Identity Over Time

First published Fri Mar 18, 2005; substantive revision Thu Oct 6, 2016

Irving Copi once defined the problem of identity through time by noting that the following two statements both seem true but, on the assumption that there is change, appear to be inconsistent:

If a changing thing really changes, there can't literally be one and the same thing before and after the change.
However, if there isn't literally one and the same thing before and after the change, then no thing has really undergone any change.

Traditionally, this puzzle has been solved in various ways. Aristotle, for example, distinguished between “accidental” and “essential” changes. Accidental changes are ones that don't result in a change in an objects' identity after the change, such as when a house is painted, or one's hair turns gray, etc. Aristotle thought of these as changes in the accidental properties of a thing. Essential changes, by contrast, are those which don't preserve the identity of the object when it changes, such as when a house burns to the ground and becomes ashes, or when someone dies. Armed with these distinctions, Aristotle would then say that, in the case of accidental changes, (1) is false—a changing thing can really change one of its “accidental properties” and yet literally remain one and the same thing before and after the change.

Of course, this solution to the puzzle depends on there being a coherent distinction between accidental and essential changes, and between accidental and essential properties. Some philosophers find this distinction problematic and have developed other solutions that don't require this distinction. In what follows, we discuss these solutions to the puzzle, along with other puzzles that arise when considering the identity of objects over time.

1. Introduction

As a number of philosophers have remarked, one of the many puzzles about identity, given its apparent simplicity, is why it proves so puzzling. Indeed, one pervasive sentiment is that identity cannot pose any philosophical problems. Anything that looks like a problem about identity must really be a problem about something else. David Lewis gives striking expression to this sentiment when he says:

More important, we should not suppose that we have here any problem about identity. We never have. Identity is utterly simple and unproblematic. Everything is identical to itself; nothing is ever identical to anything except itself. There is never any problem about what makes something identical to itself; nothing can ever fail to be. (Lewis 1986, 192–193)

Despite that, problems about identity appear to play a central role in a large number of philosophical issues whose discussion dates back to the ancient world. One of the most venerable concerns identity and change. Things change, but remain the same. The same poker is at one time hot, another time cold. How can something be both identical and different from one time to another? At first sight this problem evaporates once we draw the time honored distinction between numerical and qualitative identity. To say that a and b are qualitatively identical is to say that a exactly resembles b. To say that a and b are numerically identical is, at least, to say a and b are one thing and not two. Whether a and b can have all their qualities in common without being numerically identical is controversial. Nevertheless, it seems that a and b can be numerically identical without being qualitatively identical by having different qualities at different times.

Some find problematic the very same thing having different properties at different times (see the problem of temporary intrinsics discussed below). Setting that general problem aside, there are special cases of it that generate some of the most intractable issues about identity. One results from persisting things putatively having different parts at different times. Consider an object capable of changing its parts, such as a cup at a time when its handle is still attached. At that time the cup appears to consist of the following two parts: a smaller one, its handle, together with a larger one consisting of the rest of the cup. Call the larger of these parts the truncated cup. The cup, otherwise unscathed, proceeds to lose its handle. At the earlier time, with its handle still intact, the cup is surely distinct from the truncated cup. Later, after the removal of the cup's handle, the cup spatially coincides with the truncated cup. Each object is, at the later time, composed from exactly the same atoms. As one philosopher has put it about a different example, at the later time the cup and the truncated cup are as alike as one pea in a pod (Denis Robinson, in conversation). Should we say that the cup and truncated cup are earlier distinct, but later identical? The problem is that saying so arguably conflicts with a fundamental principle governing identity called Leibniz's Law.

Identity looms large in Leibniz's philosophy. He is responsible for articulating two principles that, he claims, are constitutive of identity. The first, more controversial, of these, called the identity of indiscernibles, says that qualitative indiscernibility implies identity. The second, often referred to as Leibniz's Law or the Indiscernibility of Identicals, says that identity implies qualitative indiscernibility. According to Leibniz's Law, if a is identical with b, every quality of a will be a quality of b. (See the entry on identity of indiscernibles.)

Here are two ways in which, it seems, saying that the cup is earlier distinct from, but later identical with, the truncated cup conflicts with Leibniz's Law. Ostensibly one of the cup's later properties is having earlier had a handle. That is the property the truncated cup never has. So, identifying the later cup and truncated cup appears to violate Leibniz's Law. There is, at least, one property, having formerly had a handle, that the cup and truncated cup never have in common.

Here is a second way in which the claim that the cup and truncated cup are sometimes, but not always, identical appears to violate Leibniz's Law. Let us bestow a name on the cup. Call it ‘Cup’. Let us also call the truncated cup ‘Tcup’. We are envisaging that Cup is sometimes, but not always, identical with Tcup. Leibniz's Law tells us that Cup and Tcup share all their properties at any time they are identical. Some properties are commonly referred to as modal properties. A modal property is the property of possibly or necessarily having some further property. Modal properties include such properties as being possibly red, necessarily extended, possibly taller than a giraffe, or necessarily cup shaped. Arguably one of Cup's modal properties is the property of being necessarily identical with Cup. Suppose Cup and Tcup are at some time identical. In that case, by Leibniz's Law, Tcup will, at some time, share with Cup the modal property of being necessarily identical with Cup. So, if Cup is ever identical with Tcup, then Tcup has the modal property of being necessarily identical with Cup. But if Tcup is necessarily identical with Cup, there can be no time when Tcup is distinct from Cup.

Let us say that the identity of a with b is temporary if a is sometimes, but not always, identical with b. Later we shall look at other types of puzzle cases that provide some motivation for countenancing temporary identity. Despite the existence of such cases the majority of philosophers are reluctant, principally because of the putative conflict with Leibniz's Law, to allow temporary identity. Instead, to deal with puzzles about identity through time a wide range of alternatives have been proposed. These include: maintaining that Cup is later constituted by Tcup (where constitution does not imply identity); denying that Tcup is earlier a proper part of Cup; maintaining that Cup and Tcup are never identical, but only share a later temporal part in common; holding that the identity between the earlier Tcup and later Cup is not literal, but only loose and popular.

By synchronic identity we mean an identity holding at a single time. By diachronic identity we mean an identity holding between something existing at one time and something existing at another. One question is whether synchronic and diachronic identity are different kinds of identity. Some philosophers are willing to countenance different kinds of identity. Others are reluctant to do so. One philosopher who is willing to postulate a multiplicity of different kinds of identity is Peter Geach. Geach, among others, has addressed puzzles about both synchronic and diachronic identity by denying that there is a single absolute relation of identity rather than a host of relative identity relations. On this view we cannot simply say that a is identical with b. Instead there must be a concept of a kind of thing, a so called sortal concept, that serves to answer the question: a is the same what as b? This is so, according to the champions of relative identity, because the following can happen: a and b both fall under the sortal concepts F and G, a is the same F as b, but a is not the same G as b (Geach 1967, and see the entry on relative identity).

Consider the case of Cup and Tcup. Is Cup at the later time t′ identical with Tcup? Is Tcup at t′ identical with Tcup at t? A relative identity theorist would deny that these questions have answers. For such a theorist to have an answerable question we would need to replace, for example, the first with: At t′ is Cup the same cup as Tcup?

How could insisting on the relativity of the answer to an identity question to a kind help with the diachronic identity puzzle posed by Cup and Tcup? Here is one way that it could. Suppose that nothing is a cup when it is a proper part of a cup. Then Tcup fails to qualify as a cup at t when it is a proper part of Cup. In that case a relative identity theorist can say the following. At the later time t′ Cup is the same cup as Tcup. Since Tcup is not a cup at the earlier time t, neither Cup not Tcup at t′ is the same cup as Tcup at t. Moreover, for any kind K, Cup is not the same K as Tcup at t. Identifying Cup with Tcup as the same cup at t′ places us under no constraint to identify Cup with one of its proper parts, Tcup, at t.

Some of those who reject relative identity nevertheless accept that a cannot be identical with b, unless there is a more specific answer to the question whether a is the same thing as b. Many philosophers distinguish between two kinds of concepts which are applicable to whatever can persist through time. One kind is illustrated by the concepts of gold (as opposed to a quantity or piece of gold), snow, or rain. In the case of any such concept F, there is no answer to the question: how many Fs are there? In contrast, in the case of other concepts such as the concept of a horse, a tall person, an artwork, or a statue there is an answer to the question: how many Fs are there? For example, though we may not know it, there is an answer to the question: how many statues are there? Concepts of this last kind are often referred to as sortal concepts. Those who take the view that the question whether a is the same as b is illegitimate, unless it is construed as elliptical for the question whether a is the same thing of such and such a kind as b typically also hold the following views. We should distinguish between two types of sortal concepts: phase and substance sortals. A phase sortal such as child, utensil or prize is a concept that something can cease to fall under without ceasing to exist. If, in contrast, something falls under a substance sortal, it must always do so. If a at some time t is the same as b at the same, or a different time t′, it must, say advocates of the view in question, be that, for some sortal S, a at t is the same S as b at t′. For example, if John's favorite artwork at t is identical with Sally's most valuable possession at t′, there must be a substance sortal, the concept of a statue as it may be, under which John's favorite artwork at t, and Sally's most valuable possession at t′ both fall. Moreover, a substance sortal is said to go together with a criterion of identity where a criterion of identity associated with substance sortal S is, inter alia, a criterion for some earlier S being the same S as some later S.

Finally, there are a group of issues that fall under the heading of the dispensability of identity. According to one tradition that goes back, at least, to Wittgenstein's Tractatus, we can theoretically dispense with identity talk without loss of information. Some, but by no means all, who take this view, do so because they hold that the predicate ‘is identical with’ corresponds to no genuine property. Issues about the dispensability of identity engage with issues about identity across time in the following way. This section opened with a quote from David Lewis claiming that there is never any philosophical problem about identity. The case of Cup and Tcup raises what is ostensibly a problem about identity across time. That problem only arises, it seems, because the later Cup is putatively identical with the earlier Tcup. If the problem is not, in part, about that putative identity holding, what is it about?

According to a four dimensionalist like David Lewis a table is extended through the time of its life, and constituted from temporal parts which are themselves short lived tables. As such a four dimensionalist like Lewis would not hesitate to give the following answer to the above question. The problem is, in part, a problem about whether a cup-like object that exists only at t′ is suitably related to a cup-like object, itself a proper part of a larger cup-like object, that exists only at t so that both cup-like objects are temporal stages or parts of a four-dimensionally extended cup.

If we are not prepared to endorse four dimensionalism, it remains to be seen how the putative problem about Cup and Tcup's identity through time can be reformulated so that it is no longer a problem about identity through time.

2. Identity and Change

2.1 Diachronic and Synchronic Identity

It is customary to distinguish identity at a time from identity across time. An example of an identity holding at a single time is: the table in the next room is (now) identical with my favorite table. An example of an identity holding across different times is: The table in the next room is identical with the one you purchased last year. Diachronic identities pose some of the most intractable problems about identity. Before looking at those problems, and some of the most frequently proposed solutions to them, let us ask whether there is anything that distinguishes identity from other relations.

The most commonly agreed on distinguishing feature of identity is that it conforms to the Indiscernibility of Identicals, what was earlier called Leibniz's Law. Taking ‘∀F’ to be a quantifier ranging over properties, here is one way to formulate Leibniz's Law:

LL: ∀x∀y[x=y → ∀F(Fx → Fy)]

LL, understood to range over identity properties, if any, such as being identical with a, says that if x is identical with y, then any property of x is a property of y.

2.2 Identity as an Equivalence Relation

A relation R is reflexive if each thing stands in R to itself. It is symmetrical if a's standing in R to b implies that b stands in R to a. It is transitive if a's standing in R to b and b's likewise standing in R to c together imply that a stands in R to c. Identity is trivially reflexive. Each thing trivially stands in the relation of identity to itself. That identity is also symmetrical and transitive follows from Leibniz's Law. Suppose identity fails to be symmetrical, and for some a and b, a is identical with b, but b is not identical with a. In that case, a has a property, being identical with b, which b fails to have. Suppose identity is not transitive, and, for some a, b and c, a is identical with b and b is identical with c, but a is not identical with c. In that case b has a property, being identical with c, that a lacks.

2.3 Leibniz's Law and the Possibility of Change: The Problem of Temporary Intrinsics

Identity through time generates a number of problems posed by puzzle cases such as the case of Cup and Tcup. Later we will review a number of solutions to those problems offered in the literature. One problem about identity through time is not raised by consideration of puzzle cases. It arises simply because persisting things can change their intrinsic properties. For that reason it has been labeled by David Lewis the problem of temporary intrinsics (Lewis 1986, 202–205).

A decent test for distinguishing between extrinsic and intrinsic properties is this. A property F is an extrinsic property of an object o if o having F implies that something distinct from, and not a proper part of, o exists. For example, being married to Sally is an extrinsic property of John's since John can only have that property if something, Sally, distinct from, and not a proper part, of him exists. A property F is an intrinsic property of o if and only if o having F is compatible with nothing apart from o and its proper parts existing, and also compatible with something apart from o existing. For example, the property of being round is an intrinsic property because a surface S having that property is compatible with nothing other than S and its proper parts existing. Here is one reason why this is only a rough way of drawing the distinction between intrinsic and extrinsic properties. It looks as though the property of existing in complete isolation, which Lewis calls loneliness, is extrinsic. Nevertheless being, in this sense, lonely is not only compatible with, but requires that nothing else exists. (For more discussion, see the entry on intrinsic vs. extrinsic properties.)

Suppose some object, a metal plate we will call Plate, changes from being round at t₁ to being square at t₂. How can that be? After all, though something can have a round part and a square part, nothing can be round and square. No problem, you might say. Nothing can be round and square at a single time, place and world. But something can be round at one time and square at another.

According to Lewis the original problem of temporary intrinsics remains, unless we can show how something can have incompatible properties at different times. To show how that can be so we need to give at least a partial answer to the following question. What is it for something to have a property at a time?

2.4 Candidate Solutions

Lewis considers three answers to this question. According to the first for some object O to be F at t is for the relation of being F to tenselessly, or timelessly, hold between O and time t. For example, for Plate to be round at t₁ is for the two-place relation of being round at to hold between Plate and t₁. Something can stand in the relation of being round at to the earlier time t₁ without standing in that relation to the later time t₂. So there is no reason to think that standing in the relation of being round at to t₁ is incompatible with standing in the relation of being square at to t₂. By transmuting the ostensibly one place relational properties of being round and being square into the two place relational properties of being round at and being square at we can show how something can be round at one time and square at another.

Lewis' principle objection to this first solution is that it transforms intrinsic into extrinsic properties. He takes it as evident that properties such as being round and being red are intrinsic. Why so? Call the view that putatively one place intrinsic properties are two place relational properties the relational view. Why does Lewis so adamantly reject that view? One difficulty with answering this question is a difficulty about locating the source of Lewis' disquiet with the relational view.

Is it that Lewis rejects the relational view because it treats putatively intrinsic properties as extrinsic, or because it discerns an extra place in a putatively monadic property? That it is the latter is suggested by the following. The problem of temporary intrinsics appears to arise because nothing can have the intrinsic properties of being round and being square, unless it has those properties at different times. The same goes for pairs of extrinsic properties. The property of being the same height as the Eiffel Tower is extrinsic as is the property of being different in height from the Eiffel Tower. Something can change from being the same height as the Eiffel Tower to being different in height from that structure even though nothing can simultaneously have the properties of being the same height as, and being different in height from, the Eiffel Tower. Suppose we say that something can be the same height as the Eiffel Tower at some time t₁ without being the same height as the Eiffel tower at some distinct time t₂. In that case we appear to be confronted with the same problem as the one that originally raised the problem of temporary intrinsics. We are confronted with the task of explaining what it is for something to have, in this case, the property of being the same height as the Eiffel Tower at time t₁. If we respond, it is for the three place relation of being the same height as at to hold between some object, the Eiffel Tower, and time t₁ we are, treating an ostensibly two place relation as a three place one even though we are not treating an intrinsic property as extrinsic.

Lewis considers an alternative explanation of what it is for an object to have a property at a time. What might be called the ‘according to’ explanation. We are used to something having a property according to one story, but failing to have that property according to another. If we think of a time as a set of propositions describing what holds at that time, we can say that according to one such set plate is round, but according to another it is square.

Lewis gives the according to explanation short shrift. We may think it cannot be so readily dismissed if it is combined with a view about existence and time that has received considerable discussion in recent years. The view is called Presentism. On the Presentist view the only things that exist without qualification are things that presently exist. Suppose t₁, a time when Plate is round, is the present. In that case if Plate is ever square it will be, or was square. What is it for Plate to be round? Given that plate is presently round what makes it the case that Plate is round is not just that Plate is round according to some set of propositions about the present. Instead what makes it the case that Plate is presently round is that plate exists and is round. So, what makes it the case that Plate, say, will be square? Not, the Presentist will say, this: Plate tenselessly or timelessly exists, and will be square. So what makes it the case that Plate will be square? Perhaps this. What makes it true that Plate will be square is that Plate is square according to some relevant future tensed presently existing propositions.

Here is one reason why we might think that Presentism does not, in the end, help with the problem of temporary intrinsics. Suppose that, at t₁, we send a circular object forward in time to t₂. At t₂ the shape of the circular object changes so that it becomes elliptical. Retaining its elliptical shape the object is sent back to t₁. Even if Presentism is true at t₁ we have an object with incompatible intrinsic properties.

Of course, to embrace this combination of an according to explanation with Presentism is to embrace just one of a number of options available to the Presentist for giving the truthmakers of future and past tense propositions.

Whether or not a Presentist wishes to take over in this way the ‘according to’ explanation, Presentism provides a solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics. Presentists can deny that it follows from something at one time being round that will at another time be square that there exists something both round and square.

2.5 Alternative Solutions

Lewis, we saw, denies that a sentence such as ‘Plate is square at t₁’ states something true just in case Plate stands in the square at relation to t₁. In his original exposition of the problem of temporary intrinsics, Lewis does not consider a variety of other ways of understanding sentences attributing ostensibly intrinsic properties to objects at times. Here is one. Many take it that a relation of instantiation holds between a property and its instances. Suppose instantiation is not a two place, but, at least, a three place relation holding between an object, property and time. If so, Plate is round at t₁ if and only if Plate stands in the instantiation relation to the (non-relational) property of roundness and t₁. Moreover Plate standing in the instantiation relation to roundness and t₁ is clearly consistent with Plate failing to stand in the instantiation relation to roundness and the different time t₂.

The key difference between this view and the relational view that Lewis considers is the following. On the relational view we take an ostensibly non-relational property such as being circular to be relational and extrinsic [extrinsic because having it requires an object to stand in a relation to a time]. On the instantiation view we are taking something, the instantiation relation, that is already an extrinsic relation to have an extra place. So, our intuitions about what counts as an intrinsic non-relational property are not violated.

Alternative ways of taking ‘a is red at t’ include treating ‘at t’ as an adverbial modifier, or as a sentential operator. According to the first ‘at t’, better written as ‘at t-ly’, is an adverbial modifier specifying the way in which something has a property. So ‘Plate is round at t₁’ is true just in case Plate has roundness at-t₁-ly. Plate, on this view, can be round at t₁, but square at t₂ because Plate can have roundness at t₁-ly without having roundness at-t₂-ly (See Johnston 1987, Haslanger 1989).

According to the temporal operator view ‘at t₁’ and ‘at t₂’ should be understood as the temporal operators: ‘at t₁ it is true that …’ and ‘at t₂ it is true that …’. Just as ‘it is possible that Plate is round’ is consistent with ‘it is possible that Plate is square’ so ‘at t₁ it is true that Plate is round’ is consistent with ‘at t₂ it is true that Plate is square’.

Solutions to the problem of temporary intrinsics abound. Here is another that treats being true and being false as three place relations between propositions, facts and times. Consider the propositions:

(i) Plate is round,

And:

(ii) Plate is square.

We should distinguish between a property of a proposition, and a property that is a constituent of a proposition. Being a proposition is a property of (i), but is not a constituent of (i). In contrast, being round is a constituent of (i), but is not a property of (i). Propositions have no shape. Can we hold that (i) and (ii) are both true compatibly with taking roundness and squareness to be intrinsic properties?

It is plausible to suppose that that the truth value of a proposition such as (i) or (ii) depends on the existence of something distinct from that proposition. Since that is so, let us, as some adherents of a correspondence theory of truth would do, allow that if (i), say, is true, it has a relational property of being true. For example being true may be a relation that holds between (i) and the fact that Plate is round.

How many places are there in what we may call the truth relation? It is often though to be a two place relation. Suppose that is wrong, and truth is a three place relation holding between a proposition, fact and time. In that case, the three place relation of truth can hold between (i), the fact that Plate is round, and t₁, without holding between (i), the same fact and t₂.

Of course whether this is a solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics depends on what that problem is. It is a solution if the problem is to explain time indexing without turning intrinsic into extrinsic properties. After all, no correspondance theorist would allow truth is an intrinsic property. It is not a solution if the problem is to explain time indexing without adding extra places to, it may be, relational properties.

Alternatively, we can follow Haslanger in Haslanger 1989 and Lowe in Lowe 1987 and treat the relevant propositions as tensed. A change in an intrinsic property corresponds, on this view, to a change in the tense of a proposition atrributing that property.

Lewis (2002) objects to this last solution on the grounds that a tensed proposition should itself be identified with a relational property. But, such identification leaves it unexplained how something can change its non-relational intrinsic properties. Ben Caplan in Caplan 2005 has replied to Lewis that Lewis's objection depends on a view about propositions that is not compulsory.

Lewis favors a different solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics (Lewis 1986). Whether or not there is a problem with the same object being round and square, there is no problem with the same object having a round part and a square part. To solve the problem of temporary intrinsics, Lewis invokes the view that, in addition to their spatial parts, objects have temporal parts or stages. This allows him to hold that Plate is round at t₁ and square at t₂ because Plate has a round part at t₁ and a square part at t₂. Plate's round t₁ part exists only at t₁, and Plate's square t₂ part exists only at t₂. Hence there is no problem posed by either temporal part changing its shape. Plate itself is an object consisting of a suitably interrelated sequence of such temporal parts. For the t₁ temporal part of Plate to be round is just for it to be round. For the longer lived Plate to be round at t₁ is for Plate to be appropriately related to a round temporal part at t₁.

As we have seen in invoking temporal parts or stages Lewis endorses one species of what has come to be called Four Dimensionalism. The expression ‘Four Dimensionalism’ has been applied to a number of different positions that it is well to distinguish here since not all of them are relevant to identity across time. ‘Four Dimensionalism’ has sometimes been used for the thesis, particularly associated with Relativity Theory, that time is space like. On another use of ‘Four Dimensionalism’ a persisting thing is identical with its history. On this view an object is a sequence of events. Sometimes ‘Four Dimensionalism’ is used to label the view that, contra Presentism, things past present and future are equally real.

Lewis' version of Four Dimensionalism should be distinguished from all of the above. It is the view that, just as an object such as Plate is extended in space with spatial parts, so it is extended in time with temporal parts.

The problem of temporary intrinsics focuses on the possibility of persisting things changing their properties, or, at least, changing their intrinsic properties. Many of the problems about identity through time are posed by puzzle cases that involve change of parts. Four dimensionalism is one, widely accepted, solution to those puzzles. It is not overstretching it to suggest that each of the puzzle cases we will shortly consider appears to be a case of temporary identity. That is, each one appears to be a case of the following. For some x and y, at some time t x is identical with y, and at some time t′ x is distinct from y.

In the first section we briefly looked at one argument, the so-called modal argument for the necessity of identities, for denying that there could be temporary identities. Some philosophers have responded to some of the diachronic identity puzzles by maintaining that there could be indeterminate identities. An argument with a similar structure to the modal argument has been deployed to rule out indeterminate identities. Give their implications for identity across time the modal argument and the argument against indeterminate identities are set out in more detail in the next section.

3. Necessary and Determinate Identities

Here are two examples of identity statements:

(i) The table in the next room is (now) identical with my favorite table.
(ii) The table in the next room is identical with the one you purchased last year.

(i) and (ii) are contingent. Even if the table in the next room is my favorite table, it might not have been. Even if the table in the next room is the one you purchased last year, it might not have been. One of the most important discussions of identity is to be found in Saul Kripke's paper ‘Identity and Necessity’ and his book Naming and Necessity (in Munitz 1971, Kripke 1980). One lesson to be learned from Kripke's discussion is that it is illegitimate to infer from identity statements such as (i) and (ii) having their truth value contingently that the relation of identity can hold contingently.

Why is this inference illegitimate? Compare (i) with:

(iii) The table in the next room is the same size as my favorite table.

Being the same size as is an equivalence relation that holds contingently. What does it take for that relation to hold contingently between the table in the next room and my favorite table? Thinking in terms of possible worlds the table in the next room is contingently the same size as my favorite table just in case the following is so. The table in the next room is the same size as my favorite table, but, in some possible world W, something identical to (or a counterpart of) the actual table in the next room is not the same size as what is actually my favorite table.

Without having recourse to possible worlds, what this comes to is that the table in the next room is contingently the same size as my favorite table only if, in addition to (iii), the following is true:

(iv) (∃x)(∃y)[(x = the table in the next room) & (y = my favorite table) & (possibly, x is not the same size as y)].

Likewise the table in the next room is contingently identical with my favorite table only if, in some world W, what is actually my favorite table is not identical with what is actually the table in the next room. That condition need not be satisfied for (i) to be contingently true. All it takes for (i) to be contingently true is that, for example, (i) is true, but in some world W something qualifies as my favorite table without also qualifying as the table in the next room. For that to be so nothing need be identical, or counterpart related, across worlds.

Kripke and Ruth Barcan Marcus offer an argument to show that there are no contingent identities. Here is one version of that argument often referred to as the Modal Argument for the Necessity of Identities:

Suppose:

(1) a=b.

But each thing is necessarily identical with itself. Hence;

(2) □ (a=a)

Taking ‘[λx Φ]’ to mean: being an x such that Φ (where Φ is some logical formula in which ‘x’ is a free variable), we supposedly have:

(3) [λx □(x=a)]a

Since, by Leibniz's Law, if (1) then a and b share all properties in common. Hence (1) and (3) yield:

(4) [λx □(x=a)]b

which in turn yields:

(5) □(a=b).

Though widely accepted this type of argument can be contested. Leibniz's Law, again understood as ranging over identity properties, is used to derive step (4)—b has the property of being necessarily identical with a—from step (3), a has the property of being necessarily identical with a. We might deny that there are any such modal properties. Doing so blocks the argument if the application of LL is restricted to properties. Alternatively we might allow that there are such properties as being necessarily identical with a, but deny that (3) follows from (2). On one view all that follows from (2) is that a has the property of being necessarily identical with itself expressed by the predicate ‘[λx x=x]’. We need to distinguish the property of being necessarily identical with itself, which every existent has, from the property of being necessarily identical with a—which only a has (Lowe 1982). Finally, we might reject (2) on the following grounds. There is a well entrenched convention that repeated tokens of the same type of name, constant or variable are assigned the same value. From the existence of this convention it follows that ‘a = a’ expresses a truth. It does not follow that ‘a = a’ expresses something necessarily true.

Here is one way of making clear why it does not follow. According to what we may call the identity convention two tokens of the same name standardly refer to the same thing. So in, for example, the sentence ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ we are, unless otherwise indicated, to take the second occurrence of ‘Napoleon’ to have a referent identical with the referent of the first. In the case of ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ the relation Napoleon is said to stand in to himself is different from the relation governing the repeated use of a proper name. In the one case it is the relation of admiration. In the other it is identity. But, suppose they were the same relation. Suppose, the repeated use of a proper name were governed, not by the identity convention, but by what we may call the admiration convention. According to the admiration convention a subsequent occurrence of a proper name in a sentence should be taken to refer to something only if it is admired by the referent of the first occurrence. In the light of this, admittedly bizarre, convention what should we say about the truth value of ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’. Well if the second occurrence of ‘Napoleon’ refers, it will refer to someone admired by the referent of the first occurrence. So, if the admiration convention is adhered to, ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ will, if it expresses any proposition, will express a true one. Despite that, ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ expresses a contingent truth. Likewise, ‘a=a’ expresses a true proposition if it expresses any proposition at all, since the relation governing the repeated use of ‘a’ is the same as the one that a is said to stand in to a. But, as with ‘Napoleon admires Napoleon’ given the admiration convention, there is no reason to suppose that the truth expressed by ‘a=a’ is a necessary one. A like observation applies to ‘a is identical with itself’.

Philosophers have appealed to contingent identities to solve identity puzzles. They have also appealed to vague or indeterminate identities to solve such puzzles. Consider a club that over an extended time changes its rules, membership and location. Is the original club identical with the club having a new location, rules and membership? Call the original club the Identity Club, and the club with new rules, membership and location the Constitution Club. Is the following true?:

C: The Identity Club = The Constitution Club.

Some would say that that the identity stated by C is vague or indeterminate. What does it mean to say that an identity is vague or indeterminate? At least this. C is not determinately true, or determinately false. If C does lack a determinate truth value, is that enough to ensure that the identity of the clubs referred to by C is indeterminate?

In the case of the identity sentence:

(i) The table in the next room is (now) identical with my favorite table.

we saw the need to distinguish between (i) having its truth value contingently, and (i) stating an identity that holds only contingently. We likewise need to distinguish C having an indeterminate truth value from C stating an identity that holds only indeterminately. C may lack a determinate truth value because one, or both, of the referring expressions ‘The Identity Club’ and ‘The Constitution Club’ lacks a determinate referent. Nevertheless for any determinate choice of referents for those expressions C has a determinate truth value.

Can it happen that the referring expressions ‘a’ and ‘b’ refer precisely in the identity sentence ‘a=b’ without that sentence being determinately true or false? Here is one version of an argument, due to Gareth Evans and Nathan Salmon, that is supposed to show that it cannot (Evans 1978, Salmon 1981). Let ‘Ip’ mean: it is indeterminate whether p, that is p is neither determinately true nor determinately false, and let ‘Dp’ mean: it is determinate that p. We have:

(1′) I(a=b).

But:

(2′) D (a=a).

(2’) yields:

(3′) [λx D(x=a)]a

Suppose:

(4′) a=b

Applying Leibniz's Law to (3′) and (4′) gives:

(5′) [λx D(a=x)]b

from which it follows that:

(6′) D(a=b),

which contradicts (1′). Hence (1′) implies:

(7′) ¬(a=b)

If (7′) is true then it is not true that a is identical with b. So if (7′) is true, a is determinately distinct from b. (1′) cannot be true.

Of course, defenders of indeterminate identity do not let this pass unquestioned. One assumption of the argument is that (7′) implies that a is determinately distinct from b rather than just that a is not determinately identical with b.

Arguments against contingent and indeterminate identities appeal to Leibniz's Law. Seen as a principle about the transmission of properties across identity Leibniz's Law has rarely been challenged. Still, it has been challenged. One interesting challenge is brought by Benjamin Schnieder in Schnieder 2006. Similarly, Evans' argument has been challenged from a number of directions. A recent challenger is Elizabeth Barnes who in Barnes 2009 invokes counterpart theory to defuse it.

4. Diachronic Identity Puzzles

In the introduction we encountered one type of puzzle about identity across time: the case of Cup and Tcup. The puzzle arose because we envisaged Cup losing one of its parts, and coming to have the same material constitution (being, for example, composed of exactly the same atoms as), and spatial boundaries as Tcup. Call this the cup case. Let us say that a and b are coincident at a time t just in case the following holds. Something is a proper part of a at t if and only if it is a proper part of b at that same time. Cup and Tcup are coincident at the later time since something at that later time is, for example, and atomic part of a if and only if it is an atomic part of b.

There are cases that pose similar diachronic identity puzzles that do not involve change of parts. One of the best known involves a lump of clay which, at an earlier time, is coincident with a statue, but, at a later, say as a result of deformation, is just a shapeless lump of clay. Other much discussed cases of putatively distinct things at one time being coincident at another involve fission or fusion. One of the most famous examples of a fission case is provided by the ship of Theseus. Over a long period all of the planks composing a certain ship are replaced one by one. Eventually a ship indiscernible from the original, but composed of entirely different planks, results. Call that later ship Replacement. As each plank is removed from the original ship it is used to construct a ship that is constituted from all and only the planks belonging to the original ship. Call the ship composed of the same planks as the ones initially composing the original ship Reassembly.

Identity is, very plausibly, an equivalence relation (see Section 2.2). One consequence of it being an equivalence relation is that it is subject to transitivity: the principle that if aRb and bRc, then aRc. Saying that, in the case of Theseus' ship, Replacement and Reassembly are both identical with the original ship putatively conflicts with the transitivity of identity since Replacement seems to be later clearly distinct from Reassembly.

What is the best account of these cases? Here are some of the major ones on offer:

4.1 Constitution

Constitution accounts pivot on the distinction between constitution and identity. Defenders of such accounts hold that constitution, unlike identity, is not an equivalence relation (Baker 2002). Constitution is said to be, at least, non-symmetrical. According to a constitution account, we say the following about the three types of puzzle cases described above. Cup is never identical with Tcup. Later Cup is constituted by Tcup [alternatively: Cup and Tcup never constitute each other, but later are constituted from the very same atoms]. Likewise the lump of clay is never identical with the statue, but earlier only constitutes the statue. Finally, the reassembly ship is never identical, but only constituted from exactly the same planks as, the original.

Kit Fine has deployed a number of novel Leibniz's Law arguments in favour of a constitution accounts. Such arguments are replied to by Brian Frances in Frances 2006.

The constitution view has come in for its share of criticisms. Some think it engages in metaphysical multiple vision, seeing a multiplicity of things at a given place and time where there is plausibly only one. Others argue that constitution is identity (see Noonan 1993).

A number of objections have been raised against constitution views. One is an objection from causal overdetermination. Another is an objection from grounding. Consider a statue allegedly constituted from a statue shaped piece of clay. Someone throws the statue against a pane of glass, which breaks. What caused the glass to break? Surely, the statue impacting it. But the glass was also impacted by the statue shaped piece of clay with sufficient force to break it. So, if constitution is not identity, the glass breaking has two causes. Some would say that is one cause too many.

The objection from grounding is not so much an objection to the constitution view, but an objection designed to undermine a principle reason for adopting it. A principle reason for adopting the constitution view is that it seems to allow, for example, the statue and the piece of clay to have different properties. In particular, it seems to allow them to have different modal properties such as being squashable. Since constitution, unlike identity, does not conform to the indiscernibility of identicals, the clay can be squashable even if the statue is not.

The problem is that the clay and the statue are made up of exactly the same atoms organized in the same way. Since that is so it is hard to see how the clay can be squashable without the statue being so as well.

A further problem for constitution views is the so called too many minds objection (see Olsen 1997 and Shoemaker 1999). Advocates of constitutionalism typically hold that a person is constituted by a living organism. If so, the person and the living organism constituting that person share the same thoughts. Whenever you encounter a person you encounter a distinct living organism having occupying the same region and having the same thoughts. Not a good result.

4.2 Relative Identity

Advocates of relative identity deny that there is a single identity relation (see Geach 1967, Griffin 1977). On their view it is improper to ask whether, say, the statue is the same thing as the later lump of clay. Instead we should ask whether it is the same statue, or the same lump of clay. For an advocate of relative identity denying that the earlier statue is the same statue as the later lump of clay is consistent with allowing that the earlier statue is the same lump of clay as the later lump of clay. It is natural for the relative identity theorist to insist on relativising the transitivity of identity to the same sortal concept in the following way. What the relativised transitivity principle says is that: a is the same F as b, and b is the same F as c implies only that a is the same F as c (see Griffin 1977).

One objection to relative identity is that it conflicts with Leibniz's Law. Here is one way in which such conflict may be thought to arise. Consider the property version of Leibniz's Law:

LL: ∀x∀y[x=y → ∀F(Fx → Fy)]

The relation of identity mentioned in the antecedent of LL is unrelativised to a sortal. To make it acceptable to the relative identity theorist, let us amend LL to:

LLR: ∀x∀y[∀F(x is the same F as y) → ∀G(Gx → Gy)]

Suppose we replace ‘is the same F as y’ in LLR with ‘is the same lump of clay’, ‘x’ with ‘the earlier statue’, ‘y’ with ‘the later clay lump’, and instantiate the quantifier ∀G with ‘is the same statue as the earlier statue’. We then obtain:

R: the earlier statue is the same lump of clay as the later clay lump → (the earlier statue is the same statue as the earlier statue → the earlier statue is the same statue as the later clay lump ).

The trouble is that R is false. The earlier statue is the same lump of clay as the clay lump, and the earlier statue is the same statue is the same statue as the earlier statue, but the earlier statue is not, contrary to LLR, the same statue as the later clay lump.

4.3 Identity: ‘Strict’ and ‘Loose’

Following Bishop Butler [see Section 5], Roderick Chisholm distinguishes between a strict and a loose sense of identity (see Chisholm 1969a). To see what this distinction comes to, and how it might help with the puzzle cases, consider the case of Cup and Tcup. For Chisholm things have their parts essentially in the following sense. It is impossible for a to be identical with b in the strict and philosophical sense, unless a and b have all their parts in common. Earlier Cup has a part, a handle, that later Cup, not to say earlier and later Tcup, lacks. Hence, on Chisholm's view, earlier Cup is not strictly identical with later Cup.

Earlier Cup is nontheless identical with later Cup in a loose and popular sense. What then, according to Chisholm, is it for earlier Cup and later Cup to be identical in a loose and popular sense? To simplify let us suppose, unrealistically, that the only change of parts that Cup in, Chisholm would say, a loose and popular sense undergoes is loss of a handle. Call Hcup the object that consists of Cup's handle together with Tcup. Chisholm would say this. Cup is earlier wholly constituted by Hcup, that is Tcup plus handle, and later wholly constituted by Tcup alone. Moreover Tcup is related to Hcup in such a way that, as Chisholm puts it, Tcup at t₂ is the ens successivum of Hcup at an earlier time t₁. For Chisholm what makes Tcup at t₂ an ens successivum of Hcup at t₁ seems to be this. Tcup is a proper part of Hcup at t₁. There is a sequence S of cups such that each member of S that is not identical with Hcup is, at some time, a proper part of some member of S. For each time between and including t₁ and t₂ Cup is wholly constituted by some member of S.

Cup is wholly constituted by Tcup at t₂. Since the later Cup is wholly constituted by something, Tcup, that is an ens successivum of something, Hcup, that wholly constitutes Cup we may say that earlier cup is loosely identical with later Cup.

4.4 Arbitrary Undetached Parts

One solution to the problem posed by the cup case is to reject what Peter van Inwagen calls the Doctrine of Arbitrary Undetached Parts (see van Inwagen 1981). In setting the problem up we assumed that earlier Cup consists of the following parts: a handle together with Tcup. That assumption is justified if the following is. Tcup existed as a part of Cup when Cup still had its handle. Van Inwagen would reject that assumption. According to him it is illegitimate to assume that any old way of notionally dividing up an object yields an existing undetached part.

Instead of denying that Tcup exists at t₁ when it is ostensibly a proper part of Cup, we might instead deny that Tcup at t₁ is identical with what looks very much like Tcup at t₂. In this way we can preserve transitivity without having to identify the earlier cup with one of its proper parts.

One way to allow that Tcup earlier exists without conceding its later identity with Cup is, following Michael Burke, to maintain that Tcup goes out of existence when Cup loses its handle (see Burke 1994).

4.5 Four Dimensionalism

Here is what a classical four dimensionalist would say about the case of the cup. Suppose the interval from t₁ to t₂ is the time during which Cup has a handle attached to it, and t₂ to t₃ the interval during which Cup is without a handle, and, so, putatively identical with Tcup. As before Hcup is the fusion of Tcup and Cup's handle. According to the four dimensionalist, Cup, Tcup and Hcup are all extended in time as well as space. Tcup has a temporal part that extends from t₁ to t₂ together with a temporal part that extends from t₂ to t₃. Tcup's t₁ to t₂ and t₂ to t₃ temporal parts are distinct from each other as well as being distinct from the temporally longer Tcup. Hcup, that is Tcup plus handle, is a four dimensional object that extends from t₁ to t₂. Cup itself consists of the following two, among indefinitely many other, temporal parts: Hcup and the t₂ to t₃ part of Tcup.

What we should say according to the classical four dimensionalist is this. The t₁ to t₂ temporal part of Tcup is a proper temporal and spatial part of Hcup. Hcup and the t₂ to t₃ temporal parts of Tcup are proper temporal parts of Cup. Cup is not identical with any of Hcup, Tcup from t₁ to t₂, Tcup from t₂ to t₃, or Tcup from t₁ to t₃. In particular there is no question of Cup being literally identical with Tcup from t₂ to t₃, when they are indiscernible, though, following David Lewis, we may say that Cup and Tcup are identical at any time between t₂ and t₃ in the sense that they share temporal parts during those times (see Lewis 1986).

Many four-dimensionalists subscribe to a principle that a number of writers call unrestricted mereological composition. According to that principle any set of, in this case four-dimensional, objects constitute a further four dimensional object. Armed with the unrestricted mereological composition principle a four-dimensionalist can say that what there is, in the case of Theseus' ship, is a Y branching object dividable in an indefinite number of ways into four dimensional proper parts an indefinite number of which are ships. For example the ship consisting of the stem together with the replacement branch has as two of its proper parts a ship consisting of just the stem, and one consisting of just the replacement branch.

Apart from the argument that it provides the best solution to diachronic identity puzzles four dimensionalism has been defended on a number of other grounds. One we have reviewed already; the argument that four dimensionalism gives the best solution to the problem of temporary intrinsics. Another, also offered by David Lewis, invokes the principle that facts in general supervene on facts about the instantiations of intrinsic properties and external relations. Call facts about the instantiation of intrinsic properties and external relations basic facts, and let R be the spatio-temporal region occupied by Plate throughout its career. According to Lewis there is a world W in which a sequence of shorter Plate-like objects occupy R, and all of the basic facts that obtain in our world obtain in W. Lewis' supervenience principle tells us that all facts supervene on basic facts. The same basic facts obtain in both our world and W. So whatever is true of the occupant of R in W is true of the occupant of R in our world. The occupant of R in W is a sequence of, appropriately interrelated Plate-like objects. Hence the occupant of R in our world, that is Plate, is likewise a sequence of interrelated Plate-like objects.

Recently Sider (2002) developed an argument for Four Dimensionalism from considerations about vagueness. He argues that Four Dimensionalism is true if it cannot be vague how many things there are, and also that it cannot be vague how many things there are.

It should be noted that Sider and Katherine Hawley defend an alternative version of Four Dimensionalism which identifies objects with what, on the first version, would qualify as their stages (Hawley 2001, Sider 2002). In order to make this identification Sider invokes something close to Lewis’ counterpart relation. Will the table I am currently looking at persist through the next ten minutes? According to the classical four-dimensionalist, otherwise known as the perdurantist, the table will persist through that period provided it has a present and a ten minutes from now table stage that are both stages of the table without either one being identical with the table. In contrast the stage theorist identifies the table with the present stage of the table. How can that be since the present table stage only exists now, and the table is supposed to be around ten minutes from now? It can be, says the stage theorist, because, though the ten minute from now table stage is not now identical with the table, it will be identical with the table. Moreover it will be identical with the table since it stands in the appropriate counterpart relation to the present table stage.

Stage theory enjoys the following advantage over classical four-dimensionalism. Consider the case of a person fissioning into two later people. A classical four-dimensionalist like Lewis will say that before the fission there are two separate people that cannot be told apart. The stage theorist has no need to say that. Instead the stage theorist can say there is a single present person who will be identical with each of a pair of later individuals in virtue of standing in the relevant counterpart relations to each one.

It should also be noted that four dimensionalism differs from Chisholm's invocation of loose and popular identity in, at least, the following way. The persistence of an object for any length of time will, on a four dimensionalist view, require the existence of shorter lived objects setting aside the possibility of extended simples. The persistence for any length of time, on Chisholm's view, of a three dimensional object does not require the existence of shorter lived three dimensional objects. It does not do so because the object persisting for a lengthy period may undergo no change of parts.

4.6 Temporary Identity

In the case of, for example, the truncated cup we saw that one option is to claim that Cup is earlier distinct from Tcup [cup minus its handle], but later identical with Tcup. According to this option the identity of Cup with Tcup is only temporary. We also saw that many refuse to countenance temporary identity because it allegedly conflicts with Leibniz's Law [LL]. After all, later Cup, but not Tcup, apparently later has the property of having had a handle.

Despite this putative conflict with LL, some philosophers are prepared to defend temporary identity as the best solution to the puzzles about diachronic identity. George Myro does so by restricting the scope of LL to exclude such properties as having had a handle (Myro 1985). Gallois (1998) does so by arguing that if the identity of Cup and Tcup is temporary, we cannot infer from Tcup having had a handle earlier that earlier Tcup has a handle.

4.7 Further Puzzle Cases

We have focused attention on one type of case that raises a puzzle about diachronic identity. Such a case involves something ostensibly becoming, or ceasing to be identical with something that is ostensibly one of its earlier or later proper parts. It would be wrong to give the impression that such a “Deon-Theon” case named after the individuals involved in the example is the only, or even main, type of case posing a problem about diachronic identity. In addition there are what are often referred to as fission and fusion cases. A fission case has the following features. We have putatively distinct things b and c existing at some later time t₂. Each of b and c is related to a, which exists at an earlier time t₁, in such a way that each one is ostensibly identical with a.

Fission cases come in two varieties: symmetrical and asymmetrical. Examples of symmetrical fission cases include amoebic and hemispheric division [for the latter see Personal Identity below]. In a symmetrical case there is some relation that each of b and c stand in to a, where standing in that relation is what makes each one putatively identical with a. In an asymmetric case, b is putatively identical with a because it stands in a certain relation to a, but c is putatively identical with a because it stands in a different relation to a. The best known example of a symmetrical fission case is the Ship of Theseus described at the beginning of this section.

Let us see how the proposals for dealing with the cup case apply to fission cases. Constitution only delivers a candidate solution in a symmetric fission case. As we noted above, a constitution theorist can say the following about Theseus' Ship. The ship resulting from the replacement of the original planks is identical with, but not constituted from the original planks. The ship reconstituted from the original planks is not identical with the one originally constituted from those planks.

Some relative identity theorists have this to say about Theseus' Ship. In that case conflict with the transitivity of identity is avoided by maintaining the following. The replacement ship is the same ship as the original, and the original is the same collection of planks as the reassembly ship. Conflict with transitivity is avoided because we need not allow that the reassembly ship is the same ship as the original.

Distinguishing between a strict and loose sense of ‘identical’ yields the following solution in the case of Theseus' Ship. Let Original be the original ship, Replacement be the ship that results from replacing Original's original planks, and Reassembly the one that results from their reassembly. In that case, deploying the distinction between a strict and loose sense of identity, we can say this. Reassembly is strictly identical with Original, but Replacement is only loosely identical with Original. A conflict with transitivity of identity is avoided for the following reason. It follows by transitivity from Replacement being identical with Original, and Original being identical with Reassembly, that Replacement is identical with Reassembly only if a single relation of identity is involved.

Here is what a four dimensionalist such as Lewis will say about Theseus' ship. In that case there are two initially indiscernible ships. The first is a four dimensionally extended ship located where the original ship is initially located that ends up coinciding only with the reassembly ship. The second, also initially located where the original ship is initially ends up coinciding with the replacement ship. We thus have a Y-branching four dimensionally extended object with one ship constituted by the stem together with one branch, and the other constituted by the stem together with the remaining branch.

Four Dimensionalism, like the thesis that identities can be temporary, applies to both symmetric and asymmetric cases of fission.

A temporary identity theorist will hold that Replacement and Reassembly are identical at t₁, but distinct ships at t₂.

In the previous section we reviewed an argument designed to rule out indeterminate identities. If that argument can be met, it is open to us to say the following about Theseus' Ship. Each of Replacement and Reassembly is indeterminately identical with Original.

The puzzle cases are puzzle cases because they bring into putative conflict intuitions all of which we want to subscribe to. Consider a statue and the collection of atoms that constitute it. We wish to say that the statue is identical with the collection of atoms. We also wish to say that the statue, but not the collection, can survive the loss of one atom belonging to that collection. Leibniz's Law appears to force us to renounce one of these intuitions. Thomas Sattig argues for a compatibilist view according to which we can hold on to both intuitions without giving up, or modifying, Leibniz's Law. We can do so by relativising identities to different perspectives. From the ordinary object perspective the statue is distinct from the atoms that constitute it. From the material object perspective the statue is identical with the atoms that constitute it.

5. Personal Identity

Personal identity is perhaps the most extensively discussed special case of identity. What is it for a person existing at one time to be identical to a person existing at another? This question was first clearly posed by John Locke in his celebrated discussion of personal identity in the Essay (Locke 1975). Locke distinguishes between being the same man and being the same person. To be the same man is to be the same member of the species human being. For Locke what is crucial is that having the same consciousness is not sufficient for being the same man, but is sufficient for being the same person.

Famously Locke calls the concept of a person a forensic concept. For Locke much of the importance attaching to being the same person is that moral responsibility for past deeds goes with being the same person, rather than being the same man or even the same immaterial substance, as a past person. In his view it is enough to be morally responsible for some deed that one is the same person as its performer. It is not required that one be the same man or the same immaterial substance as the one who performed the act in question.

What then, according to Locke, is it to have the same consciousness as some past person? He is customarily interpreted as holding that person A is the same person as earlier person B just in case A is able to remember enough of what happened to B. This is sometimes referred to as the memory criterion of personal identity. The memory criterion was criticized by Butler and Reid principally because it was said to be circular, and, as a criterion of personal identity, incompatible with the transitivity of identity. (See Section 2.2, and Joseph Butler ‘Of Personal Identity’ and Thomas Reid ‘Of Mr. Locke's Account of Our Personal Identity’ in Perry 1975.)

The argument for the circularity of the memory criterion went like this. Suppose we think of the memory criterion as giving what would be later called an analysis of A being the same person as B. If so, we are invited to analyze A being the same person as b in terms of A remembering enough of what happened to B. But any plausible analysis of A remembering what happened to B will mention, in the analysans, A being the same person as B.

Sydney Shoemaker has responded to the circularity charge by distinguishing remembering from what he calls Q-remembering (Shoemaker 1975). A Q-remembers something that happened to b just in case there is an appropriate causal link between the event Q-remembered and A's memory impression of that event. Unlike remembering, Q-remembering a past experience does not imply the identity of the one having the Q-memory with the one who had the experience. We can avoid the charge of circularity by restating the memory criterion in the following way. A is the same person as some earlier individual B if and only if A Q-remembers enough of what happened to B.

The charge that the memory criterion conflicts with the transitivity of identity was illustrated by the famous case of the schoolboy, the young lieutenant and the elderly general (Reid 1975). The elderly general can Q-remember enough of what happened to the young lieutenant to qualify, by the memory criterion, as being the same person as the young lieutenant. The young lieutenant in turn Q-remembers enough of what happened to the young schoolboy. But the elderly general can remember almost nothing of what happened to the young schoolboy. Since the memory criterion has it that A Q-remembering enough of what happened to B is a necessary condition for A being the same person as an earlier person B, it follows that, according to the memory criterion, the elderly general is not the same person as the young schoolboy. Hence, the memory criterion implies, contrary to the transitivity of identity, that, although the elderly general is the same person as the young lieutenant, and the young lieutenant is the same person as the schoolboy, the elderly general is not the same person as the young schoolboy.

The memory criterion came to be modified in two further ways. The first modification provides a way of reconciling the memory criterion with the transitivity of identity in the light of cases such as the elderly general. Instead of saying that A is the same person as some earlier B if and only if A can Q-remember enough of what happened to B, we say the following. A is the same person as B if and only if there is a Q-memory chain linking A with B. For there to be a Q-memory link between A and B, either A remembers enough of what happened to B, or A remembers enough of what happened to someone who remembers enough of what happened to B, or A remembers enough of what happened to someone who remembers enough of what happened to someone who remembers enough of what happened to B, and so on. In the case of the elderly general, the elderly general does remember enough of what happened to, someone, the young lieutenant, who remembers enough of what happened to the young schoolboy to count, by the modified criterion, as the same person as the young schoolboy.

The second modification extends the memory criterion to include forward looking psychological connections, such as that between present intention and future action, as determinants of personal identity.

With these modifications incorporated the memory criterion has come to be known as the psychological continuity criterion of personal identity. The psychological continuity criterion is an improvement on the original memory criterion. Nevertheless one of the problems confronting the original memory criterion, its putative conflict with the transitivity of identity, can be brought against its successor in a different form. We saw that making certain identifications in a fission case such as the ship of Theseus [see Section 4: Diachronic Identity Puzzles] threatens the transitivity of identity. One much discussed type of fission case, hemispheric division, is taken by many to show that the psychological continuity criterion is, after all, incompatible with the transitivity of identity (Nagel 1975).

Suppose, as may one day be medically feasible, an individual A's still functioning upper brain is transplanted from A's body to the debrained, but living, body formerly belonging to B. Upon being transplanted A's upper brain is connected to what remains of B's central nervous system so that a person, call her A-B, results. A-B believes herself to be A, can Q-remember what happened to A, has A's psychological dispositions, and so on. Should we say that A-B is the same person as A, the same person as B, or an altogether new person? Psychological continuity theorists will have little hesitation in answering that A-B is the same person as A.

A person can function fairly normally with much of their brain destroyed. Suppose A loses an entire brain hemisphere. Given the plasticity of the brain, and aided by our hypothetical future medical technology, it may be that A could survive such a loss. If so, it would be unreasonable to deny that A could survive the transplantation of only one brain hemisphere given that she could survive the transplantation of he entire intact upper brain.

The putative conflict with transitivity arises when we consider a case in which both of the separated hemispheres of A's original brain are transplanted to separate bodies resulting in what certainly look to be distinct individuals. Suppose, one of A's brain hemispheres is transferred to B's body, resulting in a person PB, and the other to C's body resulting in a person PC. It flouts transitivity to say that PC is identical with A, and that A is identical with PB, but deny, at it seems we should, that PC is identical with PB.

There are a number of ways that defenders of a psychological continuity criterion have attempted to evade this result. One, adopted by David Lewis, goes like this (Lewis 1976). We say that earlier, when A is around with an intact brain, there are two indiscernible individuals, PB and PC, sharing a single body. Another, advocated by Robert Nozick, concedes that if both hemispheres are successfully transplanted, neither of the later individuals with just one brain hemisphere is identical with the earlier one with an intact brain, but insist that if only one hemisphere is transplanted, the resulting individual is identical with the former possessor of two hemispheres. On this view whether, for example, PB is identical with the earlier person with A's body depends on whether there is an equally good later candidate, such as PC, for being the earlier A-body person (Nozick 1981).

In one of the most influential discussions of personal identity Derek Parfit defends a view close to Nozick's by distinguishing between survival and identity (in Perry 1975). In Nozick's view what psychological continuity guarantees is not identity, but survival. In the case where both of A's hemispheres are transplanted to yield PB and PC, A survives as PB, and survives as PC, though she is identical with neither PB nor PC.

Parfit, Nozick and Lewis all take psychological continuity to be integral to personal identity in the following sense. In cases where there is no branching psychological continuity is sufficient to ensure the identity of a later with an earlier person. A number of philosophers would reject this claim insisting that bodily persistence is required for personal identity. Some, for example Eric Olson, would argue that psychological continuity is irrelevant to the identity of those things, human beings, who are the only things we know to be persons. Instead, on this view, what is crucial to personal identity for humans is continuing to be the same animal (Olson 1997).

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B. Necessary and Determinate Identities

B.1 Necessary Identities

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B.2 Determinate Identities

Barnes, E., 2009, “Indeterminacy,Identity and Counterparts: Evans Reconsidered,” Synthese, 168(1): 81–96.
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C. Diachronic Identity Puzzles

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Gabbay, D., and Moravcsik, J.M., 1973, “Sameness and Individuation,” Journal of Philosophy, 70: 513–526.
Gallois, A., 1998, Occasions of Identity: The metaphysics of Persistence, Change, and Sameness, New York: Oxford University Press.
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–––, Gibbard, A., 1975, “Contingent Identity,” Journal of Philosophical Logic, 4: 187–221.
Griffin, N., 1977, Relative Identity, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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Haslanger, S., 1994, “Humean Supervenience and Enduring Things,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 72: 339–359.
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Haslanger, S., and Kurtz, R.M. (eds.), 2006, Persistence: Contemporary Readings, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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Hirsh, E., 1976, “Physical Identity,” Philosophical Review, 85: 357–389.
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Hughes, C., 1986, “Is a Thing Just the Sum of its Parts?,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 86: 213–23.
Johnston, M., 1989, “Fission and the Facts,” in Philosophical Perspectives 3 (Philosophy of mind and Action Theory), Atascadero: Ridgeview Press.
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Jubien, M., 1993, Ontology, Modality and the Fallacy of Reference, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kazmi, A., 1990, “Parthood and Persistence,” Canadian Journal of Philosophy (Supplementary Volume), 16: 227–250.
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Lowe, E.J., 1983, “On the Identity of Artifacts,” Journal of Philosophy, 80: 220–232.
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Markosian, N., 1998, “Brutal Composition,” Philosophical Studies, 79: 95–105.
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Moyer, M., 2006, “Statues and Lumps a Strange Coincidence,” Synthese, 148(2): 401–423.
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Myro, G., 1986, “Identity and Time,” in R. Grandy and R. Warner (eds.), Philosophical Grounds of Rationality: Intentions Categories and Ends, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 383–409.
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–––, 1993, “Constitution is Identity,” Mind 102: 133–146.
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Oaklander, N., 1992, “Temporal Passage and Temporal Parts,” Noûs, 26: 79–84.
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Parsons J., 2000, “Must a Four-Dimensionalist believe in temporal Parts?,” The Monist, 83: 399–814.
Perry, J., 1970, “The Same F,” Philosophical Review, 79: 181–200.
Rea, M., 1995, “The Problem of Material Constitution,” Philosophical Review, 104: 525–552.
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–––, 1998, “Temporal Parts Unmotivated,” Philosophical Review, 107: 225–260.
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Robinson, D., 1982, “Re-identifying Matter,” Philosophical Review, 91: 317–342.
–––, 1985, “Can Amoebae Divide Without Multiplying?,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 63: 299–319.
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Sattig, T., 2008, “Identity in 4D,” Philosophical Studies, 104(2): 179–195.
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Shoemaker, S., 2015, “Persistence and Properties,” Journal of the American Philosophical Association, 1(3): 433–448.
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D. Personal Identity

Ballie, J., 1990, “Recent Work on Personal Identity,” Philosophical Books, 34: 193–206.
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Bermudez, J., 1998, The Paradox of Self-Consciousness, Cambridge: MIT.
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–––, 2009, “Endurantism and the Psychological Approach to Personal Identity,” Theoria, 75(1): 28–33.
Buford, C., 2009, “Memory, Quasi-Memory, and Pseudo-Quasi Memory,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 87(3): 465–478.
Butler J., 1736, “Of Personal Identity,” in The Analogy of Religion, New York: Cosimo, 2005.
Campbell, J., 2011, “Personal Identity,” The Oxford Handbook of the Self, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Cartwright, H.M., 1993, “On Two Arguments for the Indeterminacy of Personal Identity,” Synthese, 95: 241–273.
Chandler, H., 1969, “Shoemaker's Arguments Against Locke,” Philosophical Quarterly, 19: 17–37.
Chihara, C., 1994, “The Many Persons Problem,” Philosophical Studies, 76: 45–9.
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Coburn, R., 1960, “Bodily Continuity and Personal Identity,” Analysis, 20: 117–120.
Cole, D., 1991, “Artificial Intelligence and personal Identity,” Synthese, 88: 399–417.
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Ehring, D., 1987, “Personal Identity and Time Travel,” Philosophical Studies, 52: 427–33.
–––, 1990, “Nonbranching and Nontransitivity,” Analysis, 50: 268–71.
–––, 1995, “Personal Identity and the R-Relation: Reconciliation Through Cohabitation?,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 73: 337–346.
––&Ndash;, 2013, “Why Parfit Did Not Go Far Enough,” Philosophical Studies, 165(1): 133–149.
Eklund, M., 2004, “Personal Identity, Concerns, and Indeterminacy,” Monist, 87(4): 489–511.
Elliott, R., 1991, “Personal Identity and the Causal Continuity Requirement,” Philosophical Quarterly, 41: 55–75.
Fuller, G., 1992, “Functionalism and personal Identity,” Personalist Forum, 8: 133–143.
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–––, 1998, Personal Identity and Self-Consciousness, London: Routledge.
Gendler, T.Z., 2002, “Personal Identity and Thought Experiments,” Philosophical Quarterly, 52: 34–54.
Grice, H.P., 1941, “Personal Identity,” Mind, 50: 330–350.
Hamilton, A., 1995, “A New Look at Personal Identity,” Philosophical Quarterly, 45: 332–349.
Hirsch, E., 1991, “Divided Minds,” Philosophical Review 100: 3–30.
Johnston, M., 1987, “Human Beings,” Journal of Philosophy, 84(2): 59–83.
–––, 1989, “Relativism and the Self,” in Relativism, Interpretation and Confrontation, M. Krausz (ed.), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
–––, 1992, “Reasons and Reductionism,” Philosophical Review, 101: 589–618.
Kolak, D., 1993, “The metaphysics and Metapsychology of Personal Identity,” American philosophical Quarterly, 30: 39–50.
Lewis, D., 1976, “Survival and Identity,” in Amelie Oksenberg Rorty (ed.), The Identities of Persons, Berkeley: University of Calfornia Press.
Lowe, E. J., 2011, “Personal Identity,” The Continuum Companion to Philosophy of Mind, London: Continuum International Publishing Group.
Mackenzie, C., 2009, “Personal Identity, Narrative Integration and Embodiment,” in S. Campbell (ed.), Embodiment and Agency, University Park: Penn State University Press.
Markosian, N., 2010, “Identifying the Problem of Personal Identity,” in J.K. Campbell, M. O'Rourke, and H.S. Silverstein (eds.), Time and Identity, Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
Merricks, T., 2001, “Realism about Personal Identity over Time,” Philosophical Perspective 15 (Noûs Supplement, 35): 173–187.
Mills, E., 1993, “Dividing Without Reducing: Bodily Fission and Personal Identity,” Mind, 102: 35–51.
Miri, M., 1973, “Memory and personal Identity,” Mind, 82: 1–21.
Nagel, T., 1979, “Brain Bisection and the Unity of Consciousness,” in Nagel, T., Mortal Questions, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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