Supplement to Jury Theorems

Long descriptions for some figures in Jury Theorems

Figure 1 description

Figure 1 plots collective competence (majority correctness probability) as a function of group size, for four different levels of individual competence, given by \(p=.505\), \(p=.51\), \(p=.55\), and \(p=.6\), respectively. For readability, the plot is divided into two diagrams, the first covering a range of (odd) group size from 1–199 and the second covering the large range from 201–9999. The four curves are growing and approach 1 at different speed of convergence. To the left, the curves start at the collective competence level for \(n=1\), which matches the individual competence level, that is: .505, .51, .55 and .6, respectively. The higher individual competence \(p\) is, the faster the convergence to 1. For instance, group competence exceeds \(.8\) from (odd) group size \(n=7083\) if \(p=.505\), from \(n=1771\) if \(p=.51\), from \( n=71\) if \(p=.55\), and already from \(n=17\) if \(p=.6\). To the right, at \(n=9999\), the curves for \(p=.55\) and \(p=.6\) have progressed in their convergence to an extent that they are visually indistinguishable from the upper bound of 1. The curve for \(p=.51\) is at about .977, the curve for \(p=.505\) at about .841.

Figure 2 description

Figure 2 plots an example of a discrete competence distribution that tends to exceed 0.5, with “Competence” from 0 to 1 on the x-axis and “Probability” from 0 to 0.4 on the y-axis. The (x,y) points of the distribution are (0, .01); (.125, .025); (.25, .05); (.375, .0875); (.5, .15); (.625, .375); (.75, .18); (.875, .1); (1, .0225). For visibility, some bars are added to the plot. For each of the nine points there is a vertical bar from the x-axis to the point. Each bar whose x-value is below .5 by some amount \(\epsilon\) is paired by a horizontal line with the bar whose x-value exceeds .5 by this amount \(\epsilon\). These horizontal lines are blue and dotted. For any two vertical bars paired by a horizontal line, the right one is higher, reflecting Tendency to Competence. The difference in height for each pair of bars is indicated by a blue vertical arrow next to the higher bar, pointing up. The arrow starts at the probability reached by the left bar and ends at the probability reached by the corresponding right bar.

Figure 3 description

Figure 3 compares 4 different examples of distributions of competence. It has four subfigures from left to right, labelled a, b1, b2, and c. Each subfigure carries a title. Title of a: “Fixed Competence in UC”. Title of b1: “Competence distribution across facts in CC: facts as states”. Title of b2: “Competence distribution across facts in CC: richer facts”. Title of c: “Competence distribution across facts in TC”. Each subfigure has “Competence” from 0 to 1 on the x-axis and “Probability” from 0 to 1 on the y-axis. As in Figure 2, the (discrete) distribution of competence on each subfigure is represented by vertical bars going from the x-axis to some probability level. Subfigure a has one bar, representing competence .7 with probability 1. Subfigure b1 has two bars, representing competence .6 with probability .6 and competence .8 with probability .4. Subfigure b2 has four bars, with (competence, probability) pairs (.6, .18), (.7, .25), (.8, .3), (.9, .2), (1, .07). In these first three subfigures, all bars are to the right, so that only competence levels above .5 have positive probability. Finally, subfigure c displays a probability distribution with competence values scattered across the whole interval [0,1]. The distribution tends to exceed 0.5. The (competence, probability) pairs are (0, .01), (.1, .03), (.2, .04), (.3, .06), (.4, .09), (.5, .15), (.6, .17), (.7, .16), (.8, .13), (.9, .09), (1, .07).

Figure 4 description

Figure 4 contains two subfigures. Subfigure (a) is called “Sources pre-deliberation” and is to the left. Subfigure (b) is called “Shared sources post-deliberation” and is to the right. Each subfigure shows a causal network with a top and a bottom layer of nodes. The two networks have the same nodes, but the network on the right has more arrows, i.e., more causal effects. At the top layer are two nodes: “source 1” and “source 2”. At the bottom layer are three nodes: \(\mathbf{v_1}\), \(\mathbf{v_2}\), and \(\mathbf{v_3}\). The network in (a) has black arrows from source 1 to \(\mathbf{v_1}\) and \(\mathbf{v_2}\) and from source 2 to \(\mathbf{v_2}\) and \(\mathbf{v_3}\). The network in (b) has the same black arrows as in (a), but has two further arrows in blue: one from source 1 to \(\mathbf{v_3}\) and one from source 2 to \(\mathbf{v_1}\). The blue arrows are created by deliberation.

Figure 5 description

Figure 5 contains three subfigures from left to right, labelled a, b and c. Title of a: “Fixed competence: Deliberation achieves UC”. Title of b: “Competence distribution across facts: Deliberation achieves CC”. Title of c: “Competence distribution across facts: Deliberation achieves TC”. Each subfigure has “Competence” from 0 to 1 on the x-axis and “Probability” from 0 to 1 on the y-axis. Each subfigure displays a pre-deliberation competence distribution and a post-deliberation competence distribution, represented by vertical bars as in previous figures. The pre-deliberation bars are grey, the post-deliberation bars are black. In each subfigure, the post-deliberation distribution is shifted to the right compared to the pre-deliberation distribution, reflecting competence improvement through deliberation. In each subfigure, the upward shift of the competence distribution is symbolized by an arrow pointing to the right, labelled “Deliberation”. In subfigure a, the single grey bar is at competence .4 and probability 1 while the single black bar is at competence .8 and probability 1. In subfigure b, the (competence, probability) pairs with grey bars are (0, .1), (.2, .2), (.4, .4), (.6, .15), (.8, .1), (1, .05), while the pairs with black bars are (.6, .3), (.8, .5), (1, .2), indicating that deliberation has eliminated all competence levels below .5. In subfigure c, the pairs with grey bars are (0, .1), (.2, .2), (.4, .4), (.6, .15), (.8, .1), (1, .05), while those with black bars are (0, .05), (.2, .1), (.4, .15), (.6, .4), (.8, .2), (1, .1). Here, the post-deliberation distribution tends to exceed .5, whereas the pre-deliberation distribution does not.

Copyright © 2021 by
Franz Dietrich <fd@franzdietrich.net>
Kai Spiekermann <k.spiekermann@lse.ac.uk>

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