Imagination

To imagine is to represent without aiming at things as they actually, presently, and subjectively are. One can use imagination to represent possibilities other than the actual, to represent times other than the present, and to represent perspectives other than one’s own. Unlike perceiving and believing, imagining something does not require one to consider that something to be the case. Unlike desiring or anticipating, imagining something does not require one to wish or expect that something to be the case.

Imagination is involved in a wide variety of human activities, and has been explored from a wide range of philosophical perspectives. Philosophers of mind have examined imagination’s role in cognitive processes such as mindreading and pretense. Philosophical aestheticians have examined imagination’s role in creating and in engaging with different types of artworks. Epistemologists have examined imagination’s role in acquiring knowledge of various sorts.

Because of the breadth of the topic, this entry focuses primarily on contemporary discussions of imagination in the Anglo-American philosophical tradition. For notable historical accounts of imagination, see the entries on Aristotle, Thomas Hobbes, David Hume, Immanuel Kant, Gilbert Ryle, Jean-Paul Sartre, and R.G. Collingwood’s aesthetics; for a more detailed and comprehensive historical survey, see Brann (1991); for a wide-ranging discussion of imagination in the phenomenological tradition, see Casey (2000); for discussions of imagination in South Asian philosophical traditions, see Shulman (2012) and Thompson (2014); and for the same in Islamic philosophy, see the entry on Arabic and Islamic Psychology and Philosophy of Mind.

• 1. The Nature of Imagination
  • 1.1 Taxonomies of Imagination
  • 1.2 Unified Theories of Imagination
• 2. Imagination in Cognitive Architecture
  • 2.1 Imagination and Belief
  • 2.2 Imagination and Mental Imagery
  • 2.3 Imagination and Desire
  • 2.4 Imagination and Memory
  • 2.5 Imagination and Supposition
  • 2.6 Imagination and Intention
• 3. Roles of Imagination
  • 3.1 Mindreading
  • 3.2 Pretense
  • 3.3 Engagement with the Arts
  • 3.4 Creativity
  • 3.5 Knowledge
  • 3.6 Imagination and Belief: Borderline Cases
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. The Nature of Imagination

A variety of roles have been attributed to imagination across various domains of human cognition and activity (section 3). Not surprisingly, it is doubtful that there is one component of the mind that can satisfy all the various roles commonly attributed to imagination (Kind 2013; Strawson 1970). In the opening chapter of Mimesis as Make-Believe—perhaps the most influential contemporary monograph on imagination—Kendall Walton throws up his hands at the prospect of delineating the notion precisely. After enumerating and distinguishing a number of paradigmatic instances of imagination, he asks:

What is it to imagine? We have examined a number of dimensions along which imaginings can vary; shouldn’t we now spell out what they have in common?—Yes, if we can. But I can’t (Walton 1990, 19).

Although it may not be possible to give a completely general account of all the cognitive phenomena we call “imagination,” philosophers have attempted to eludicate the imagination in two ways. Some aim to draw precise distinctions between types of imagination, using these to build taxonomies (section 1.1). Others aim to develop theories that unify many paradigmatic cases of imagination, even if they leave some out (section 1.2).

1.1 Taxonomies of Imagination

Philosophers have attempted to draw distinctions between different types of imagination (or different senses of the term “imagination”), typically while acknowledging that these distinctions are not exhaustive. Many of these taxonomies are overlapping—i.e., a given instance of imagining may fall under categories posited by more than one taxonomy.

Neil Van Leeuwen (2013, 2014a) draws a highly influential distinction between attitude imagining and imagistic imagining. Sometimes, when we say that a subject “imagines” some content P (as in “S imagines that King’s College is on fire”), we are referring to the propositional attitude S takes towards P (see the entry on propositional attitude reports). Roughly, we mean that S regards P as fictional, as opposed to believing P is true (this category of imagination also goes by various other names in the literature, including “belief-like,” “cognitive,” and “propositional” imagining). Other times, we instead use “imagine” to refer to the format S uses to mentally represent P—specifically, we mean that S represents P imagistically, or using mental imagery (also known as “sensory” imagining). Imagistic and attitude imagining often occur together, as when S visualizes King’s College on fire while taking this scenario to be fictional. It is also possible for imagistic imagining to occur in absence of attitude imagining: if S sees a news alert about King’s College being on fire, she might both believe that King’s College is on fire and imagistically imagine it. It is more controversial whether there is a category of non-imagistic attitude imagining (see section 2.2).

We also use the word “imagine” in ways that distinguish different contents imaginings can have. Propositional uses, which take the form “S imagines that P,” describe S as imagining that some proposition P is the case. For example, Juliet might imagine that Romeo is by her side. Objectual uses, which take the form “S imagines O,” describe S as imagining some entity or situation (Yablo 1993; see also Martin 2002; Noordhof 2002; O’Shaughnessy 2000). For example, Prospero might imagine an acorn or a nymph or the city of Naples or a wedding feast. We also describe people as imagining doing or experiencing things, using the formulation “S imagines X-ing” (Walton 1990). For example, Ophelia might imagine getting herself to a nunnery or seeing Hamlet. These uses of “imagine” may not be mutually exclusive—when Juliet sits on a bench and forms a mental image of Romeo next to her, it seems equally apt to describe her as imagining that Romeo is by her side, as imagining Romeo, and as imagining sitting beside Romeo. However, it is more controversial how they come apart from each other. For example, philosophers have debated whether using mental imagery to imagine an object always involves imagining experiencing that object (Gregory 2016; Martin 2002; Noordhof 2002; Peacocke 1985; Williams 1973).

Another notable distinction is that between imagining from the inside versus from the outside (Ninan 2016; Williams 1973; Wollheim 1973). To imagine from the outside that one is Napoleon involves imagining a scenario in which one is Napoleon. To imagine from the inside that one is Napoleon involves that plus something else: namely, that one is occupying the perspective of Napoleon. Imagining from the inside is essentially first-personal, imagining from the outside is not. This distinction is especially notable for its implications for thought experiments about the metaphysics of personal identity (Nichols 2008; Ninan 2009; Williams 1973).

Various further distinctions can be drawn. Van Leeuwen (2013, 2014a) also distinguishes attitude and imagistic imagining from constructive imagining, or the process of generating a mental representation (e.g., the temporally extended process of piecing together a mental image of King’s College on fire). Kendall Walton (1990) distinguishes between spontaneous and deliberate imagining (acts of imagination that occur with or without the one’s conscious direction) and between occurrent and nonoccurrent imaginings (acts of imagination that do or do not occupy one’s explicit attention). Amy Kind and Peter Kung (2016b) distinguish transcendent uses of imagination, which enable one to escape from or look beyond the world as it is, from instructive uses of imagination, which enable one to learn about the world (a distinction especially relevant to the epistemology of imagination; see section 3.5).

1.2 Unified Theories of Imagination

Instead of merely drawing distinctions between types of imagination, some philosophers aim to develop theories that unify various paradigmatic processes we intuitively recognize as imaginative. They do so while acknowledging that their theories may not capture every single such process. While this section is not an exhaustive overview of every recent theory, it aims to give a representative look at the types of theories on offer.

Gregory Currie and Ian Ravenscroft (2002) develop a theory of imagination as a recreative capacity (see also Goldman’s 2006 enactive theory). They start from the intuitive observation that imagination enables us to mentally “project” ourselves into perspectives different from our own. This serves as the core of their theory, according to which imagination is a capacity for recreating or simulating other mental states. On this view, imagistic imagining involves simulating perceptual experiences—for example, to visualize the Statue of Liberty is to simulate a visual experience of the Statue of Liberty. Similarly, attitude imagining involves simulating beliefs—for example, to imagine that I am in New York City is to simulate the belief that I am in New York City. Currie and Ravenscroft also posit an imaginative analogue of desire (see section 2.3). This “recreativist” theory of imagination has been both influential and controversial (for more recent developments of it, see Arcangeli 2020; Roelofs 2023; for criticisms, see Langland-Hassan 2020; Wiltsher 2019).

Amy Kind (2020) gives an account of imagination—specifically, imagistic and experiential forms of imagination—as a cognitive skill. Kind starts from the intuitive observation that some people are better at imagining things that others—for example, Mozart might be better than the average person at imagining what a symphony will sound like before hearing it, and one child might be better than her friend at imagining a monster during their shared game of make-believe. Drawing on an analysis of skilled action from Jason Stanley and John Krakauer (2013), Kind proposes that paradigmatic examples of skilled activities satisfy three conditions: (1) they can be done more or less well; (2) they are under the intentional control of the one performing them; and (3) one can improve at them through practice or training. She argues that imagistic imagining satisfies all three conditions (for further developments of this view, see Blomkvist 2022a; Kind 2022a, 2023a, 2023b).

Peter Langland-Hassan (2020) gives a reductive account of attitude imagining. He first defines attitude imagining as engagement in “rich, elaborated cognition about the possible, fantastical, pretended, and so on,” in a way that is “epistemically safe” in that it does not commit us to believing that what we imagine is true (5). He then argues that imagination in this sense is not a sui generis propositional attitude distinct from others like belief, intention, or desire. Instead, he argues that we engage in attitude imagining whenever we form other propositional attitudes in a way that involves epistemically safe cognition about the possible, fantastical, pretended, and the like. For example: to believe it is merely possible that the moon is made of blue cheese is a way of imagining that the moon is made of blue cheese; to believe that the fictional character Harry Potter studies at Hogwarts is a way of imagining that Harry Potter studies at Hogwarts; and to desire or intend to bring about a state of affairs in which I am rich and famous is a way of imagining that I am rich and famous. Attitude imagining therefore reduces to other, more basic mental states (see Chasid 2025 for objections to this reductive view).

Nicholas Wiltsher (2023) develops a theory of imagination as a process. He distinguishes this from the more traditional view that there are distinctive imaginative states, such as the “recreative” states posited by Currie and Ravenscroft (2002). Wiltsher objects to the state view on the grounds that it fails to account for every type imaginative activity—in particular, as Currie and Ravenscroft (2002) themselves grant, it fails to apply to more creative forms of imagination. Wiltsher instead proposes that imagination is a cognitive process, i.e., a particular way of manipulating or transitioning between mental states, where this includes states such as ordinary belief and desire (as opposed to imaginative recreations of them). Wiltsher individuates cognitive processes generally by appealing to the norms or principles that govern transitions between states—the process of epistemic inference, for example, is governed by truth-preserving and evidential transitions. He argues that imagination likewise involves certain kinds of transitions between states. He argues that one promising candidate for understanding these transitions appeals to the “lens” metaphor developed in Wiltsher (2019): much as lenses “magnify, focus, clarify, attenuate, [and] distort” the things on which they are trained, imagination does the same to other mental states (445).

Finally, consider Bence Nanay’s (2023) eliminativist view (which provides a “unified” theory of imagination insofar as it posits there is no such thing as imagination). Nanay starts from the observation that concepts encoded in ordinary language often fail to pick out what actually exists—for example, folk biological concepts like “lily” and “beech tree” fail to pick out real biological categories, and scientists aim to replace these with classifications that pick out genuine natural kinds. He argues that something similar goes for many of our folk psychological categories, including imagination, which fails to pick out a unified neurocognitive kind. Conversely, he points out that the category mental imagery is well-established as a theoretically useful classification in cognitive science; he therefore argues that it is often more accurate to replace our talk of “imagination” with talk of mental imagery. While Nanay does not claim that we should stop using the term “imagination” in ordinary, everyday communication, he argues that we should drop it from scientifically informed attempts to understand how the mind really works.

2. Imagination in Cognitive Architecture

One way to make sense of the nature of imagination is by drawing distinctions between different types of imagination (section 1.1). We can then further elucidate the nature of these different types by figuring out, within a broadly functionalist framework, how they fit in with other mental entities from folk psychology and scientific psychology (see the entry on functionalism).

Amongst the most widely-discussed mental entities in contemporary discussions of imagination are belief (section 2.1), mental imagery (section 2.2), desire (section 2.3), memory (section 2.4), supposition (section 2.5), and intention (section 2.6). See also the entry on dreams.

In discussing imagination’s relations to each of these states, this section will continue to invoke the influential distinction, covered above in section 1.1, between attitude and imagistic imagining.

2.1 Imagination and Belief

To believe is to take something to be the case or regard it as true (see the entry on belief). When one says something like “the liar believes that his pants are on fire”, one attributes to the subject (the liar) an attitude (belief) towards a proposition (his pants are on fire). Likewise, when one says something like “the liar imagines that his pants are on fire”, one attributes to the subject (the liar) an attitude (imagination) towards a proposition (his pants are on fire). The similarities and differences between the belief attribution and the imagination attribution point to similarities and differences between imagining and believing. Specifically, these apply to belief in comparison with attitude imagining.

On the single code hypothesis, beliefs and attitude imaginings share a common representational format, where this grounds functional similarities between the two (Nichols 2004a; Nichols & Stich 2000, 2003). These functional similarities include belief-like inferential relations between imaginings that guide how an overall imaginative episode unfolds over time. If one believes that a cup is full of water and believes that it has been tipped over onto a table, one will as a result believe that the cup is empty and that the table is wet. Similar inferential relations typically hold between attitude imaginings. For example, in a famous experiment by Alan Leslie (1994), children are invited to engage in an imaginary tea party (with empty cups); when they see that one cup has been tipped over, their representation of the imagined situation is updated such that they now imagine the tipped cup as empty and the non-tipped cups as full (see Gendler 2003 for further discussion of this aspect of imagination, as well as various ways in which imaginative episodes can depart from it).

There are two main options for distinguishing imagining from believing (Sinhababu 2016).

The first option characterizes their difference in normative terms. While belief aims at truth, imagination does not (Humberstone 1992; Shah & Velleman 2005). If the liar did not regard it as true that his pants are on fire, then it seems that he cannot really believe that his pants are on fire. By contrast, even if the liar did not regard it as true that his pants are on fire, he can still imagine that his pants are on fire. While the norm of truth is constitutive of the attitude of belief, it is not constitutive of the attitude of imagination. In dissent, Neil Sinhababu (2013) argues that the norm of truth is neither sufficient nor necessary for distinguishing imagining and believing.

The second option characterizes their difference in functional terms. One purported functional difference between imagination and belief concerns their characteristic connections to actions. If the liar truly believes that his pants are on fire, he will typically attempt to put out the fire by, say, pouring water on himself. By contrast, if the liar merely imagines that his pants are on fire, he will typically do no such thing. In other words, while beliefs directly guide and motivation action, imagination typically does not (Nichols & Stich 2000, 2003). It is controversial whether there are ordinary contexts in which imagination directly motivates or guides action the way belief does. Some argue that it does so during contexts such as pretend play (Doggett & Egan 2007; Velleman 2000), while others argue that the connection between imagination and action in such contexts is less direct (Everson 2007; Funkhouser & Spaulding 2009; Kind 2011; O’Brien 2005; Van Leeuwen 2009).

Another purported functional difference between imagination and belief concerns their characteristic connection to emotions. If the liar truly believes that his pants are on fire, then he will be genuinely afraid of the fire; but not if he merely imagines so. While belief evokes genuine emotions toward real entities, imagination does not (Walton 1978, 1990, 1997; see also the entry on emotional responses to fiction). This debate is entangled with controversies concerning the nature of emotions (see the entry on emotion). Those who reject this purported functional difference also typically reject narrow cognitivism about emotions (Carruthers 2003, 2006; Kind 2011; Nichols 2004a; Meskin & Weinberg 2003; Spaulding 2015; Weinberg & Meskin 2005, 2006).

Tamar Szabó Gendler’s (2003) notion of imaginative quarantining is useful for summing up putative functional differences between attitude imagining and belief, when it comes to their effects on both action and emotions. Quarantining is manifest to the extent that events within an imagined or pretended episode are taken to have effects only within a relevantly circumscribed domain. So, for example, children engaging in a make-believe tea party do not expect that “spilling” (imaginary) “tea” will result in the table really being wet, nor does a person who imagines winning the lottery expect that when she visits the ATM, her bank account will contain a million dollars. More generally, quarantining is manifest to the extent that imagined contents are not treated as relevant to guiding action in, or attitudes towards, the actual world. Quarantining can be disrupted by imaginative contagion, when imagined content directly influences actual attitudes or behaviors (see also Gendler 2008a, 2008b). For example, in affective transmission, an emotional response to an imagined situation constrains subsequent behavior (e.g., imagining a scary monster in a closet leads to hesitation to open the door).

Philosophers have debated whether the phenomenon of imaginative immersion shows that the propositional attitudes of imagination and belief lie on opposite ends of a continuum, with intermediate states in between. Susanna Schellenberg (2013) argues that, when one becomes deeply immersed in an imagining (as when, e.g., an actor becomes deeply immersed in a role she is playing), one to some extent loses awareness of reality and the fact that one is merely imagining, thereby coming closer to regarding the imagined content as true; one therefore comes to occupy a mental state somewhere in between imagination and belief. In response, Shen-yi Liao and Tyler Doggett (2014) argue that a cognitive architecture that collapses distinctive attitudes on the basis of borderline cases is unlikely to be fruitful in explaining psychological phenomena. Others propose alternative explanations of imaginative immersion (Chasid 2017, 2021; Kind 2024; see also Kampa 2017 on imaginative “transportation”).

2.2 Imagination and Mental Imagery

Mental images are, roughly, perception-like representations triggered by something other than the appropriate external stimulus; so, for example, one might have “a picture in the mind’s eye or … a tune running through one’s head” (Strawson 1970, 31) in the absence of any corresponding visual or auditory stimulation (see the entry on mental imagery). While attitude imagining is often compared to belief, imagistic imagining is often compared to perception (Currie & Ravenscroft 2002). It is possible to form mental images in any of the sensory modalities, though it is most common to focus on examples of visual imagery.

Broadly, there is agreement that mental imagery and perception have similar phenomenologies, which can be explicated in terms of their similar content and representational formats (Nanay 2016b; see, for example, Kind 2001; Nanay 2015; Noordhof 2002). Potential candidates for distinguishing mental imagery from perception include their relative degrees of intensity or vividness (Hume’s Treatise of Human Nature), voluntariness (Ichikawa 2009; McGinn 2004), or causal relationship with the represented object (Noordhof 2002). However, no consensus exists on features that clearly distinguish the two. This is in part because of ongoing debates about the nature of perception itself (see the entries on contents of perception and epistemological problems of perception). It also stems from difficulties defining notions like experiential or imaginative vividness. Amy Kind (2017) goes as far as arguing that various potential ways of understanding imaginative vividness are problematic, such that the very idea is philosophically untenable; others are more optimistic that some kind of positive account can be given (Fazekas 2024; Langkau 2021; Tooming & Miyazono 2021; Riley & Davies 2023).

Some philosophers argue that, during imagistic imaginings, what one imagines is determined by more than just what is represented in one’s mental image alone, or when considered in isolation from the broader imagining of which it is part. This idea is often motivated by the observation that identical mental images can be used to imagine different things (what Noordhof 2002 calls the “Multiple Use Thesis”). I can, for example, use identical visual images to imagine both a suitcase sitting alone in my living room and a suitcase sitting in my living room with a cat fully hidden from view behind it. Likewise, I can use identical visual images to imagine both Elvis Presley and a very convincing Elvis impersonator. This suggests that the image itself is insufficient for determining what one imagines (at least, it suggests this is sometimes true—see Gregory’s 2016 argument that some imaginings are “purely imagistic”). Philosophers have therefore argued that imagistic imaginings are hybrids of both a mental image and a purely propositional or linguistic component. The latter is taken to be something like a supposition about what the image represents, or a linguistic “label” that partially fixes what is represented (Fodor 1975; Kung 2010; Langland-Hassan 2020; Noordhof 2002; Peacocke 1985; but see Wiltsher 2016 for dissent).

It is controversial whether there is such as a thing as purely propositional imaginings, or imaginings that do not involve mental imagery at all. Historical philosophers such as Aristotle (De Anima), René Descartes (Meditations on First Philosophy), and David Hume (Treatise of Human Nature) thought that imagination must involve mental imagery. Against this historical orthodoxy, the contemporary tendency is to recognize that there can be non-imagistic attitude imaginings. To defend this idea, some philosophers argue that, intuitively, it is possible to imagine contents that cannot be represented in mental imagery. Neil Van Leeuwen (2013) gives one such example: “When I imagine, on reading Lord of the Rings, that elves can live forever, I’m fictionally imagining a proposition that I couldn’t imagine using mental imagery. It would take too long!” (222). Similarly, Peter Langland-Hassan (2020) argues that it is possible to imagine unobservable entities such as the theoretical posits of physics or legal and moral principles. Against this contemporary tendency, Kind (2001) argues that an image-based account can explain three crucial features of imagination—its directedness, active nature, and phenomenological character—better than its imageless counterpart. Magdalena Balcerak Jackson (2016) argues that an image-based account is necessary for differentiating imagination from the distinct propositional attitudes of supposing and conceiving.

The question of whether there is such a thing as non-imagistic imagining takes on new significance in relation to recent research on aphantasia. Aphantasia is a condition in which subjects report an inability to form mental images. It remains controversial exactly how to understand aphantasia—for example, whether aphantasic subjects genuinely lack the ability to form mental imagery altogether, or whether they merely seem to lack imagery because their imagery is very weak, unconscious, or non-introspectable. Psychologists continue to investigate this question, while philosophers attempt to contribute conceptual clarity to empirical investigations (for overviews, see Arcangeli 2023; Blomkvist 2022b; Blomkvist & Marks 2023; Nanay 2021a, 2025). If aphantasics do genuinely lack mental imagery, it is natural to ask whether they are still capable of imagination in some sense, or whether they simply lack imagination. Answering this requires settling whether there is such a thing as non-imagistic imagining.

Finally, the relationship between mental imagery and perception has potential implications for the connection between imagination and action. Working from the starting point that imagistic imagination is similar to perception, some philosophers have argued that—much as perception directly outputs to action-generation systems (cf. Nanay 2013)—imagistic imagination can, too (Langland-Hassan 2015; Nanay 2016a; Van Leeuwen 2011, 2016b). For example, Van Leeuwen (2011) argues that an account of imagination that is imagistically-rich is useful for explaining pretense behaviors. Furthermore, Robert Eamon Briscoe (2008, 2018) argues that representations that blend inputs from perception and mental imagery, which he calls “make-perceive”, guide many everyday actions. For example, a sculptor might use a blend of the visual perception of a stone and the mental imagery of different parts of the stone being subtracted to guide their physical manipulation of the stone.

2.3 Imagination and Desire

To desire is to want something to be the case (see the entry on desire). Standardly, the conative attitude of desire is contrasted with the cognitive attitude of belief in terms of “direction of fit”: while belief aims to make one’s mental representations match the way the world is, desire aims to make the way the world is match one’s mental representations. Recall that on the single code hypothesis, there exists a cognitive imaginative attitude that is structurally similar to belief (section 2.1). Is there a conative imaginative attitude—call it desire-like imagination (Currie 1997, 2002a, 2002b, 2010; Currie & Ravenscroft 2002), make-desire (Currie 1990; Goldman 2006), or i-desire (Doggett & Egan 2007, 2012)—that is structurally similar to desire?

One impetus for positing a conative imaginative attitude comes from behavior motivation in imaginative contexts, such as pretend play (see section 3.2). Tyler Doggett and Andy Egan (2007) argue that, in such contexts, cognitive and conative imagination jointly output to action-generation systems, in the same way that belief and desire jointly do. Another impetus for positing a conative imaginative attitude comes from emotions in imaginative contexts. Gregory Currie and Ian Ravenscroft (2002) and Doggett and Egan (2012) argue the best explanation for people’s emotional responses toward non-existent fictional characters (e.g., apparent feelings of grief at Juliet’s suicide) call for positing conative imagination (e.g., a desire-like imagining that Juliet live). Currie and Ravenscroft (2002), Currie (2010), and Doggett and Egan (2007) argue that the best explanation for people’s apparently conflicting emotional responses toward tragedy and horror also call for positing conative imagination. In response, others give alternative explanations of such phenomena which do not require positing a conative imaginative attitude (Carruthers 2003, 2006; Funkhouser & Spaulding 2009; Kind 2011; Langland-Hassan 2020; Meskin & Weinberg 2003; Nichols 2004a; Spaulding 2015; Van Leeuwen 2011; Weinberg & Meskin 2005, 2006).

Some object to the idea of conative imagination by arguing that its different impetuses call for conflicting functional properties. Amy Kind (2016b) notes a tension between the argument from behavior motivation and the argument from fictional emotions: conative imagination must be connected to action-generation in order for it to explain pretense behaviors, but it must be disconnected from action-generation in order for it to explain fictional emotions. Similarly, Shaun Nichols (2004b) notes a tension between Currie and Ravenscroft’s (2002) argument from the paradox of fictional emotions and argument from paradoxes of tragedy and horror.

Kind (2016b) also objects to positing a conative imaginative attitude on the grounds that, unlike belief-like imagining, such an attitude is not reflected in our folk psychological understanding of activities such as engagement with fiction (see also Doggett & Egan 2012). She argues that this distinction is not apparent in introspection, and that people typically simply take themselves to have genuine desires about what happens in works of fiction. Luke Roelofs (2023) responds that it is difficult for us to recognize the existence of conative imaginings because we are often in states which fall somewhere in between genuine desire and its imaginative analogue, being indeterminate between the two.

Blumberg and Strohminger (2025) argue that, if understanding engagement with fiction motivates us to posit an imaginative analogue of desire, then we should also posit imaginative analogues of other desire-involving states, such as hoping, wishing, and regretting. However, they argue that positing such states is in tension with the standard view that conative imaginings interact with cognitive imaginings but remain insulated from actual beliefs.

2.4 Imagination and Memory

Episodic memory is, roughly, memory for one’s own past experiences, such as one’s firsthand memory of last Tuesday’s lunch, one’s tenth birthday party, or the birth of one’s child. While episodic memory is just one among various forms of memory that make up standard taxonomies (see the entry on memory), it is the type that features most prominently in philosophical discussions about the relationship between memory and imagination. This is unsurprising given obvious similarities between imagination and episodic memory: for example, both typically involve mental imagery, both typically represent what is not presently the case, and both frequently involve recreating or simulating experiences.

Recent philosophical literature on memory and imagination has been dominated by a disagreement between two views. According to discontinuism, episodic memory and imagination are—despite some obvious similarities—distinct psychological kinds. According to continuism, episodic memory and imagination are the same sort of psychological process, distinguished merely by the fact that episodic memory is directed towards one’s past while imagination represents things that are past, future, and merely possible (for a detailed review of the continuism-discontinuism debate, see Rudnicki et al. forthcoming).

Discontinuism was the orthodox view in the history of philosophy (see De Brigard 2017 for a historical overview). In contemporary philosophy, the most common form of discontinuism posits that memory, unlike imagination, requires a causal connection to a past experience (Martin & Deutscher 1966 develop the most prominent contemporary formulation of this view). On this view, genuinely remembering an event E (as opposed to merely imagining it) requires that one experienced E oneself in the past, and that an appropriate causal connection (via, e.g., some form of stored “trace” of the experience) holds between the original experience and one’s present remembering.

In recent years, two sets of findings from cognitive science have given philosophers reasons to push back against this “causalist” form of discontinuism, instead defending continuism.

The first set of findings concern distortions and confabulations. The traditional conception of memory is that it functions as an archive: past experiences are encapsulated and stored in the archive, and remembering is just passively retrieving the encapsulated mental content from the archive (Robins 2016). Behavioral psychology has found numerous effects that challenge the empirical adequacy of the archival conception of memory. Perhaps the most well-known is the misinformation effect, which occurs when a subject incorporates inaccurate information into their memory of an event—even inaccurate information that they received after the event (Loftus 1979 [1996]).

The second set of findings concerns the psychological underpinnings of “mental time travel,” or the similarities between remembering the past and imagining the future (see Schacter et al. 2012 for a review). Using fMRI, neuroscientists have found a striking overlap in the brain activities for remembering the past and imagining the future, which suggest that the two psychological processes utilize the same neural network (see, for example, Addis et al. 2007; Buckner & Carroll 2007; Gilbert & Wilson 2007; Schacter et al. 2007; Suddendorf & Corballis 1997, 2007). Note that, despite the evocative contrast between “remembering the past” and “imagining the future,” it is questionable whether temporality is the central contrast. Indeed, some philosophers and psychologists contend that temporality is orthogonal to the comparison between imagination and memory (De Brigard & Gessell 2016; Schacter et al. 2012).

These two set of findings have given rise to a conception of episodic memory as essentially constructive, in which remembering is actively generating imagistic mental representations that more or less accurately represent the past. This constructive conception of memory is in a better position to explain why memories commonly contain distortions and confabulations, and why remembering makes use of the same neural networks as imagining.

This constructive turn in memory science has inspired philosophical defenses of continuism. Kourken Michaelian (2016, 2024) defends the view that episodic memory is nothing more than imagining the past. Similarly, Felipe De Brigard (2014) characterizes remembering as just one among other forms of episodic hypothetical thought, a category that also includes imagining future and counterfactual events. On these views, one can genuinely remember a past event even if one’s memory bears no causal connection to that event. They thus deny the orthodox discontinuist view according to which causal connections distinguish memory from imagination.

In response, many have argued that empirical findings about the constructive nature of memory are compatible with discontinuism. Some defend the idea that a causal connection really is necessary for genuine remembering, often by attempting to develop more nuanced versions of causal conditions (Munro 2021; Perrin 2018; Werning 2020). Others defend discontinuism by appealing to metaphysical differences in the ways memory and imagination relate subjects to events being remembered or imagined (Aranyosi 2020; Debus 2014). Some argue that, although both memory and imagination involve constructive processes, the specific types of constructive processes involved are different in each (Robins 2022; Sant’anna 2023). Sarah Robins (2020) also argues that memory involves a distinct cognitive attitude from imagination—namely, the attitude of seeming to remember.

As in this subsection thus far, the debate between continuists and discontinuists is often conducted without much attention to what is meant by “imagination.” This leads to some lack of clarity given that, as per section 1.1, the term “imagination” is used to refer to various kinds of processes. Peter Langland-Hassan (2021) attempts to rectify this by appealing to Neil Van Leeuwen’s (2013) notion of constructive imagining, the temporally extended process of generating mental representations.

2.5 Imagination and Supposition

To suppose that P is true is to form a hypothetical mental representation of P, typically for the purpose of reasoning through P’s consequences. You might, for example, suppose that a certain political candidate wins the next election, then think through what would follow for the country’s economy under that supposition. There exists a highly contentious debate on whether supposition is a form of attitude imagining, or whether there are enough differences to make them distinct mental states. There are obvious similarities between the two, such as the fact that both are under our voluntary control and can be used to explore the implications of hypothetical scenarios. There are two main options for distinguishing imagination and supposition: by their contents or by their functions.

The content-based distinction is often cashed out in terms of imaginings containing richer or more elaborate detail than suppositions—for example, Brian Weatherson (2004) claims suppositions are “coarser” than imaginings, since the latter contain more fine-grained details (but see Weinberg & Meskin 2006 for objections). One way of further fleshing out this idea is to claim that imagination has a rich imagistic, experiential, or sensory element that supposition does not (Balcerak Jackson 2016; Kind 2001; Peacocke 1985). However, it is controversial whether all imagining involves imagistic phenomenology, since many philosophers hold that there is such a thing as non-imagistic attitude imagining (see section 2.2). So, whether to accept this way of understanding the distinction turns on whether one accepts the existence of non-imagistic imaginings.

There have been diverse functional distinctions attributed to imagination and supposition, but none has gained universal acceptance. Richard Moran (1994) contends that imagination tends to give rise to a wide range of further mental states, including affective responses, whereas supposition does not (see also Arcangeli 2014, 2017). Tamar Szabó Gendler (2000) contends that, while attempting to imagine morally repugnant propositions (e.g., that female infanticide is morally right) generates imaginative resistance, supposing them does not. Tyler Doggett and Andy Egan (2007) contend that imagination tends to motivate pretense actions, but supposition tends not to. Magdalena Balcerak Jackson (2016) argues that imagination involves simulating other possible perspectives and experiences while supposition involves merely accepting a proposition while reasoning through its implications. Jonathan Weinberg and Aaron Meskin (2006) argue that, while there is no necessary functional characteristic that distinguishes imagination from supposition, there are certain clusters of properties characteristic of each that allow us to distinguish them as mental activities.

Others are skeptical that there are genuine discontinuities between imagination and supposition. Gregory Currie and Ian Ravenscroft (2002) argue that supposition is a kind of belief-like attitude imagining, albeit one that differs from most instances of attitude imagining in that it remains isolated from desire-like imaginings. Peter Langland-Hassan (2020) subsumes supposition under his account of attitude imagining, arguing that there is little introspective reason to think the two are different in kind. Bence Nanay (2023) argues that what philosophers call “propositional imaginings” are really just suppositions elaborated through the use of mental imagery, thus blurring any sharp theoretical distinction between supposition and imagination.

Arcangeli (2019) finds some middle ground: she argues that supposition is a type of imagination, but she views it as its own category of imagination distinct from both attitude and imagistic imagining.

2.6 Imagination and Intention

To intend something is, roughly, to plan or decide to bring it about (see the entry on intention). Definitions of imagination often focus in part on the extent to which imagination is under our voluntary control, compared with other mental states such as perception and belief (see, e.g., Arcangeli 2019). One aspect of this control is that what we imagine seems to be largely fixed by our intentions about what to imagine. Suppose I intend to imagine Elvis Presley, and that I carry out this intention by forming a mental image of someone who looks exactly like Elvis. What determines the fact that I have imagined Elvis himself, as opposed to imagining a very convincing impersonator or wax replica? A natural answer is that I imagined Elvis simply because that is who I intended to imagine.

Based on such intuitions, philosophers of imagination have claimed that our intentions about what to imagine are sufficient for determining what we imagine—i.e., that when you intend to imagine X and then act on that intention, you cannot fail to imagine X. This view, which Daniel Munro and Margot Strohminger (2021) dub intentionalism, traces back at least to Ludwig Wittgenstein, who claims:

Forming an image can also be compared to creating a picture in this way—namely, I am not imagining whoever is like my image; no, I am imagining whoever it is I mean to imagine (1980, §115).

Following Wittgenstein, formulations of intentionalism often focus specifically on imagistic imaginings (or mental images generally). Many contemporary philosophers endorse intentionalism, often simply taking it as an intuitive starting point rather than giving substantive arguments for it (Balcerak Jackson 2018; Dorsch 2012; Fodor 1975; Kind 2019; Langland-Hassan 2016; McGinn 2004; Noordhof 2002).

Against this orthodoxy, Munro and Strohminger (2021) argue that intentionalism is subject to counterexamples in which the causal history of a mental image, not an imaginer’s intentions, determines imagined content. Some accept these as legitimate counterexamples (Carbonell 2024; Goldwasser 2024), while others argue for alternative interpretations (Langland-Hassan 2024a; 2024b).

3. Roles of Imagination

Much of the contemporary discussion of imagination has centered around particular roles that imagination is purported to play in domains of human psychology and activity. Amongst the most widely-discussed are the roles of imagination in understanding other minds (section 3.1), in pretense (section 3.2), in engaging with the arts (section 3.3), in creativity (section 3.4), in acquiring knowledge (section 3.5), and in various psychological phenomena that seem difficult to classify as either belief or imagination (section 3.6).

The topics covered in this section are far from exhaustive. For additional relevant topics, see the entries on metaphor, empathy, and transformative experience.

3.1 Mindreading

Mindreading is the activity of attributing mental states to oneself and to others, and of predicting and explaining behavior on the basis of those attributions. Discussions of mindreading in the 1990s were often framed as debates between two families of views. Theory theory views hold that the attribution of mental states to another person (the “target”) is guided by the application of some (tacit) folk psychological theory that allows one to make predictions and offer explanations of the target’s beliefs and behaviors (see entry on folk psychology as a theory). Simulation theory views hold that the attribution of mental states is guided by a process of replicating or emulating the target’s mental states within one’s own mind (classic formulations of simulation theory include Goldman 1989; Gordon 1986; Heal 1986; see entry on folk psychology as mental simulation). (Influential collections of papers on this debate include Carruthers & Smith (eds.) 1996; Davies & Stone (eds.) 1995a, 1995b.)

On pure versions of theory theory views, imagination plays no special role in the attribution of mental states to others. Conversely, traditional versions of simulation theory typically describe simulation using expressions such as “imaginatively putting oneself in the other’s place.” How this metaphor is understood depends on the specific account (see Dokic & Proust (eds.) 2002 for a collection of papers exploring various versions of simulation theory). On many accounts (e.g., Goldman 1989), simulation involves imaginatively running mental processes “off-line” that are directly analogous to those being run “on-line” by the target. For example, a target that is deciding whether to eat sushi for lunch is running their decision-making processes “on-line”; and a subject that is simulating the target’s decision-making is running the analogous processes “off-line”—in part, by imaginatively simulating or recreating the relevant mental states of the target.

Though classic simulationist accounts have tended to assume that the simulation process is at least in-principle accessible to consciousness, a number of more recent accounts appeal to neuroscientific evidence suggesting that at least some simulative processes take place completely unconsciously. On such accounts, no special role is played by conscious imagination (Goldman 2009; Saxe 2009).

Many contemporary views of mindreading are hybrid theories, according to which both theorizing and simulation play a role in the understanding of others’ mental states. Alvin Goldman (2006), for example, argues that while mindreading is primarily the product of simulation, theorizing plays a role in certain cases as well. Many recent discussions have endorsed hybrid views of this sort (see Carruthers 2003; Nichols & Stich 2003).

A number of philosophers have also suggested that the mechanisms underlying subjects’ capacity to engage in mindreading also enable engagement in pretense behavior (Currie & Ravenscroft 2002; Goldman 2006; Nichols & Stich 2003; for an overview, see Carruthers 2009.) According to such accounts, engaging in pretense involves imaginatively taking up perspectives other than one’s own, and the ability to do so skillfully may rely on—and contribute to—one’s ability to understand alternate perspectives.

3.2 Pretense

Pretending is an activity that occurs during diverse circumstances, such as when children play games of make-believe, when criminals deceive, and when thespians act (Langland-Hassan 2014). Although “imagination” and “pretense” have been used interchangeably (Ryle 1949), this section uses “imagination” to refer to a state of mind (e.g., imagining that one is at a tea party) and “pretense” to refer to actions in the world (e.g., the act of setting out a plastic tea set during a make-believe tea party).

There are two main families of views about the nature of the mental states involved in pretense (see Liao & Gendler 2011 for an overview). Metarepresentational theories hold that engaging in pretense requires the innate mental-state concept pretend (Baron-Cohen, Leslie, & Frith 1985; Friedman 2013; Friedman & Leslie 2007; Leslie 1987, 1994). For such theories, to pretend is to represent one’s own representations under this concept. Behaviorist theories hold that engaging in pretend play requires a process of “behaving-as-if,” as when children pretending to be at a tea party behave as if they are at a tea party (Harris 1994, 2000; Harris & Kavanaugh 1993; Jarrold et al. 1994; Lillard & Flavell 1992; Nichols & Stich 2003; Perner 1991; Rakoczy, Tomasello, & Striano 2004; Stich & Tarzia 2015). Different behaviorist theories explicate behaving-as-if in different ways, but all aim to provide an account of pretense without recourse to a mental-state concept of pretense. These two, competing families of theories seek to explain both the performance of pretense and our ability to recognize others as pretending, often by focusing on evidence about childhood pretense from developmental psychology (see Lillard 2001 for an early overview).

This debate has implications for the role of imagination in pretense. Behaviorist theories generally tend to invoke imagination to explain pretense performance; metarepresentational theories do not (although the mental-state concept pretend posited by metarepresentational theories arguably serves similar functions; see Nichols & Stich 2000). On some behaviorist theories, imagination is essential for guiding behaviors during pretense (Velleman 2000; Gendler 2007; Van Leeuwen 2011; Picciuto & Carruthers 2016; Stich & Tarzia 2015). Others loosen this connection, arguing that, while imagination can be (and often is) involved in guiding pretense behavior, it need not be (Currie & Ravenscroft 2002; Adair & Carruthers 2023). Theories differ as to exactly what kind of imagination they have in mind, such as whether they mean to focus on imagistic forms of imagination or on attitude imagining more broadly (see Adair & Carruthers 2023 for discussion of this point).

Peter Langland-Hassan (2012, 2014, 2020) has developed a theory that aims to explain pretense behavior and recognition without appeal to either metarepresentation or imagination. Langland-Hassan argues that pretense behaviors can be adequately explained by beliefs, desires, and intentions. While he does not deny that pretense is in some sense an imaginative activity (see the description of his reductive account of imagination in section 1.2), he argues that we do not need to posit a sui generis component of the mind to account for it.

3.3 Engagement with the Arts

The most prominent contemporary theory of imagination’s role in engagement with the arts is presented in Kendall Walton’s Mimesis as Make-Believe (1990). Although Walton uses “fictions” as a technical term to refer to artworks, his conception of the arts is broad enough to include both high-brow and low-brow; popular and obscure; and a variety of specific arts such as literature, poetry, paintings, and videogames. Walton’s core idea is that engagement with the arts is fundamentally similar to children’s games of make-believe. When one engages with an artwork, one uses it as a prop in a make-believe game. As props, artworks generate prescriptions for imaginings. These prescriptions also determine the representational contents of artworks (that is, what is true in a fictional world). To correctly engage with an artwork, then, is to imagine the representational contents it prescribes. While Walton (1990) took prescriptions to imagine to be sufficient for fictionality, he argues in later work that they are merely necessary but not sufficient (Walton 2015; see also Chasid 2020).

Walton’s (1990) account understands “imagination” broadly, in a way that can be either imagistic or non-imagistic. Many subsequent discussions have followed him in this (see, e.g., Kim 2025; Stock 2013). Stacie Friend (2021) argues that Walton’s account is best construed in terms of a particular, immersive kind of imagining she calls imagining a storyworld. Recent discussions of Walton-style frameworks have continued to explore what the connection between imagination and fiction can tell us about the nature of fictional truths, as well as its implications for the limits on what sorts of contents can be true within works of fiction (Friend 2011, 2017; Kim 2025; Xhignesse 2021). Friend (2008) argues that this sort of account can be extended even to many works of nonfiction that invite imaginings, and therefore that it cannot be used to distinguish fiction from nonfiction.

Out of all the arts, it is the engagement with narratives that philosophers have explored most closely in conjunction with imagination (see Stock 2013 for an overview; see also the papers in Nichols (ed.) 2006). Gregory Currie (1990) offers an influential account of imagination and fictional narratives, and Peter Lamarque and Stein Haugom Olsen (1996) discuss literature specifically. Many accounts either incorporate or respond to the Waltonian idea that narratives prescribe imaginings. For example, Kathleen Stock (2017) argues that a specific kind of propositional imagination is essential for engagement with narrative fiction. In dissent, Derek Matravers (2014) argues that, contra Walton, imagination is not essential.

Philosophers have also articulated connections between imagination and engagement with music (see the entry on philosophy of music; see also Trivedi 2011). Some focus on commonalities between engagement with narratives and engagement with music. For example, even though Walton (1990, 1994, 1999) acknowledges that fictional worlds of music are much more indeterminate than fictional worlds of narratives, he maintains that the same kind of imagining used in experiencing narratives is also used in experiencing various elements of music, such as imagining continuity between movements and imagining feeling musical tension. Similarly, Andrew Kania (2015) argues that experiencing musical space and movement is imaginative like our experience of fictional narratives. Jerrold Levinson (1996) draws parallels between engaging with music and imaginatively engaging with other minds (section 3.1), arguing that the best explanation of musical expressiveness requires listeners to imagine a persona expressing emotions through the music. Scruton (1997) argues that musical experience is informed by spatial concepts applied metaphorically, and that imaginative perception is therefore necessary for musical understanding (but see Budd 2003 for a criticism; see also De Clercq 2007 and Kania 2015). Stephen Davies (2005, 2011) and Peter Kivy (2002) notably criticize imaginative accounts of engagement with music on empirical and theoretical grounds.

Other imaginative accounts of engagement with specific arts can be found in the entries on philosophy of film and philosophy of dance. See also discussions of imagination in the entries on the aesthetics of the everyday and environmental aesthetics.

Philosophers have also considered how imaginative engagement with works of art can play a role in moral persuasion. Plato famously warned against the power of poetry to morally corrupt its audience (Republic X; see the entry on Plato on rhetoric and poetry). Conversely, contemporary philosophers tend to focus more on the prospect of moral education (see, e.g., Carroll 2002; Currie 1995; Jacobson 1996; Kieran 1996; Murdoch 1970; Nussbaum 1990; Robinson 2005). This includes attempts to unpack the psychological processes involved when merely imaginative representations change one's moral perspective on the real world. Martha Nussbaum (1990), for example, maintains that one of the central moral skills is the ability to discern morally salient features of one’s situation. This skill, she contends, is one that must be developed, and one to which the engagement with literature might effectively contribute, by providing “close and careful interpretative descriptions” of imagined scenarios that enable emotional involvement untainted by distorting self-interest (see also Carroll 2000; Gendler 2000, 2006; Hakemulder 2000; Liao 2013).

Finally, philosophers have sought to further clarify the role of imagination in engagement with the arts by focusing on a number of apparent puzzles and paradoxes in the vicinity. For discussion of several of these, see the entries on imaginative resistance, emotional responses to fiction, and the paradox of tragedy.

3.4 Creativity

While the precise characterization of creativity remains controversial, contemporary philosophers generally agree that some processes count as creative (see Gaut & Kieran (eds.) 2018; Paul & Kaufman (eds.) 2014; and the entry on creativity). Paradigmatic examples of creative processes are those involved in producing valuable works of art. Philosophers also consider creative processes in other domains, including “science, craft, business, technology, organizational life and everyday activities” (Gaut 2010, 1034; see also Stokes 2011). A scientist, for example, might employ a creative process to design a thought experiment or generate an innovative, novel theory (Murphy forthcoming).

Historically, imagination has often been thought to play a central role in creative processes. Immanuel Kant (Critique of Pure Reason) argued that, when imagination aims at the aesthetic, it is allowed to engage in free play that goes beyond one’s current knowledge or understanding. The unconstrained imagination can thereby take raw materials and produce outputs that transcend concepts that one possesses. Michael Polanyi (1966) gives imagination a central role in the creative endeavor of scientific discovery, by refining and narrowing the solution space to open-ended scientific problems (see Stokes 2016, 252–256).

Contemporary philosophers have continued exploring the role of imagination in creativity (for an overview, see Kind & Langkau (eds.) forthcoming). Peter Carruthers (2002) argues that the same cognitive resources, including imagination, underlie children’s pretend play and adults’ creative thinking, hypothesizing that the former developed as precursors to, and practice for, the latter. Berys Gaut (2003) and Dustin Stokes (2014) argue that two characteristic features of imagination—its lack of aim at truth and its dissociation from guiding action—make it especially suitable for facilitating creative processes. Amy Kind (2022b) builds on this by emphasizing the imagination’s power for combining ideas in novel ways.

Kant took imagination to be constitutive of creativity: what makes a creative process creative is the involvement of imagination aiming at the aesthetic. Most contemporary philosophers see the connection between imagination and creativity as weaker: while they agree that imagination is often involved in creative processes, and even that it may be uniquely well-suited to facilitating creativity, they do not see it as a necessary component of creativity (for views along these lines, see Beaney 2005; Gaut 2003; Kind 2022b; Kind & Langkau forthcoming; Langkau 2025; Langland-Hassan 2020; Stokes 2014, 2016; for arguments that imagination really is a necessary part of creativity, see Hills & Bird 2019; Arcangeli 2022).

Philosophers also disagree about the type of imagination involved in creative processes. Gregory Currie and Ian Ravenscroft (2002) sharply distinguish recreative imagination, which is involved in activities such as pretense and mindreading, from creative imagination, or the capacity to combine ideas in novel or unexpected ways (though they argue that the two categories overlap). Others object that creative imagining is not a distinct type of imagination, preferring to view it as a distinct use to which other kinds of imagination can be put (Arcangeli 2022; Kind & Langkau forthcoming). Gaut (2003) argues that imagistic imagining is especially well-suited for artistic creativity while non-imagistic attitude imagining is better suited for finding creative solutions to intellectual problems. Julia Langkau (2025) argues that creative imagination is a distinct use of imagistic imagining that involves intentionally manipulating and combining contents represented in imagination, where this manipulation is guided by attention to the subjective value of experiences being imagined.

3.5 Knowledge

Can imagination be a source of knowledge, or at least a source of justification for beliefs? This question has been considered with respect to various domains of knowledge, including modal, scientific, and empirical. It has received increased attention in recent years (marked by two significant collections: Badura & Kind 2021; Kind & Kung 2016). Optimists contend that imaginings can yield justification and knowledge, while pessimists disagree.

First, consider the acquisition of metaphysical modal knowledge, or knowledge about necessity and possibility. Many philosophical arguments take for granted that what we can imagine is (to at least some extent) a good guide to what is possible (for overviews, see the entry on epistemology of modality, sec. 4; Kung 2016; and Strohminger & Yli-Vakkuri 2017). For example, René Descartes (Meditations on First Philosophy) argued from the fact that he could conceive of his mind and body as existing apart from each other to the conclusion that they really are distinct (see entry on Descartes’ modal metaphysics). Various modal arguments in contemporary philosophy rely on the assumption of a fallible and defeasible connection between what can be imagined and what is possible.

Pessimists—notably Peter Van Inwagen (1998, 70)—doubt that imagination can give us an accurate understanding of scenarios that are “remote from the practical business of everyday life,” such as those called upon in philosophical modal arguments (see also Hawke 2011). Optimists believe that imagination can do so, though they grant that modal errors occur when the connection between imaginability and possibility is imperfect (Chalmers 2002; Ichikawa 2016; Kripke 1972 [1980]; Williamson 2007, 2016; Yablo 1993). In recent years, this debate has been refined with respect to different types of imaginings. Dominic Gregory (2004, 2010) and Peter Kung (2010) are pessimists about non-imagistic propositional imaginings but optimists about imagistic imaginings, arguing that imaginings with mental imagery can be sufficiently constrained to function as a reliable or rational guide to metaphysical possibility (see also Peacocke 1985). Similarly, Magdalena Balcerak Jackson (2018) argues that a careful use of recreative imagination can give indirect insight into metaphysical possibility by simulating possible experiences. In contrast, Derek Lam (2018, 2021) argues that imagistic and non-imagistic imagination are epistemically on par, but that there are in fact reasons to be optimistic about both.

Second, consider imagination’s role in the acquisition of scientific knowledge. Scientific theorizing regularly calls on thought experiments (see the entry on thought experiments). For example, Galileo (On Motion) offered a thought experiment that disproved Aristotle’s theory of motion, which predicts that heavier objects fall more quickly (see also Brown 1991; Gendler 1998, 2004; Strohminger 2021). Galileo asked people to imagine the falling of a composite of a light and heavy object versus the falling of the heavy object alone. When one runs the thought experiment—that is, when one elaborates on the starting point of this imaginary scenario—one notices an incoherence in Aristotle’s theory: on the one hand, it should predict that the composite would fall more slowly because the light object would slow down the heavy object; on the other hand, it should also predict that the composite would fall more quickly because the composite is heavier than the heavy object alone.

In recent years, the focus on imagination’s role in science has moved from thought experiments to models, including “fictionalist” accounts inspired by Kendall Walton’s (1990) theory of make-believe (see entry on models in science; Frigg 2023; Levy 2012, 2015; Murphy 2022: sec. 2; Salis 2021; Toon 2015). While the relationship between thought experiments and models remains contested, they have been treated similarly when it comes to debates over optimism versus pessimism about imagination’s epistemic value (see the papers collected in Levy & Godfrey-Smith 2020). Philosophers have connected both thought experiments and models to mental imagery (Gooding 1992; Levy 2015; Miščević 1992). Optimists have argued that the imagistic nature of these imaginings explains how thought experiments and models can provide justification (Gendler 2004; Nersessian 1992, 2007); pessimists dismiss this mental imagery as mere picturesque illustration (Norton 2004; Weisberg 2013). Other optimists link the epistemic value of thought experiments and models to non-imagistic imagining (Arcangeli 2010, 2021), while pluralists argue that scientific knowledge arises from different types of imagination (French 2020; Murphy 2020).

Third, consider imagination’s role in the acquisition of empirical knowledge, or knowledge of contingent matters of fact, as opposed to knowledge of what is merely possible. We seem to use imagination this way in daily life—for example, you might use imagistic imagination when considering whether an old couch would fit in a new apartment. At the same time, imagination is often thought of as totally “free,” in the sense that the contents we imagine are up to us, are often insensitive to the way things are in reality, and can depart from reality in highly fantastical ways (unlike, e.g., perception, which is epistemically useful because what we perceive is directly sensitive to how things are in the world around us). This gives rise to what Amy Kind and Peter Kung (2016b) call the puzzle of imaginative use: the puzzle of how to reconcile transcendent uses of imagination, which enable one to escape from or look beyond the world as it is, and instructive uses of imagination, which enable one to learn about the world as it is.

On Kind and Kung’s (2016b) highly influential resolution of the puzzle, the same cognitive faculty can be put to such disparate uses because instructive uses involve imposing more constraints on imagination, while transcendent uses are comparatively unconstrained. For example, instructively imagining trying to fit a couch in an apartment arguably requires constraining what one imagines, as well as the way one’s imagining unfolds over time, using information from intuitive physics, about the size and shape of the couch and apartment, and the like. More generally, Kind (2016c, 2018) proposes two types of constraints that need to be satisfied: the imaginings capture the world as it is (the reality constraint), and imaginings of changes to the world are guided by logical consequences of that change (the change constraint).

Optimists have taken up the task of specifying exactly what such constraints are. Some characterize them as structure-based: the constraints are part of our built in psychological architecture (Langland-Hassan 2016; Miyazono & Tooming 2024; Williamson 2007, 2016). Others characterize them as content-based: the constraints are imposed by the content of other mental states, such as beliefs and prior experiences (Kind 2016c, 2018; Myers 2021a, 2021b). Most optimists focus specifically on imagistic imagining under constraints (Balcerak Jackson 2016, 2018; Dorsch 2016; Kind 2016c, 2018; Miyazono & Tooming 2024; Myers 2021a, 2021b; Williams 2021), though a few also discuss propositional imagining (Badura 2021; Langland-Hassan 2016; Williamson 2007, 2016). Moreover, there are subtle differences amongst optimist positions: while some focus on showing that imagining under constraints can preserve justification (such as Myers 2021a, 2021b), others focus on showing that imagining under constraints can generate new justification (such as Miyazono & Tooming 2024). See also Spaulding’s (2016) more qualified optimistic view, according to which, while imagination itself cannot provide justification, it can still play an epistemic role in generating new ideas that other cognitive processes must evaluate.

Pessimists raise different worries for different approaches to specifying constraints. For example, while many optimists appeal to intuitive physics as an example of structure-based constraints on imaginative simulations, Ori Kinberg and Arnon Levy (2023) point out that the biases and errors inherent to intuitive physics make it a poor guarantor for the reliability of such imaginings. For another example, Christopher Gauker (2024) poses a dilemma for optimists who appeal to content-based constraints: either such constraints are deterministic of imaginings, in which case they would not be able to handle the simulation of non-closed systems; or they are not, in which case they would be too permissive to guarantee realistic imaginings. Finally, Michael Stuart (2020) is skeptical of constraint-based accounts in general, arguing that they do not leave room for scientific knowledge that comes from breaking constraints.

3.6 Imagination and Belief: Borderline Cases

Section 2.1 covered the similarities and differences between belief and attitude imagining. Many grant that the two are similar in representational format and the inferential relations that hold between them, while distinguishing them by appealing to each state’s distinctive norms and/or functional profiles. Philosophers of imagination have attempted to apply their preferred accounts of the distinction to analyze psychological phenomena that seem difficult to straightforwardly classify as either belief or imagination. This includes delusions, implicit biases, religious beliefs, and conspiracy theories.

Delusions can be characterized as belief-like mental representations that manifest an unusual degree of disconnectedness from reality (Bortolotti & Miyazono 2015). For example, those suffering from Capgras delusion take their friends and family to have been replaced by imposters, and those suffering from Cotard delusion take themselves to be dead. One approach to delusions characterizes them as beliefs that are dysfunctional in their content or formation (see Coltheart & Davies (eds.) 2000). However, another approach characterizes them as dysfunctions of imagination. Gregory Currie and Ian Ravenscroft (2002) argue that delusions are imaginings that are misidentified by the subject as being beliefs, as the result of an inability to keep track of the sources of one’s thoughts. Tamar Szabó Gendler (2007) argues that, in delusions, imaginings come to play a role in one’s cognitive architecture similar to that typically played by beliefs. Andy Egan (2008) likewise argues that the mental states involved in delusions are both belief-like (in their connection to behaviors and inferences) and imagination-like (in their circumscription); however, he argues that these functional similarities suggest the need to posit an in-between attitude called “bimagination”. For more on this topic, see the entry on delusion.

Implicit biases are, roughly, stereotypes or prejudices that influence our behavior in ways that are involuntary, outside of our awareness, and/or in conflict with our explicit beliefs and values. They have been invoked to explain, among other things, subtly prejudiced behaviors that contradict explicit, professed values—for example, someone genuinely committed to gender equality may nevertheless rate female job candidates as weaker than males without realizing it. Philosophers and psychologists continue to disagree about how to more precisely define this notion, and even over whether implicit biases really exist (see the entry on implicit bias). Some philosophers have proposed that we view implicit biases as imaginings (Sullivan-Bissett 2019, 2024; Welpingus 2020; see also Nanay’s 2021b mental imagery account). For example, Ema Sullivan-Bissett (2019) argues that implicit biases are unconscious imaginings triggered by stimuli (e.g., seeing a woman might trigger a there is a woman imagining, which then triggers an additional imagining that women are weak). She defends her account in part by appealing to considerations about what distinguishes imagination from belief.

It is natural to assume that the cognitive attitudes we ordinarily refer to as religious “beliefs” involve simply taking something to be true—for example, that God exists, that Jesus rose from the dead, or that the Qur’an is the literal word of God. Recently, philosophers have debated whether religious “beliefs” are something more like attitude imaginings (for an overview, see Ichino forthcoming-a). Those who defend this view appeal primarily to functional differences between imagination and belief (Ichino 2024; Van Leeuwen 2014b, 2023). For example, while what we imagine is to a large extent under our voluntary control and subject to our intentions about what to imagine, beliefs are generally not under voluntary control and are constrained by what evidence we possess (Currie & Ravenscroft 2002, sec. 1.3). Philosophers defending the “make-believe” view of religion point to the way people describe religious “beliefs” as consciously chosen, and thus as under voluntary control (for relevant empirical work, see Luhrmann 2012, 2020). Van Leeuwen (2023) also argues that, much as imaginings only guide actions for the duration of episodes of pretense or pretend play, religious commitments guide actions only in temporary, highly specific contexts—for example, religious people often truly act as if God is real only on Sundays and during other sacred times. The make-believe view of religion continues to generate discussion and debate (Boudry & Coyne 2016; De Cruz 2024; Levy 2017, 2024a; Van Leeuwen 2025).

It is also at first natural to assume that conspiracy theorists simply believe their theories—for example, that the moon landing was faked, that the scientific establishment is covering up the flat Earth, or that vaccines secretly contain microchips. However, philosophers have also recently defended make-believe views of conspiracy theorizing (for overviews, see Ichino forthcoming-b; Munro forthcoming). According to these views, a large proportion of (if not most) conspiracy theorists treat their theorizing as akin to telling fictional stories (Ganapini 2022; Ichino 2022; Munro & Rini 2025), playing games of make-believe (Levy 2022, 2024b), or fantasizing (Munro 2024). Proponents again appeal to functional differences between imagination and belief. For example: there is empirical evidence that conspiracy theorists are guided not by evidence but by a desire to be special (Imhoff & Lambert 2017) or by the entertainment value of conspiracy theories (van Prooijen et al. 2022). Conspiracy theorists’ attitudes also do not seem to guide action the way beliefs do—for example, there is no reliable correlation between endorsing conspiracy theories that recommend extreme or violent actions and actually committing those actions (Uscinski et al. 2022).

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aesthetics: environmental | aesthetics of the everyday | Arabic and Islamic Philosophy, disciplines in: psychology and philosophy of mind | Aristotle, General Topics: psychology | belief | bias, implicit | causation: counterfactual theories of | Collingwood, Robin George: aesthetics | conditionals | creativity | dance, philosophy of | delusion | desire | dreams and dreaming | dualism | emotion | empathy | fiction | film, philosophy of | folk psychology: as a theory | folk psychology: as mental simulation | functionalism | Hobbes, Thomas | Hume, David | Hume, David: aesthetics | imaginative resistance | intention | Kant, Immanuel | Kant, Immanuel: aesthetics and teleology | memory | mental imagery | metaphor | modality: epistemology of | models in science | music, philosophy of | perception: epistemological problems of | perception: the contents of | propositional attitude reports | Ryle, Gilbert | Sartre, Jean-Paul | thought experiments | transformative experience

Acknowledgments

As of the January 2026 update, Daniel Munro has taken over responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry. No one can have encyclopedic knowledge on a topic as vast as imagination. Previous versions of the entry could not have existed without the help of Paul Bloom, Elisabeth Camp, David Chalmers, Gregory Currie, Felipe De Brigard, Tyler Doggett, Jonathan Jenkins Ichikawa, Anna Ichino, Andrew Kania, Amy Kind, Peter Langland-Hassan, Aaron Meskin, Kengo Miyazono, Shaun Nichols, Aaron Norby, Eric Peterson, Mark Phelan, Dustin Stokes, Margot Strohminger, Mike Stuart, Zoltán Gendler Szabó, Neil Van Leeuwen, Jonathan Weinberg, Nick Wiltsher, Ed Zalta, and several anonymous referees. The current iteration owes much to Olivia Bailey, Alon Chasid, Peter Langland-Hassan, Anna Ichino, Amy Kind, Derek Lam, Alice Murphy, Joshua Myers, Evan Thompson, Neil Van Leeuwen, I-jan Wang, and Nick Wiltsher.