temporal parts. For the $t_1$ temporal part of Plate to be round is just for it to be round. For the longer lived Plate to be round at $t_1$ is for Plate to be appropriately related to a round temporal part at $t_1$.

As we have seen, in invoking temporal parts or stages Lewis endorses one species of what has come to be called Four Dimensionalism. The expression ‘Four Dimensionalism’ has been applied to a number of different positions that it is well to distinguish here, since not all of them are relevant to identity across time. ‘Four Dimensionalism’ has sometimes been used for the thesis, particularly associated with Relativity Theory, that time is space-like. On another use of ‘Four Dimensionalism’ a persisting thing is identical with its history. On this view an object is a sequence of events. Sometimes ‘Four Dimensionalism’ is used to label the view that, contra Presentism, things past, present, and future are equally real.

Lewis’ version of Four Dimensionalism should be distinguished from all of the above. It is the view that, just as an object such as Plate is extended in space with spatial parts, so it is extended in time with temporal parts. (See the entry on temporal parts.)

The problem of temporary intrinsics focuses on the possibility of persisting things changing their properties, or, at least, changing their intrinsic properties. Many of the problems about identity through time are posed by puzzle cases that involve change of parts. Four dimensionalism is one, widely accepted, solution to those puzzles. It is not overstretching it to suggest that each of the puzzle cases we will shortly consider appears to be a case of temporary identity. That is, each one appears to be a case of the following. For some $x$ and $y$, at some time $t x$ is identical with $y$, and at some time $t'$, $x$ is distinct from $y$.

In the first section we briefly looked at one argument, the so-called modal argument for the necessity of identities, for denying that there could be temporary identities. Some philosophers have responded to some of the diachronic identity puzzles by maintaining that there could be indeterminate identities. An argument with a similar structure to the modal argument has been deployed to rule out indeterminate identities. Given their implications for identity across time, the modal argument and the argument against indeterminate identities are set out in more detail in the next section.

3. Necessary and Determinate Identities

Here are two examples of identity statements:

(i) The table in the next room is (now) identical with my favorite table.

(ii) The table in the next room is identical with the one you purchased last year.

(i) and (ii) are contingent. Even if the table in the next room is my favorite table, it might not have been. Even if the table in the next room is the one you purchased last year, it might not have been. One of the most important discussions of identity is to be found in Saul Kripke’s paper ‘Identity and Necessity’ and his book Naming and Necessity (in Munitz 1971, Kripke 1980). One lesson to be learned from Kripke’s discussion is that it is illegitimate to infer from identity statements such as (i) and (ii) having their truth value contingently that the relation of identity can hold contingently.

Why is this inference illegitimate? Compare (i) with:

(iii) The table in the next room is the same size as my favorite table.

Being the same size as is an equivalence relation (i.e., it is symmetric, reflexive, and transitive) that holds contingently. What does it take for that relation to hold contingently between the table in the next room and my favorite table? Thinking in terms of possible worlds, the table in the next room is contingently the same size as my favorite table just in case the following is so. The table in the next room is the same size as my favorite table, but, in some possible world $W$, something identical to (or a counterpart of) the actual table in the next room is not the same size as what is actually my favorite table.

Without having recourse to possible worlds, what this comes to is that the table in the next room is contingently the same size as my favorite table only if, in addition to (iii), the following is true:

(iv) $(\exists x)(\exists y)[(x =$ the table in the next room) & $(y =$ my favorite table) & (possibly, $x$ is not the same size as $y)]$.

Likewise the table in the next room is contingently identical with my favorite table only if, in some world $W$, what is actually my favorite table is not identical with what is actually the table in the next room. That condition need not be satisfied for (i) to be contingently true. All it takes for (i) to be contingently true is that, for example, (i) is true, but in some world $W$ something qualifies as my favorite table without also qualifying as the table in the next room. For that to be so nothing need be identical, or counterpart related, across worlds.

Kripke and Ruth Barcan Marcus offer an argument to show that there are no contingent identities. Here is one version of that argument often referred to as the Modal Argument for the Necessity of Identities:

Suppose:

\[\tag{1} a=b \]

But each thing is necessarily identical with itself. Hence;

\[\tag{2} \Box(a=a) \]

Taking ‘$[\lambda x\ \Phi]$’ to mean: being an $x$ such that $\Phi$ (where $\Phi$ is some logical formula in which ‘$x$’ is a free variable), we supposedly have:

\[\tag{3} [\lambda x\ \Box(x=a)]a \]

Since, by Leibniz’s Law, if (1) then $a$ and $b$ share all properties in common. Hence (1) and (3) yield:

\[\tag{4} [\lambda x\ \Box(x=a)]b \]

which in turn yields:

\[\tag{5} \Box(a=b). \]

Though widely accepted, this type of argument has been contested. Leibniz’s Law, again understood as ranging over identity properties, is used to derive step (4)—$b$ has the property of being necessarily identical with $a$—from step (3), $a$ has the property of being necessarily identical with $a$. One might deny that there are any such modal properties. Doing so blocks the argument if the application of LL is restricted to properties. Alternatively, one might allow that there are such properties as being necessarily identical with $a$, but deny that (3) follows from (2). On one view, all that follows from (2) is that $a$ has the property of being necessarily identical with itself expressed by the predicate ‘$[\lambda x\ x=x]$’. We need to distinguish the property of being necessarily identical with itself, which every existent has, from the property of being necessarily identical with $a$—which only $a$ has (Lowe 1982).

Finally, (2) has been rejected on the following grounds. There is a well entrenched convention that repeated tokens of the same type of name, constant or variable are assigned the same value. From the existence of this convention it follows that ‘$a = a$’ expresses a truth. It does not follow, according to this objection, that ‘$a = a$’ expresses something necessarily true. Here is the thought. Suppose, the repeated use of a proper name were governed, not by the identity convention, but by what we may call the admiration convention. According to the admiration convention, a subsequent occurrence of a proper name in a sentence should be taken to refer to something only if it is admired by the referent of the first occurrence. In the light of this, admittedly bizarre, convention consider the truth value of ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’. If the second occurrence of ‘Napoleon’ refers, it will refer to someone admired by the referent of the first occurrence. So, if the admiration convention is adhered to, ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ will, if it expresses any proposition, express a true one. This is guaranteed by our supposition that the relation governing the repeated use of ‘$a$’ is the same as the one that $a$ is said to stand in to $a$. Despite that, ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ expresses a contingent truth. Likewise, ‘$a=a$’ expresses a true proposition if it expresses any proposition at all, since the relation governing the repeated use of ‘$a$’ is the same as the one that $a$ is said to stand in to $a$. But, as with ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ given the admiration convention, there is no reason to suppose that the truth expressed by ‘$a=a$’ is a necessary one. (Gallois 1998, 229–231). This objection is not unassailable, however. First, it is not obvious how the same objection can be made in terms of the sentence ‘$a$ is identical with itself’ or a sentence in quantified first order logic, such as $(\exists x)(Fx \text{ and } Gx)$. In the latter case, the identity convention seems essential to the meaning of the recurrent variable (Hawthorne 2003, 100). Second, it should be granted that the fact that a sentence expresses a true proposition if it expresses anything is not by itself sufficient for the proposition that it expresses being a necessary truth. However, granting this does not compromise premise (2), which is the proposition that $a=a$ is necessarily true, which is independent of the conventions used in expressing that proposition.

Philosophers have appealed to contingent identities to solve identity puzzles. They have also appealed to vague or indeterminate identities to solve such puzzles. Consider a club that over an extended time changes its rules, membership and location. Is the original club identical with the club having a new location, rules and membership? Call the original club the Identity Club, and the club with new rules, membership and location the Constitution Club. Is the following true?:

C: The Identity Club = The Constitution Club.

Some would say that that the identity stated by $C$ is vague or indeterminate. What does it mean to say that an identity is vague or indeterminate? At least this. $C$ is not determinately true, or determinately false. If $C$ does lack a determinate truth value, is that enough to ensure that the identity of the clubs referred to by $C$ is indeterminate?

In the case of the identity sentence:

(i) The table in the next room is (now) identical with my favorite table.

we saw the need to distinguish between (i) having its truth value contingently, and (i) stating an identity that holds only contingently. We likewise need to distinguish $C$ having an indeterminate truth value from $C$ stating an identity that holds only indeterminately. $C$ may lack a determinate truth value because one, or both, of the referring expressions ‘The Identity Club’ and ‘The Constitution Club’ lacks a determinate referent. Nevertheless for any determinate choice of referents for those expressions $C$ has a determinate truth value.

Can it happen that the referring expressions ‘$a$’ and ‘$b$’ refer precisely in the identity sentence ‘$a=b$’ without that sentence being determinately true or false? Here is one version of an argument, due to Gareth Evans and Nathan Salmon, that is supposed to show that it cannot (Evans 1978, Salmon 1981). Let ‘$Ip$’ mean: it is indeterminate whether $p$, that is $p$ is neither determinately true nor determinately false, and let ‘$Dp$’ mean: it is determinate that $p$. We have:

\[\tag{$1'$} I(a=b). \]

But:

\[\tag{$2'$} D (a=a). \]

This $(2')$ yields:

\[\tag{$3'$} [\lambda x\ D(x=a)]a \]

which states: $a$ has the property of it being determinate that it is identical with $a$. Suppose:

\[\tag{$4'$} a=b \]

Applying Leibniz’s Law to $(3')$ and $(4')$ gives:

\[\tag{$5'$} [\lambda x\ D(a=x)]b \]

which states: $b$ has the property of it being determinate that it is identical with $a$. From the above, it follows that:

\[\tag{$6'$} D(a=b), \]

which contradicts $(1')$. Hence $(1')$ implies:

\[\tag{$7'$} \neg(a=b) \]

If $(7')$ is true then it is not true that $a$ is identical with $b$. So if $(7')$ is true, $a$ is determinately distinct from $b. (1')$ cannot be true.

Of course, defenders of indeterminate identity do not let this pass unquestioned. One assumption of the argument is that $(7')$ implies that $a$ is determinately distinct from $b$ rather than just that $a$ is not determinately identical with $b$.

Arguments against contingent and indeterminate identities appeal to Leibniz’s Law. Seen as a principle about the transmission of properties across identity, Leibniz’s Law or its use in metaphysics has been scrutinized (see Schnieder 2006, Magidor 2011, Shumener 2022). Similarly, Evans’ argument has been called into question from a number of directions. Examples include Parsons 2000 (esp. Appendix), and more recently Barnes 2009; also see entry on identity.

4. Diachronic Identity Puzzles

In the introduction we encountered one type of puzzle about identity across time: the case of Cup and Tcup. The puzzle arose because we envisaged Cup losing one of its parts, and coming to have the same material constitution (being, for example, composed of exactly the same atoms as), and spatial boundaries as Tcup. Call this the cup case. Let us say that $a$ and $b$ are coincident at a time $t$ just in case the following holds. Something is a proper part of $a$ at $t$ if and only if it is a proper part of $b$ at that same time. Cup and Tcup are coincident at the later time since something at that later time is, for example, and atomic part of $a$ if and only if it is an atomic part of $b$.

Such a case is not the only, or even main, type of case posing a problem about diachronic identity. In addition, there are what are often referred to as fission and fusion cases. A fission case has the following features. We have putatively distinct things $b$ and $c$ existing at some later time $t_2$. Each of $b$ and $c$ is related to $a$, which exists at an earlier time $t_1$, in such a way that each one is ostensibly identical with $a$.

Fission cases come in two varieties: symmetrical and asymmetrical. Examples of symmetrical fission cases include amoebic and hemispheric division [for the latter see Personal Identity below]. In a symmetrical case there is some relation that each of $b$ and $c$ stand in to $a$, where standing in that relation is what makes each one putatively identical with $a$. In an asymmetric case, $b$ is putatively identical with $a$ because it stands in a certain relation to $a$, but $c$ is putatively identical with $a$ because it stands in a different relation to $a$.

The best known example of an asymmetrical fission case is the Ship of Theseus. Over a long period all of the planks composing a certain ship are replaced one by one. Eventually a ship indiscernible from the original, but composed of entirely different planks, results. Call that later ship Replacement. As each plank is removed from the original ship it is used to construct a ship that is constituted from all and only the planks belonging to the original ship. Call the ship composed of the same planks as the ones initially composing the original ship Reassembly.

Identity is, very plausibly, an equivalence relation (see Section 2.2). One consequence of it being an equivalence relation is that it is subject to transitivity: the principle that if aRb and bRc, then aRc. Saying that, in the case of Theseus’ ship, Replacement and Reassembly are both identical with the original ship putatively conflicts with the transitivity of identity since Replacement seems to be later clearly distinct from Reassembly.

There are cases that pose similar diachronic identity puzzles that do not involve change of parts. One of the best known involves a lump of clay which, at an earlier time, is coincident with a statue, but, at a later, say as a result of deformation, is just a shapeless lump of clay. Since the lump has the property of existing at the later time which the statue doesn’t, given Leibniz’s Law, the statue and the lump must be distinct objects. One problem with this is that during the time the statue exists, it would be against common sense to say that they are two and not one.

What is the best account of these cases? Here are some of the major ones on offer:

4.1 Constitution

Constitution accounts pivot on the distinction between constitution and identity. Defenders of such accounts hold that constitution, unlike identity, is not an equivalence relation (Baker 2002). Constitution is said to be, at least, non-symmetrical. According to a constitution account, we say the following about the three types of puzzle cases described above. Cup is never identical with Tcup. Later Cup is constituted by Tcup. (Alternatively: Cup and Tcup never constitute each other, but later are constituted from the very same atoms.) Likewise the lump of clay is never identical with the statue, but earlier only constitutes the statue. Finally, the reassembly ship is never identical, but only constituted from exactly the same planks as, the original.

A constitution theorist can say the following about Theseus’ Ship. The ship resulting from the replacement of the original planks is identical with, but not constituted from, the original planks. The ship reconstituted from the original planks is not identical with the one originally constituted from those planks. Unfortunately, constitution only delivers a candidate solution in a symmetric fission case.

Kit Fine has deployed a number of novel Leibniz’s Law arguments in favour of a constitution account. Such arguments are replied to by Brian Frances in Frances 2006.

The constitution view has come in for its share of criticisms. Some think it engages in metaphysical multiple vision, seeing a multiplicity of things at a given place and time where there is plausibly only one. Others argue that constitution $is$ identity (see Noonan 1993).

A number of objections have been raised against constitution views. One is an objection from causal overdetermination. Another is an objection from grounding. Consider a statue allegedly constituted from a statue shaped piece of clay. Someone throws the statue against a pane of glass, which breaks. What caused the glass to break? Surely, the statue impacting it. But the glass was also impacted by the statue shaped piece of clay with sufficient force to break it. So, if constitution is not identity, the glass breaking has two causes. Some would say that is one cause too many.

The objection from grounding is not so much an objection to the constitution view, but an objection designed to undermine a principal reason for adopting it. A principal reason for adopting the constitution view is that it seems to allow, for example, the statue and the piece of clay to have different properties. In particular, it seems to allow them to have different modal properties such as being squashable. Since constitution, unlike identity, does not conform to the indiscernibility of identicals, the clay can be squashable even if the statue is not.

The problem is that the clay and the statue are made up of exactly the same atoms organized in the same way. Since that is so, it is hard to see how the clay can be squashable without the statue being so as well. Catherine Sutton argues that the clay and the statue differ in their extrinsic properties, specifically in their relationship to human intentions (Sutton 2012).

A further problem for constitution views is the so called too many minds objection (see Olsen 1997 and Shoemaker 1999). Advocates of constitutionalism typically hold that a person is constituted by a living organism. If so, the person and the living organism constituting that person share the same thoughts. Whenever you encounter a person you encounter a distinct living organism having occupying the same region and having the same thoughts. Not a good result.

4.2 Relative Identity

Advocates of relative identity deny that there is a single identity relation (see Geach 1967, Griffin 1977). On their view it is improper to ask whether, say, the statue is the same thing as the later lump of clay. Instead we should ask whether it is the same statue, or the same lump of clay. For an advocate of relative identity denying that the earlier statue is the same statue as the later lump of clay is consistent with allowing that the earlier statue is the same lump of clay as the later lump of clay. It is natural for the relative identity theorist to insist on relativising the transitivity of identity to the same sortal concept in the following way. What the relativised transitivity principle says is that: $a$ is the same $F$ as $b$, and $b$ is the same $F$ as $c$ implies only that $a$ is the same $F$ as $c$ (see Griffin 1977).

One objection to relative identity is that it conflicts with Leibniz’s Law. Here is one way in which such conflict may be thought to arise. Consider the property version of Leibniz’s Law:

\[\tag{LL} \forall x\forall y[x=y \rightarrow \forall F(Fx \rightarrow Fy)] \]

The relation of identity mentioned in the antecedent of LL is unrelativised to a sortal. To make it acceptable to the relative identity theorist, let us amend LL to:

\[\tag{LLR} \forall x\forall y[\forall F(x \text{ is the same } F \text{ as } y) \rightarrow \forall G(Gx \rightarrow Gy)] \]

Suppose we replace ‘is the same $F$ as $y$’ in LLR with ‘is the same lump of clay’, ‘$x$’ with ‘the earlier statue’, ‘$y$’ with ‘the later clay lump’, and instantiate the quantifier $\forall G$ with ‘is the same statue as the earlier statue’. We then obtain:

R: the earlier statue is the same lump of clay as the later clay lump $\rightarrow$ (the earlier statue is the same statue as the earlier statue $\rightarrow$ the earlier statue is the same statue as the later clay lump ).

The trouble is that $R$ is false. The earlier statue is the same lump of clay as the clay lump, and the earlier statue is the same statue as the earlier statue, but the earlier statue is not, contrary to LLR, the same statue as the later clay lump.

Some relative identity theorists have this to say about Theseus’ Ship. In that case conflict with the transitivity of identity is avoided by maintaining the following. The replacement ship is the same ship as the original, and the original is the same collection of planks as the reassembly ship. Conflict with transitivity is avoided because we need not allow that the reassembly ship is the same ship as the original.

In symmetrical fission cases, however, relative identity theory is not helpful. If an amoeba, call it $A$, fissions into amoebae $B$ and $C$, each of $B$ and $C$ have a claim to being the same amoeaba as $A$. Since $B$ and $C$ are not the same amoeba, transitivity fails.

4.3 Identity: ‘Strict’ and ‘Loose’

Following Bishop Butler, Roderick Chisholm distinguishes between a strict and a loose sense of identity (see Chisholm 1969a and 1976; Steen 2008 for a meticulous study of the evolution of Chisholm’s ontological views). To see what this distinction comes to, and how it might help with the puzzle cases, consider the case of Cup and Tcup. For Chisholm things have their parts essentially in the following sense. It is impossible for $a$ to be identical with $b$ in the strict and philosophical sense, unless $a$ and $b$ have all their parts in common. Earlier Cup has a part, a handle, that later Cup, not to mention earlier and later Tcup, lacks. Hence, on Chisholm’s view, earlier Cup is not strictly identical with later Cup.

Earlier Cup is nonetheless identical with later Cup in a loose and popular sense. What then, according to Chisholm, is it for earlier Cup and later Cup to be identical in a loose and popular sense? To simplify let us suppose, unrealistically, that the only change of parts that Cup in, Chisholm would say, a loose and popular sense undergoes is loss of a handle. Call Hcup the object that consists of Cup’s handle together with Tcup. Chisholm would say this. Earlier, Hcup stands in for Cup, and later Tcup alone stands in for Cup. Moreover Tcup is related to Hcup in such a way that, as Chisholm puts it, Tcup at $t_2$ is the ens successivum of Hcup at an earlier time $t_1 .$ For Chisholm what makes Tcup at $t_2$ an ens successivum of Hcup at $t_1$ seems to be this. Tcup is a proper part of Hcup at $t_1$. There is a sequence $S$ of cups such that each member of $S$ that is not identical with Hcup is, at some time, a proper part of some member of $S$. For each time between and including $t_1$ and $t_2$ Cup some member of $S$ stands in for cup. Since Hcup stands in for Cup $t_1$ and Tcup stands in for Cup at $t_2$ and Tcup is an ens successivum of Hcup, we may say that earlier cup is loosely identical with later Cup.

According to Chisholm, the puzzles we have encountered stem from our conflating strict with loose and popular identity. In the case of Ship of Theseus, we find it intuitive to say that Replacement is the same as the original ship because we have in mind loose and popular identity. We also find Reassembly to be a good fit to be identical to the original since they share all the same parts and so pass the demands of strict identity. The Ship of Theseus characterized as entia successiva is not real but a logical construction, in a succession of materials that go from the original to Replacement. The set of planks that stood in for the ship before replacements began are the same set of planks that make up Reassembly. Whether strict identity obtains between the original ship and Reassembly is a thorny issue that depends on whether a mass of matter can continue to exist when its parts are not located together or else whether something can go out of existence and come back into existence. Chisholm’s views on this have shifted over the years. (Mark Steen in Steen 2008 offers an excellent exposition of the evolution of Chisholm’s views on identity over time.) Whatever Chisholm says about the putative identity of the original planks and Reassembly, however, it is clear how according to his view, transitivity of identity is not violated, since Replacement is not strictly identical with the original ship.

The two functional ships, as ordinary objects, must be distinct series of entia successiva. What can Chisholm say about one ordinary object’s fission into two? Chisholm would say that ordinary objects characterized as entia successiva are not real but logical constructions. As logical constructions it might be considered unproblematic for two ships to be at the same place at the same time in the beginning of the scenario.

It is not easy to see how Chisholm would answer the question of what it takes to be entia successiva at all. His characterization of them requires appeal to ordinary object or natural kind sortals, but since entia successiva are logical constructs rather than real objects, it is hard to know why there could not be plenty of other kinds of entia successiva that answer to sortals that are not in any known conceptual framework.

The puzzle cases are puzzle cases because they bring into putative conflict intuitions all of which we want to subscribe to. Consider a statue and the collection of atoms that constitute it. We wish to say that the statue is identical with the collection of atoms. We also wish to say that the statue, but not the collection, can survive the loss of one atom belonging to that collection. Leibniz’s Law appears to force us to renounce one of these intuitions. We have seen how Chisholm tries to reconcile these two intuitions. More recently Thomas Sattig argues for a similar compatibilist view according to which we can hold on to both intuitions without giving up, or modifying, Leibniz’s Law. We can do so by relativizing identities to different perspectives. From the ordinary object perspective the statue is distinct from the atoms that constitute it. From the material object perspective the statue is identical with the atoms that constitute it. Material object is Sattig’s term for a mereological sums of atoms, which obey unrestricted composition mentioned in section $X$ as well as another principle known as extensionality. According to extensionality a given set of objects can have only one sum. Ordinary objects are more than just material objects. They are composed of material objects as well a formal element Sattig calls a K-path. Thus, to use a term we saw in the opening, Sattig’s view is somewhat hylomorphist. By combining the resources of hylomorphism with the advantages of a perspectivalist analysis of the claims we find intuitive Sattig offers complex solutions to each of the puzzles we have been working on (Sattig 2015, Chapter 4).

4.4 Arbitrary Undetached Parts

One solution to the problem posed by the cup case is to reject what Peter van Inwagen calls the Doctrine of Arbitrary Undetached Parts (see van Inwagen 1981). In setting the problem up we assumed that earlier Cup consists of the following parts: a handle together with Tcup. That assumption is justified if the following is. Tcup existed as a part of Cup when Cup still had its handle. Van Inwagen would reject that assumption. According to him it is illegitimate to assume that any old way of notionally dividing up an object yields an individual that exists as an undetached part.

Instead of denying that Tcup exists at $t_1$ when it is ostensibly a proper part of Cup, we might instead deny that Tcup at $t_1$ is identical with what looks very much like Tcup at $t_2$. In this way we can preserve transitivity without having to identify the earlier cup with one of its proper parts.

One way to allow that Tcup earlier exists without conceding its later identity with Cup is, following Michael Burke, to maintain that Tcup goes out of existence when Cup loses its handle (see Burke 1994). Roughly, this is because at that instant the matter that made Tcup before stops being a part of a cup and starts being a cup (see the Dominant Kinds section of the entry on material constitution.)

4.5 Four Dimensionalism

Here is what a classical four dimensionalist would say about the case of the cup. Suppose the interval from $t_1$ to $t_2$ is the time during which Cup has a handle attached to it, and $t_2$ to $t_3$ the interval during which Cup is without a handle, and, so, putatively identical with Tcup. As before Hcup is the fusion of Tcup and Cup’s handle. According to the four dimensionalist, Cup, Tcup and Hcup are all extended in time as well as space. Tcup has a temporal part that extends from $t_1$ to $t_2$ together with a temporal part that extends from $t_2$ to $t_3$. Tcup’s $t_1$ to $t_2$ and $t_2$ to $t_3$ temporal parts are distinct from each other as well as being distinct from the temporally longer Tcup. Hcup, that is Tcup plus handle, is a four dimensional object that extends from $t_1$ to $t_2$. Cup itself consists of the following two, among indefinitely many other, temporal parts: Hcup and the $t_2$ to $t_3$ part of Tcup.

What we should say according to the classical four dimensionalist is this. The $t_1$ to $t_2$ temporal part of Tcup is a proper temporal and spatial part of Hcup. Hcup and the $t_2$ to $t_3$ temporal parts of Tcup are proper temporal parts of Cup. Cup is not identical with any of Hcup, Tcup from $t_1$ to $t_2$, Tcup from $t_2$ to $t_3$, or Tcup from $t_1$ to $t_3$. In particular there is no question of Cup being literally identical with Tcup from $t_2$ to $t_3$, when they are indiscernible, though, following David Lewis, we may say that Cup and Tcup are identical at any time between $t_2$ and $t_3$ in the sense that they share temporal parts during those times (see Lewis 1986).

Many four-dimensionalists subscribe to a principle that a number of writers call unrestricted mereological composition. According to that principle any set of, in this case four-dimensional, objects constitute a further four dimensional object. Armed with the unrestricted mereological composition principle a four-dimensionalist can say that what there is, in the case of Theseus’ ship, is a $Y$ branching object dividable in an indefinite number of ways into four dimensional proper parts an indefinite number of which are ships. For example the ship consisting of the stem together with the replacement branch has as two of its proper parts a ship consisting of just the stem, and one consisting of just the replacement branch (Heller 1984, 1990, 2000, Lewis 1986.)

Apart from the argument that it provides the best solution to diachronic identity puzzles four dimensionalism has been defended on a number of other grounds. One we have reviewed already; the argument that four dimensionalism gives the best solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics. Another, also offered by David Lewis, invokes the principle that facts in general supervene on facts about the instantiations of intrinsic properties and external relations. Call facts about the instantiation of intrinsic properties and external relations basic facts, and let $R$ be the spatio-temporal region occupied by Plate throughout its career. According to Lewis there is a world $W$ in which a sequence of shorter Plate-like objects occupy $R$, and all of the basic facts that obtain in our world obtain in $W$. Lewis’ supervenience principle tells us that all facts supervene on basic facts. The same basic facts obtain in both our world and $W$. So whatever is true of the occupant of $R$ in $W$ is true of the occupant of $R$ in our world. The occupant of $R$ in $W$ is a sequence of, appropriately interrelated Plate-like objects. Hence the occupant of $R$ in our world, that is Plate, is likewise a sequence of interrelated Plate-like objects.

Recently Sider (2002) developed an argument for Four Dimensionalism from considerations about vagueness. He argues that Four Dimensionalism is true if it cannot be vague how many things there are, and also that it cannot be vague how many things there are.

It should be noted that Sider and Katherine Hawley defend an alternative version of four dimensionalism which identifies objects with what, on the first version, would qualify as their stages (Hawley 2001, Sider 2002). In order to make this identification Sider invokes something close to Lewis’ counterpart relation. Will the table I am currently looking at persist through the next ten minutes? According to the classical four-dimensionalist, otherwise known as the perdurantist, the table will persist through that period provided it has a present and a ten minutes from now table stage that are both stages of the table without either one being identical with the table. In contrast the stage theorist says that in our table talk we refer to stages, not four dimensional objects. So how can we say that the table I am looking at will still be here ten minutes from now? The stage theorist says that we can, because, though the ten minute from now table stage is not now what we mean when we talk about the table, it is what we will be referring to ten minutes from now, since it stands in the appropriate counterpart relation to the present table stage. Whereas Sider defends the stage view as an additional points about the meanings of our ordinary object language, Hawley considers it the correct ontology of what ordinary objects are. Sometimes Hawley’s view is called exdurantism.

Stage theory enjoys the following advantage over classical four dimensionalism. Consider the case of a person fissioning into two later people. A classical four-dimensionalist like Lewis will say that before the fission there are two separate people that cannot be told apart. The stage theorist has no need to say that. Instead the stage theorist can say there is a single present person who will be identical with each of a pair of later individuals in virtue of standing in the relevant counterpart relations to each one.

It should also be noted that four dimensionalism differs from Chisholm’s invocation of loose and popular identity in, at least, the following way. The persistence of an object for any length of time will, on a four dimensionalist view, require the existence of shorter lived objects setting aside the possibility of extended simples. The persistence for any length of time, on Chisholm’s view, of a three dimensional object does not require the existence of shorter lived three dimensional objects. It does not do so because the object persisting for a lengthy period may undergo no change of parts.

Classical four dimensionalism can address the statue and lump puzzle as follows. The statue and the lump are distinct four dimensional objects, and it is easy to understand this as one has (temporal) parts the other lacks. This view has the advantage of vindicating the intuitive idea that at any given moment, there can only be one thing in any place (Hawley 2008, Eddon 2010). This is because at any given moment a single object is both a stage of the statue and a stage of the lump. This advantage disappears for versions of this puzzle where the lump and and the statue come into existence at exactly the same time and are destroyed simultaneously. In such a case, what can explain what distinguishes the four dimensional statue from the four dimensional lump? Four dimensionalists like Lewis and Sider have appealed to counterpart theory of modality to answer this question. They would say that a single four-dimensional object has at least two distinct sets of counterparts, its statue counterparts and its lump of clay counterparts. For example, there are possible worlds where a counterpart of the lump of clay gets squashed but continues to exist. (For more on counterparts, see entry on possible worlds.)

One reason to oppose four dimensionalism, inspired by an argument by Frank Jackson in Jackson 1999, is as follows. Four dimensionalism asks us to accept, on purely metaphysical grounds, that the matter in the universe constantly gets refreshed at each moment. Here is why. Since, according to four dimensionalism, no instantaneous stage is numerically identical to any other instantaneous stage that came before it, the entire universe is constantly losing and acquiring stages. The problem is, whether this is the case is an empirical fact that can only be ascertained through a posteriori means. A metaphysics of identity over time should analyze what it is to be numerically identical through time while remaining neutral about whether any piece of matter at one time is numerically the same as a piece of matter in any other time. Here is another way to make this point. If a school of physicists put forth a flickering universe hypothesis, and another school of physicists rejected it, a metaphysics of identity over time that is consistent with both schools would be preferable over a metaphysics on which the flickering universe hypothesis is trivially true. Four dimensionalism is the latter. (For more discussion of four dimensionalism, see the entry on temporal parts.)

4.6 Temporary Identity

In the case of, for example, the truncated cup we saw that one option is to claim that Cup is earlier distinct from Tcup [cup minus its handle], but later identical with Tcup. According to this option, the identity of Cup with Tcup is only temporary. We also saw that many refuse to countenance temporary identity because it allegedly conflicts with Leibniz’s Law [LL]. After all, Cup, but not Tcup, apparently later has the property of having had a handle.

Despite this putative conflict with LL, some philosophers are prepared to defend temporary identity as the best solution to the puzzles about diachronic identity. George Myro does so by restricting the scope of LL to exclude such properties as having had a handle (Myro 1985). Gallois (1998) does so by arguing that if the identity of Cup and Tcup is temporary, we cannot infer from Tcup having had a handle earlier that earlier Tcup has a handle.

In the Ship of Theseus case, a temporary identity theorist will hold that Replacement and Reassembly are identical at $t_1$, but distinct ships at $t_2$. This does not contradict the transitivity of identity, which, they accept in the following, modified, sense as the Transitivity of Temporary Identity (Gallois 1998, 70):

\[\tag{TTI} \forall x\forall y\forall z[(\text{At } t: x=y \amp \text{ At } t: y=z) \rightarrow \text{ At } t: x=z]. \]

According to the temporary identity theory, temporary identity is identity. Because of this, it should be a transitive relation. Ralf Bader argues that the temporary identity relation fails even this version of transitivity of identity. To see why, imagine two objects $B$ and $D$, at $t$. Later at $t', B$ and $D$ both undergo fission. Simultaneously as the fissions, a product of $B$’s fission and a product of D’s fission fuse. The outcome of these simultaneous fusion and fissions is that, at $t'$ there are three objects: $A, C$, and $E. B$ has split into $A$ and $C, D$ has split into $C$ and $E$. In this case, the following is true:

\[ \text{At } t: A=C \amp \text{ At }t: C=E \]

Given TTI, this would entail

\[ \text{At } t: A=E. \]

However, this is not the case (Bader 2010).

Sider argues that Gallois’ view conflicts with B-theory of time that is widely accepted among philosophers (Sider 2001).

4.7 Modal Plenitude

So far, we have been considering coincidence, or the existence of more than one thing in the same place at the same time, as a cost. Many philosophers hold that if there are in a single place at any given time two distinct objects, such as the statue and the piece of clay, Cup and Tcup, or Replacement and Reassembly, their being distinct or being having different properties would need an explanation. Some philosophers in favor of coincident objects argued that these sorts of facts may be brute facts, that is to say, facts that do not have or need any explanation (Wasserman 2002, Bennett 2004, Kurtsal 2010).

One problem coincidence theories face is the following. If there can be two things at the same place at the same time that differ only modally, are there also three, more, or indefinitely many things that differ only modally and are at the same place at the same time? This would be an ontological inflation that is best avoided (Sosa 1998, Noonan 1993.) Here is one way to see why the answer might be yes. Let us say that there is an object $o$ which has property $F$ essentially, and property $G$ accidentally. Coinciding with $o$ is another object $o'$ that has $F$ and $G$ essentially. When the property $F$ is no longer instantiated where these are, $o$ goes out of existence, leaving $o'$. So far this schema matches the story of the lump of clay and statue as well as the story of Cup and Tcup. But now add this further twist that $o$ and $o'$ also had the property $H$, and accidentally so, but that there is an object $o^*$ that coincides with them and which has $H$ essentially. When $H$ is lost by all three, this alters but does not destroy $o$ and $o'$ but brings to an end $o^*$’s existence. Let us call $o, o'$ and $o^*$ modal variants of each other. Cases that match this schema will tend to feel forced, but here is one example. Imagine an old church building as the place of worship for a small congregation who decides to sell their building. The new owner makes some renovations but uses the building as their art studio. This means that the place of worship does not exist anymore, but the church (with its steeple, altar, stained glass windows) go on to exist. Finally the artists also sells the building and the new owner restores the building but removes the steeple, the windows and all the other religious elements inside, thereby making the church to go out of existence. The question is, is there a problem here? Some criticisms of coincidence theory maintain that it would be objectionably anthropocentric to claim that which kinds of objects there really are in a place depends partly on which sortal concepts thinkers like us happen to have (Hawthorne and Fairchild, 2018).

In order to dispel this chauvinistic outcome, coincidence theorists can embrace coincidence in an inflated way. What exactly would be the problem with this? Penelope Mackie argues that such a view has no disadvantage over four dimensionalist endorsements of objects that permanently share temporal parts and differ only modally (Mackie 2008). Such a no restrictions approach is the view that is known as Modal Plenitude. They can say that where ever there is one object, there are indefinitely many more modal variants of it (Fairchild 2019, 2020). More generally, they can say that in every region of spacetime every possible modal variant that can exist does exist (Kurtsal 2021).

Just like the four dimensionalist Modal Plenitude theorist can say that in every puzzle case the putative problems dissipate when we point out that many objects are involved in the cases (Leslie 2011). For many philosophers this solution is worse than the problem; because, for them, without the resources of the four dimensionalism the existence of indefinitely many things in the same place at the same time is absurd. It should be noted, however, that Modal Plenitude with coincidence is the only view that maintains the classical view of identity without commitment to temporal parts, a splitting of reality into different perspectives.

4.8 Phasalism

In the introduction, we encountered the distinction between phase sortals and substance sortals and noted that the puzzles we have will be about objects as referred to with the help of substance sortals. A little appreciated view offered by Michael Ayers (Ayers 1973), defended by Marjorie Price (Price 1977) and more recently developed by Justin Mooney (Mooney 2023, 2024a, 2024b, 2025) addresses puzzles about identity over time by maintaining that there are no substance sortals, only phase sortals. We do not ordinarily hold that anything new comes into existence when someone becomes a teenager, or that anything goes out of existence when a sapling becomes a tree. Mooney would say we should understand the statue case in a similar way. That is to say, nothing comes into existence when a statue is made from the piece of clay, and similarly, nothing goes out of existence when it is flattened. All that is happening is that something acquires the property of being a statue and later loses this property and continues to exist. All ordinary objects are phases of some other underlying thing. Phasalism as a fully general ontology is criticized by Daniel Korman in Korman (2015: 204–205) where he also names it, but embraced as the correct solution to some of the puzzles in (2015: 155).

Mooney holds that even lump of clay is a phase sortal. Then what is it that acquires and loses the sortal properties now construed as phases? Mooney tentatively holds that the underlying thing is a thin particular, a logical construct postulated by metaphysicians as that which has no properties of its own but is the bearer of the properties of the object it underlies (see the entry on substance). A thin particular cannot go out of existence merely by ceasing to instantiate one of its sortal properties. It can only go out by ceasing to instantiate all of its sortal properties which happens in cases such as decomposing (2023a: 235). This raises the question, if there is such a particular $x$ at time $t$ and such a particular $y$ at $t'$ what are the necessary and sufficient conditions for it to be the case that $x$ is identical with $y$? Mooney holds that no answer to this question provides an explanatory criterion, instead offering epistemic criteria (2025a).

According to phasalism, in all the puzzle cases, what goes on involves no creation or destruction but something undergoing, and surviving, a change that is fundamentally not different from other, familiar kinds of changes involving change of age, status, use, class, and so on. In order to argue for this claim, Mooney adopts a pretheoretically reasonable verdict about each type of case. For example, Mooney would (in agreement with van Inwagen from section 4.4 above) say that Tcup simply does not exist. Reassembly, Mooney holds, is not a candidate to be identified with Theseus’ original ship; it is only a replica (Mooney 2025b, 160–161).

Korman has objected to phasalism by pointing out the following problem. Suppose that a lump of clay is made into a lion statue. Later it is flattened and made into an elephant statue. If, as the phasalist holds, the lion statue is the lump of clay and the elephant statue is the lump of clay, by transitivity it follows that the lion statue is the elephant statue (Korman 2015, 206). Mooney’s response is to acknowledge the initial counterintuitiveness of this result while pointing out its similarity to saying that a certain student is a lifeguard and used to be a fast food worker (Mooney 2025b, 152).

Bibliography

A. Identity and Change

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B. Necessary and Determinate Identities

B.1 Necessary Identities

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B.2 Determinate Identities

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C. Diachronic Identity Puzzles

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Gabbay, D., and Moravcsik, J.M., 1973, “Sameness and Individuation,” Journal of Philosophy, 70: 513–526.
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–––, 2001, How Things Persist, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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–––, 1990, The Ontology of Physical Objects, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
–––, 1992, “Things Change,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 52: 695–704.
–––, 1993, “Varieties of Four Dimensionalism,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 71: 47–59.
–––, 2000, “Temporal Overlap is Not Coincidence”, The Monist, 83(3): 362–380.
Hirsh, E., 1976, “Physical Identity,” Philosophical Review, 85: 357–389.
–––, 1982. The Concept of Identity, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Hudson, H., 1999, “Temporal Parts and Moral Personhood,” Philosophical Studies, 93: 299–316.
Hughes, C., 1986, “Is a Thing Just the Sum of its Parts?” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 86: 213–23.
Johnston, M., 1989, “Fission and the Facts,” in Philosophical Perspectives, 3 (Philosophy of mind and Action Theory), Atascadero: Ridgeview Press, pp. 369–397.
–––, 1992, “Constitution is not Identity,” Mind, 101: 89–105.
Jubien, M., 1993, Ontology, Modality and the Fallacy of Reference, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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Identity Over Time

1. Introduction