Joseph Kaspi

First published Tue Jun 6, 2006; substantive revision Mon Apr 10, 2023

Harry A. Wolfson once described medieval philosophy as one “which placed itself at the service of Scriptures” (Philo, II, p. 439). From a formal aspect, a new genre was created: “From now on, a new form of exposition appears in philosophic literature, the homily on some scriptural text, or the running commentary upon some scriptural books” (p. 444). Joseph ibn Kaspi perfectly illustrates this characterization of the medieval philosopher. He wrote some thirty works dedicated to explaining the Bible, in which philosophy served as a method and a compendium of philosophical conclusions, which the biblical author wanted to convey to the reader. Some of Kaspi’s works were devoted to logic and linguistics as methods suitable for biblical exegesis; others were commentaries on books of the Bible, or super-commentaries and he also wrote on theological subjects. Of this vast work, only some has been published; much remains in manuscript form, and some has apparently been lost.

1. Life

Recent studies have shed light on Kaspi’s life such as his place of birth and the dates of his death and marriage. We can distinguish three periods in Kaspi’s life:

1. Kaspi’s birth until his return from Egypt. Joseph b. Abba Mari ibn Kaspi was born circa 1280 in Arles in Provence (or in Argentière, in the Languedoc region). In 1314, he traveled to Egypt in 1314 for five months:

Twenty years ago, I was exiled to a place reputed for learning… I crossed to Egypt, where I visited the College of that renowned and perfect sage, the Guide [=Maimonides]. I found there the fourth and fifth generations of his holy seed, all righteous, but none devoted to science. In all the Orient there were no scholars… (Sefer HaMussar p.98)

As we see, his expectations—of delving into Maimonidean thought through learning from Rabbi Abraham the Nagid—were not met. However, his exegesis was enriched by the things he saw on the journey.

We do not know of independent books by Kaspi from this period. He wrote a supercommentary on Ibn Ezra’s commentary on the Bible, and a commentary on Sefer HaRikma by Ibn Janah.

2. Kaspi’s second Provençal period (1314–1330), where he chiefly first in Arles, then in Tarascon. During this period, Kaspi apparently married and his two children, David, the eldest and Shlomo (1320), were born. In Arles Kaspi completed his philosophical work Tirat Kesef (1317), which was harshly criticized by the scholars of Salon through Kalonymus (1318).

3. The Spanish period in Kaspi’s life: 1330–1345. In 1330, Kaspi moved from Tarascon to Spain, living with his family for several years in Perpignan (from 1336), followed by Barcelona, Majorca, Valencia and Tudela. We know that Kaspi died in Majorca in 1345 but now how he lived there. It seems that he traveled there to be alone and write, though this is uncertain. In the Spanish period Kaspi wrote many books, including three books on logic and linguistics: Ẓeror HaKesef, a brief summary of parts of the Organon for his son; Retuqot Kesef, an application of the rules of logic to Hebrew and Hebrew grammar; Sharshot Kesef, a Hebrew dictionary. These three books are among the most original and essential of Kaspi’s work, and none of them has been printed. Kaspi was well educated. Besides Hebrew and Provençal, he was apparently also proficient in Arabic and Latin. He was familiar with the classical Hebrew religious literature, such as the Talmud and earlier Bible commentaries, and well-versed in the works of Maimonides and his translator, Samuel ibn Tibbon. He was probably also familiar with Falaquera’s commentary on The Guide of the Perplexed. However, his knowledge of Halakhic literature was limited by his own admission. Among the philosophers, he mentions Averroes, Avicenna, Boethius, al-Fārābi, and Galen, in addition to Plato and Aristotle.

2. Exegesis

Kaspi considered himself primarily a commentator. He distinguishes between a “commentary” (perush) and an independent work (ḥibbur), declaring, “I do not define a work as a ‘commentary’ unless it brings us to the real intention of the author of the book” (Commentary on the Song of Songs, p. 184). Nevertheless, he sometimes admits his inability to prove that his interpretation represents the author’s real meaning, particularly when that “author” is the biblical one, i.e., God, Himself:

I do not assert that the intention of its Giver [= of the Torah] was those same purposes that I have assumed, for perhaps those were not intended, but he combined them with other intentions, presently hidden from us… For the same thing may have many purposes that do not necessarily contradict one another… Nevertheless what I say…, whether I prophesy their author’s intentions or not, what I say is true, that we have learned such and such a matter from the subject of the narratives (Tirat Kesef, p. 64).

Understanding the author’s intention is thus seen as a kind of prophecy (“whether I prophesy the intention…”). Kaspi’s interpretative truth, he insists, is concerned not with the author and his intention, but with the reader and his or her understanding: The commentator can speak for himself alone. Such exegesis is subjective, dependent on each of the work’s innumerable readers. Nevertheless, Kaspi is sometimes reasonably sure of the author’s meaning:

I have revealed to you what the Lord revealed to us of His secrets, for I think that we have thereby arrived in this chapter at the author’s intention; “the truth,” as Aristotle says, “is its own witness, agreeing in every aspect.” The meaning of “agreeing in every aspect” is in what he explained, saying, “that one aspect thereof attests to [another] aspect…”… Now our own Sages of blessed memory have already said, “words of truth are recognizable” [Babylonian Talmud, Sotah 9b] (Tirat Kesef, p. 83).

Here, Kaspi boldly implies that God somehow informed him of the secret hidden in the text. The criterion of his certainty is coherence. However, given Kaspi’s own theology (see below), he was not claiming to have received a supernatural revelation. Despite what some consider to be a radical adherence to Aristotelian philosophy, Kaspi had a conservative outlook on everything concerning the written word of the Bible and the way it is read. He maintained that the written word, or its reading, has not changed since the early sages of the Second Temple period . The way in which Jews write the Torah scroll is the same as in the original version. The square-like Assyrian lettering, known from the Torah scrolls of today, was the same as that given to Moses at Sinai. Even the division into the five books, including the weekly portions, were all present from the early sages of the Second Temple period. Kaspi differentiated between the early sages of the Second Temple period (who held traditions received from Moses, and therefore reflect the intent of the writer of the Torah), and later sages, the Tanna’im and Amora’im of rabbinic writings, whose interpretations of the biblical narrative may be disputed if they disagree with the plain interpretation of the Bible.

3. Logic

Two definitions emerge for the role of Logic after looking at Kaspi’s comments:

  1. Logic determines the correctness of our beliefs. It is not a matter of psychological rules, but of regulative rules that serve as a marker and a guide to the correct way of thinking.
  2. Logic determines the proper use of the language. This is not a matter of conventional rules that result from the structure of a certain language, but of the rules of a universal syntax that applies to all languages. The delineation of the work of logic is nothing more than a match between “external” and “internal” speech (Sharshot Kesef, p. 1), a commonplace in his philosophical antecedents.

Kaspi accused his predecessors of misunderstanding Scripture because they had not used logic:

The truth has evaded some of the commentators in this, and other matters, in many places, for they are ignorant of the science of logic, and even if some of them do know it, they do not remember its foundations when they comment (Commentary on Esther, p. 32).

As noted above, Kaspi himself, wrote a brief compendium on logic (Ẓeror ha-Kesef) in which he summarized what he believed were important principles for a correct interpretation of Scripture. He omitted discussion of dialectic, rhetoric, and poetics, which he considered irrelevant to his task. His exegesis applies various techniques: categorizing genera and species, distinguishing between essential and non-essential qualities, asserting the symmetry of relation, understanding the law of contradiction, and recognizing valid and invalid syllogisms, in addition to logical fallacies. For example, he criticizes commentators who conclude from the truth of a proposition that its parts are also true. To illustrate this, he cites the verse “There was no man to till the soil” (Genesis 2:5). This verse does not imply that there were no human beings at the time, a proposition at variance with the Aristotelian thesis (to which Kaspi apparently subscribed) that the world has always existed alongside God.

4. Logic and the Hebrew language

Kaspi was deeply concerned with the status of the Hebrew language. While agreeing with Aristotle that languages are conventional rather than natural, he places Hebrew on a higher level, arguing that its combinations of letters into words are not accidental. A Hebrew word denotes the qualities of the object designated, and there is a one-to-one relation between words and their designata. According to Kaspi, Hebrew is the ideal language because its nouns attest to their characteristics, whether essential or incidental. Man is called adam in Hebrew because he originates [partly] from the earth (Hebrew: adama); ish because he originates partly from fire (Hebrew: esh) and enosh because of his worthless and expendable nature (the Hebrew root a-n-sh, claims Kaspi, designates destruction and loss; Retuqot Kesef, p. 44).

Generalization is another critical principle derived from logic in Kaspi’s conception of language. Logic rests partly on the division between the general and the specific. Genus is defined as the most general and comprehensive set of all. A species constitutes a subset of a genus with a specific difference, but its particulars also possess non-essential properties. According to this principle, claims Kaspi, a speaker is not obligated to reveal all particulars in his choice of words. He thereby blurs boundaries in both language morphology (such as differences in gender, number and time) and syntax. Kaspi maintains that the grammatical means a speaker adopts to express these differences constitute superfluous information. Consequently, nothing is peculiar about a text that uses the male instead of the female gender and so on. “It is not obligatory to insist on gender consistency. A masculine name may well be accompanied by a feminine adjective or verb and vice versa. We have been fortunate to find textual gender consistency in a few places, but we should not find it unusual if it is lacking in others” (Retuqot Kesef, p. 15). In a similar vein, Kaspi writes about texts that use the singular instead of the plural, past tense instead of the future, or texts that lack the concept of a sentence or other syntactic structures.

5. Philosophical principles in lexicographic methodology

In Kaspi’s view, all Hebrew words are distinct; Hebrew has no absolute synonyms or homonyms. In support of this view, he wrote a kind of dictionary of the roots of biblical Hebrew (Sharshot Kesef. The dictionary is based on two main assumptions:

  1. There are no real homonyms. Kaspi determines the principle of the common denominator a priori, an economic principle of logic according to which the root has a chief meaning that includes all words derived from the same root. In some cases, however, he was forced to adapt the data to conform to the principle. Thus, for example, the root l-ch-m denotes “opposition and resistance,” and from it are derived the Hebrew words for “war” (milchamah) and “bread” (lechem). He explains the use of this root for “bread” in light of Aristotle’s proposition in On the Soul 416 that “Food is… the contrary of what is fed.” Kaspi expresses amazement that anyone should disagree with this principle: “For how could a person think that the creators of the language, who were great scholars, could have used one noun… for things so unrelated” (Sharshot Kesef, ed. Last, p. 29).
  2. There are no absolute synonyms. Kaspi, who claims that Hebrew has no absolute synonyms for words, worked hard to differentiate among synonyms throughout his dictionary.

Generally speaking, contemporary linguistics discerns two key types of meaning differentiation: (a) between word designata, in which each synonym is designated differently: quantitatively—rekhev vs. mekhonith (motor vehicle vs. automobile); qualitatively—shikor vs. mevusam (inebriated vs. tipsy); (b) among registers or layers of language (layish vs. aryeh/lion).

Kaspi also insists on an additional type of differentiation among synonyms, maintaining that there is but one designatum and even the designates do not differ. Differences among words are embodied in the aspects of the designatum that they emphasize. For example, Kaspi explains that the words ḥerev, sakkin, maakheleth and shelaḥ (javelin) are not synonymous because each designates a different aspect of the object. Kaspi maintains, that all these objects are cutting instruments: knives. One is called ḥerev because it attests to the destruction (ḥurban) of those struck by it; a sakkin designates the stricken victim as subject to danger and then severed from living creatures (according to Kaspi’s interpretation of the root samekh-kaf-nun). The instructive word maakhelet informs us that the stricken one is slaughtered, consumed (neekhal), terminated and so on. The words ḥerev, sakkin, maakhelet, and shelaḥ thus designate the same type of tool, a cutting instrument. Different words indicate and describe different phenomena concerning the designatum, but these are not synonyms.

Another significant difference between dictionaries produced before and up to Kaspi’s time and Sharshoth Kesef is the order of discussion of lexical forms. Ibn Janaḥ and Radaq, who preceded Kaspi, begin by presenting the forms of the verbs derived from a given Biblical root, followed by the noun forms. Unlike earlier lexicographers of Hebrew and Arabic, Kaspi composed a dictionary in which the nouns derived from the root were described first and the relevant verb form system was only shown afterward. This change in order is by no means coincidental. In Retuqot Kesef, Section 40, Kaspi analyzes the structure of the Hebrew language. First, its founders agreed on the general meaning of each root. Then they coined an abstract name designating its meaning that is not connected to any particular object or occurrence. Subsequently, they coined the verb’s infinitive, thereby creating the reality to which the noun refers. The infinitive is an abstract noun expressing an occurrence. Subsequently, they formed adjectives that are concretely connected with specific objects. After completing the nouns, they invented a system that addresses tangible activity and occurrences. In other words, Kaspi maintains that the formation of nouns and the various weights accorded to them proceed from the most abstract to the most tangible. As the verb system is the most tangible of all, it was devised last.

6. Theology and anthropology

Kaspi bases his biblical exegesis on the conventional theological assumptions of the Aristotelian philosophy prevalent among the Jews in fourteenth century Southern France. of his times. God is a necessary existent, the unmoved mover, the intellect that intellectually cognizes itself. Kaspi’s description of God as the intellect borders on a certain conception of divine immanence:

For we are our intellect in actu, we bring God into our minds, for the intellect is God and God is the intellect… For that reason, Moses was called “a Man of God” because God was always in his mind… I mean to say, “divine power,” and there is no difference if one says “God” or “God’s power,” since that same power is the intellect and God is the intellect (Maskiyot Kesef, p. 98).

Kaspi proposes another radical doctrine in connection with the Aristotelian conception of God as the intellect, that which intellects, and the intellectum: he compares this conception with the Holy Trinity of Christian theology. He is even willing to accept a moderate interpretation of the Trinity: “Some individuals among them (the Christians) are similar to us (in opinions)” (Gevia‘ ha-Kesef, p. 27).

Kaspi explains the relationship between God and the world in as naturalistic a manner as possible. He agrees with the position attributed to Aristotle and Plato, that the world was not created ex nihilo at a certain point in time, arguing that this was also Maimonides’ position. In that spirit, Kaspi himself proposes a systematic explanation of the creation as described in Genesis.

Kaspi also understand God’s continual providence of the world in entirely naturalistic terms. He interprets biblical miracles as rare but natural phenomena—an idea not dissimilar to Spinoza’s teachings. To say that a certain phenomenon is contrary to natural law, Kaspi writes, is a subjective judgment, “for there is no doubt that those ignorant of natural science believe many natural things to be miraculous, not natural phenomena” (Tirat Kesef, p. 12). This may be compared with Spinoza in his Tractatus Theologico-Politicus (Chap. 6): “[S]ince miracles were wrought according to the understanding of the masses, who are wholly ignorant of the workings of nature… we cannot doubt that the causes of many things, narrated in Scripture as miracles could easily be explained by reference to established workings of nature.” Kaspi also holds that a wise prophet is capable of performing miracles thanks to the possession of extensive knowledge. Moses, the wisest of men, performed miracles in Egypt because “he had acquired knowledge of the celestial body… because he had captured the world of the [four sublunar] elements” (Menorat Kesef, p. 93). This knowledge enabled him to inflict the plagues upon the Egyptians: “With the four [elements] Moses performed actions that would be impossible for any [other] wise man” (Commentary on Proverbs B, p. 127).

Discussing the relationship between the prophet and the wise man, Kaspi agrees with the Muslim thinker al-Baṭalyūsī that a person with a prophetic soul is superior in level and essence to a wise man with a philosophical soul. Nevertheless, prophecy is not a super-rational phenomenon. A prophet’s knowledge of the future is based on deductive inference, since he or she is well acquainted with the world and all details of natural causality.

The ability of God and the prophets to foresee the future, despite the apparent contradiction with the principle of (free) choice, also receives a rational explanation. Kaspi proposes an analogy between their positive knowledge and the knowledge of wise men “with a good sense of evaluation and estimation,” who are capable of foreseeing the probable behavior of a person based on their knowledge of his or her character. Like most medieval theologians, Kaspi accepts the concurrent validity of an omniscient God and human free choice.

Not unrelated to this antinomy is the theological problem posed by the human capacity for voluntary action. Maimonides stated the difficulty as follows: “How is it possible that a person can do whatever he pleases?… How can anything be done in the world without the permission and will of its Creator?” (Hilkhot Teshuvah 5:4). Maimonides’ solution was to define human choice as one expression of the divine will, which is the cause of everything that takes place in the world; accordingly, God “desired man to have his own free will” (ibid.). Kaspi goes further, however, suggesting the radical view that God is “the remote mover,” even when a person chooses to realize his free will by sinning and worshiping idols; it was in that sense that the Bible described God as hardening Pharaoh’s heart (Matsref la-Kesef, pp. 152–153).

Kaspi provides his readers with guidelines for a virtuous life. As a rationalist through and through, he recommends that a person acquire the best possible education. Every effort should be made to accumulate the financial resources necessary to improve one’s education, by purchasing books and hiring teachers. Every man should set up a family: His wife will support him, and his children will keep him in his old age, “so that he should have time to acquire wisdom… Moreover, his sons, if they are good, will join him in his studies, all the more so if his eyes have become dimmed with age” (Commentary on Proverbs, pp. 59–60). This is a wholly utilitarian and egoistical philosophy, recommending the self-realization of every human being. Kaspi enunciates these guidelines in the context of his scriptural exegesis, relying primarily on the literature of wisdom written, according to Jewish tradition, by King Solomon, the wisest of men. He also derives his rules from biblical stories, citing their heroes’ behavior.

Kaspi’s elitist principles, which create a disparity between the wise and the masses, also imply a similarity between humans and other creatures One application of this thesis may be found in his commentary on Isaiah 41:14, referring to the phrase “worm of Jacob”:

For we are of the genus of the animals, similar to that of the lowest of the creeping insects. We are also their equal in every respect, unless we realize the potential of our intellect. All that is… so that we should be aroused to acquire intelligence and the intelligibles, for in them we differ from the worms… (Adnei Kesef, p. 151).

In this context, Kaspi expressed compassion for animals, a tendency toward vegetarianism and a profound disapproval of sacrifices. He even expresses disapproval of Abraham’s willingness to sacrifice his son.

6. Conclusion

If medieval philosophy from Philo to Spinoza may be understood as being at the service of biblical exegesis, Joseph ibn Kaspi may certainly be viewed as one of its most successful representatives. As already mentioned, he also anticipated some of Spinoza’s controversial ideas in some contexts. In addition, both Kaspi and Spinoza held that only man is capable of loving God, whereas God does not love man (Kaspi, Commentary on Isaiah, p. 151; Spinoza, Ethics, On the Ability of the Intellect, Theorem 17).

Despite his brilliance and original thought, Kaspi has never been considered one of the most important medieval Jewish thinkers or commentators. Only in the 19th century were some of his works published for the first time, and others have yet to see the light of day. There are several possible explanations for this. Perhaps his controversial ideas weighed against his acceptance in the surrounding society. Another explanation is implied by comparing Kaspi and his more famous contemporary, Gersonides, a biblical exegete and philosopher. Gersonides, despite his non-conservative ideas, earned considerable fame among Jewish and non-Jewish thinkers. This was primarily thanks to his systematic, profound, philosophical work Milḥamot Adonay, which placed him squarely in the realm of philosophy, while his Bible commentaries were written mostly in the spirit of plain interpretation, although there is much philosophy, as well. Kaspi, however, was something of a philosopher among commentators and a commentator among philosophers; perhaps that was why he never attained prominence in either group. Kaspi’s writings on logic and Hebrew linguistics were indeed highly creative and innovative, but he appeared to have lacked good fortune as far as publication is concerned.

Bibliography

Kaspi’s works

  • Adnei Kesef or Sefer ha-Mashal, Commentary on the Prophetic books, ed. I. H. Last, pt. I, London 1911; pt. II, London 1912. The text is also being published anew in Mikra’ot Gedolot ‘Haketer’, ed. Menachem Hacohen, Jerusalem 1992 ff.
  • Amudei Kesef, Exoteric commentary on The Guide of the perplexed, in: Amudei Kesef u-Maskiyot Kesef, ed. S. A. Werbloner, Frankfurt a/M 1848.
  • Commentaries on the book of Job (two versions), in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. I, Presburg 1903.
  • Commentaries on the book of Proverbs (two versions), in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. I, Presburg 1903.
  • Commentary on Ibn Janach’s Sefer ha-Rikmah, lost.
  • Commentary on Maimonides’ Milot ha-Higayon, ed. H. Kasher and C. Manekin, “The Commentary of Joseph ibn Kaspi to the ‘Logical Terms’ of Maimonides”, in Tarbiz, 78:3 (2009), pp. 383–398.
  • Commentary on the Song of Songs, in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. I, Presburg 1903.
  • Gelilei Kesef, Commentary on the book of Esther, in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. II, Presburg 1903.
  • Gevia‘ ha-Kesef, Treatise on esoteric topics in the book of Genesis, with English translation, ed. B. E. Herring, New York 1982.
  • Ḥagorat Kesef, Commentary on the books of Ezra, Nehemiah, and Chronicles, in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. II, Presburg 1903.
  • Ḥatsotserot Kesef, Commentary on the book of Ecclesiastes, in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. I, Presburg 1903.
  • Kapot Kesef, Commentaries on the books of Ruth and Lamentations, in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. II, Presburg 1903.
  • Ke‘arot Kesef, Commentary on the book of Daniel, lost.
  • Kesef Sigim, 110 questions on the Bible, lost.
  • Kevutsat Kesef (two versions): Version A, in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. I, Presburg 1903; Version B, in E. Renan, Les écrivains juifs français du XIVe siècle, Paris 1983, pp. 131–201.
  • Kipurei Kesef, Critique of earlier Bible commentaries, lost.
  • Maskiyot Kesef, Esoteric commentary on The Guide of the Perplexed, in: Amudei Kesef u-Maskiyot Kesef, ed. S. A. Werbloner, Frankfurt a/M 1848.
  • Menorat Kesef, in: Asarah Kelei Kesef, ed. I. H. Last, vol. II, Presburg 1903.
  • Mazmerot Kesef, Commentary on the book of Psalms, lost.
  • Matsref la-Kesef, Systematic commentary on the Torah, ed. I. H. Last, Krakow 1906.
  • Mitot Kesef, Treatise on the intentions of the Bible, lost.
  • Mizrak la-Kesef, Treatise on Creation, lost.
  • Parashat Kesef, Supercommentary on Ibn Ezra, unpublished, Ms. Vatican 151.
  • Retukot Kesef, Principles of linguistics, Ms. Rome-Angelica 60.
  • Sharshot Kesef, Dictionary of Hebrew roots, Ms. Rome-Angelica. Part published by I. H. Last, JQR 1907, pp. 651–687.
  • Shulchan Kesef, Five exegetical and theological essays, ed. H. Kasher, Jerusalem 1996.
  • Tam ha-Kesef, Eight theological essays, ed. I. H. Last, London 1913.
  • Terumat Kesef, Brief treatise on ethics and politics, Ms. Wien 161. Part published by E. Z. Berman, The Hebrew Versions of the Fourth Book of Averro‘s’ Middle Commentary on the Nicomedean Ethics, Jerusalem 1981 (Hebrew).
  • Tirat Kesef or Sefer ha-Sod, Brief commentary on the Torah, ed. I. H. Last, Presburg 1905.
  • Yoreh De‘ah, Ethical treatise, with English translation, in: I. Abrahams (ed.), Hebrew Ethical wills, Philadelphia 1926, vol. I, pp. 127–161.
  • Ẓeror ha-Kesef, Brief treatise on logic, unpublished, Ms. Vatican 183 and 27 other mss. Section on fallacies edited by S. Rosenberg in Iyyun 32 (1984), pp. 275–295.

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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

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Hannah Kasher <kasheh@mail.biu.ac.il>
Moshe Kahan <moshe.kahan@mail.huji.ac.il>

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