Korean Buddhism

First published Thu Sep 5, 2024

Buddhism was introduced to the Korean Peninsula from China in the 3rd century during the Korean Three Kingdoms period. It first arrived in Koguryŏ, a kingdom on the northern end of the peninsula, in 372 CE and then in Paekche, a kingdom on the southwest of the peninsula, in 384 CE. It arrived in Shilla, a kingdom on the southeast of the peninsula, in 521 CE by way of Koguryŏ. The influence of Chinese Buddhism on Korean Buddhism cannot be treated lightly because Korea imported mostly sinologized Buddhism, not Indian Buddhism. However, Korea added its own color and historical and social context.

Throughout history, Buddhism has significantly influenced the worldview of the Korean people, instilling concepts such as karma and the interconnectedness of all things. Korean Buddhist philosophers place an emphasis on cultivating the power of the mind, underpinning their teachings with the belief that the mind of every individual is inherently the Buddha’s mind. Nevertheless, their narratives vary when addressing the dynamic tension between aristocratic and populist Buddhism, the quest for personal enlightenment versus the salvation of others, and the dichotomy of doctrinal study and meditation practice.

1. First Buddhist Teachings Introduced to Korea

When Buddhism reached the Korean Peninsula, it encountered a spiritual landscape dominated by indigenous shamanic religions and Confucian ethics. The first major Buddhist teachings introduced in Korea were the theory of Karma and the political ideas of Buddhism (Ko: 30–37). These core concepts resonated with the Korean people, leading Buddhism to soon supplant the previous spiritual systems.

1.1 The Theory of Karma

Karma, an idea originating from Indian thought, is a cause-and-effect principle explaining the workings of the world and human life. It is a universal law that even deities cannot escape. The term Karma translates into several Chinese words, each representing different connotations of Karma in Buddhism. These are “Comeuppance” (yinguoyingbao, 因果應報), “Karma” (ye, 業), and “Karmic retribution” (yebao, 業報). Yinguoyingbao represents the principle that good deeds earn rewards and bad deeds earn punishments. Ye implies that every thought, word, and action in human behavior yields a result, signaling a Buddhist reinterpretation of Karma. Yebao refers to human behavior and its results; typically the outcomes people experience in this life due to actions in their past lives.

The theory of Karma taught Korean people to recognize the connections between actions and their consequences. Before the advent of Buddhism, people generally believed that all events were the result of unpredictable natural forces, and that nothing was within their control. However, Buddhism introduced the concept of individuals’ roles and influence in the world, portraying them as active agents capable of significantly impacting their surroundings, rather than passive entities entirely subject to natural laws. This understanding of Karma became deeply embedded in the worldview of the Korean people.

Additionally, the theory of Karma introduced the concept of transmigration. Before the arrival of Buddhism, it was commonly believed that the realms of the living and the dead were distinct and physically separated. Beings from one realm could exert spiritual influence over the other, especially among family members. Ancestors’ spirits were thought to be able to help or harm their descendants in the world of the living, and descendants were believed to be capable of aiding their ancestors in resting peacefully in the realm of the dead. When a person dies, the spirit permanently departs the world of the living, with no rebirth. However, Buddhism introduced the idea of past and future lives through the process of rebirth, proposing that individuals are continuously reborn into circumstances determined by their past lives. The concept of Karma provided the Korean people with a logical explanation for ethical behavior.

1.2 Political Ideas of Buddhism

The ruling class embraced Buddhism because it provided advanced knowledge and ideas to fortify kingship. Specifically, during Shilla’s transition from tribal coalitions to a centralized kingdom, King Chinhŭng leveraged the concept of Chakravarti to reinforce his kingship. Chakravarti is the title of an ideal king in Buddhism, ruling by truth rather than force. This term implies a king who turns the wheel of truth, symbolizing limitless governing power. The king’s vast governing power is depicted through the rolling wheel on his castle. His right to rule, earned through good Karma in a past life, is indestructible. Under his reign, peace and justice are assured for all. For instance, if he were to go to war, he would achieve a bloodless victory as the enemy would surrender upon seeing the aura of the wheel leading the army.

The Chakravarti concept supported the appointment of a king over a tribal coalition to ensure stability. Furthermore, the people equated a king with Maitreya, the world’s savior Buddha. Buddhism was perceived as more rational and potent than indigenous belief systems, enabling Buddhist kings to make shamans and political rivals submit more easily. Such political thoughts significantly strengthened kingship and centralized governments in the three kingdoms.

2. The Flourishing of Buddhist Philosophy

Upon Buddhism’s advent in Korea, it was perceived as a progressive ideological system and swiftly adopted by the Korean populace. This adoption led to a more widespread belief in Buddhism and deepened the study of Buddhist scriptures. In particular, the scriptures from the Mādhyamaka, Yogācāra, and precepts schools gained significant traction. Numerous theoretical schools such as Sanlun, Shelun, Yogācāra, and Niepan were explored extensively (Huh 2005: 7). While Sanlun was a major stream in Koguryŏ, and Baekche, the Yogācāra School was the primary Buddhist school in Shilla (Ko 1989:138). However, towards the late Unified Shilla period (780–935CE), Huayan (K. Hwaŏm) School eventually became the most influential branch of Korean Buddhism.

2.1 The impact of the Yogācāra School

The Yogācāra School, a major philosophical branch of Mahāyāna Buddhism, proposes that all beings are simply manifestations of consciousness. It investigates the workings of human consciousness, the nature of human afflictions, and the transformation of tainted consciousness to an untainted original form. According to Yogācāra teachings, human consciousness exists at eight levels: the first five correspond to the senses, the sixth to the mind, the seventh to self-consciousness that creates the belief of self from stored consciousness, and the eighth to the storehouse consciousness storing the seeds of karma. Yogācāra practice aims to purify all consciousness levels, transforming deluded consciousness into wisdom.

In China, the Dilun School and the Shelun School are the primary schools that focus on Yogācāra scriptures. The former studies Treaties on Ten Buddhist Principles (Ch. Shidijinglun, 十地經論; Skt. Daśabhūmikasūtram) and the Flower Garland sūtra, later developing into the Huayan School. The Shelun School derives teachings from the Discourse on the Perfection of Consciousness-Only (Ch. Shedachenglun, 攝大乘論; Skt. Mahāyānasaṃgraha). Zendi (眞諦, 499–569 CE), a key translator and scholar in the Shelun School, introduced the concept of a ninth pure consciousness, a belief rooted in the Buddha nature theory. He thought that the tainted eighth consciousness and the purified consciousness were essentially different, so they should be separately named.

A Shilla monk Wŏnkwang (圓光, 542–640 CE) studied Shelun philosophy in China before teaching it in Shilla. His teachings emphasized the pure Buddha mind, urging followers of Mahāyāna teachings to primarily practice faith and understanding of the one real realm, their true mind, characterized by purity, non-obstruction, and permanence. This one real realm is referred to as the womb of Buddha (Ch. Rulaicang, 如來藏; Skt. Tathāgatagarbha) or the ninth consciousness.

After Xunzang (602–664 CE) introduced translations of new Yogācāra scriptures from India, Korean monks wanted to learn this new teaching from him. Shilla monk Wŏnchŭk (圓測, 613–696 CE), who studied in China, tried to reconcile both Xunzang’s and Zendi’s Yogācāra teachings. Differently from Zendi, Xunzang did not posit the ninth consciousness, leading to different paths to salvation in their teachings. According to Zendi, all beings will achieve Buddhahood due to the innate Buddha nature, but Xunzang made no such guarantee. While rooted in Xunzang’s teaching of only eight consciousnesses, Wŏnchŭk incorporated the concept of pure consciousness, situating it within the eighth consciousness rather than outside it. This view suggests the eighth consciousness is not entirely tainted as it does contain pure elements. Despite being a follower of the new Yogācāra doctrines, Wŏnchŭk provided all sentient beings with the opportunity to achieve Buddhahood.

Renowned monks from Shilla, such as Ŭisang (義湘, 625–702 CE) and Wŏnhyo (元曉, 617–686 CE), studied the teachings of the Yogācāra School. These monks even sought to travel to China to learn from the famous monk Xuanzang. Wŏnhyo’s story of enlightenment, which occurred en route to China, illustrates the significant impact Yogācāra teachings had on him. When Ŭisang and Wŏnhyo reached a harbor to embark on their journey to China, they were caught in a sudden downpour and sought refuge in a small cave. During the night, Wŏnhyo woke up feeling extremely thirsty. In the darkness, he found a bowl of water nearby, drank from it, and felt a sense of satisfaction. However, come daylight, he realized he had drunk fetid water from a skull, which caused him to vomit. This experience led Wŏnhyo to question why the same water had tasted satisfactory at night but made him sick in the morning when he realized its true nature. He concluded that the water was the same, but his mind had distinguished it as clean at night and dirty in the morning. This realization—that everything is a creation of the mind—prompted him to stay in Shilla, having experienced the essential teaching of Yogācāra from Xunzang.

2.2 Hwaŏm Philosophy

The philosophy of Hwaŏm, which finds its roots in the Flower Garland Sūtra, underwent diverse interpretations by Korean monks Ŭisang and Wŏnhyo. Ŭisang, who studied in China, focused his efforts on Hwaŏm philosophy itself and established the Korean Hwaŏm school. Through dedicated practice, he aspired to achieve a state of non-discriminating cognition, enabling him to grasp the profound teachings of the Flower Garland sūtra (Ch’oe Y. 2015: 15–16). On the other hand, Wŏnhyo approached Hwaŏm philosophy from the perspective of the Awakening of Mahāyāna Faith, acknowledging its inclusive nature that harmonizes all Buddhist teachings without contradictions. This perspective led him to develop his own unique philosophy. Despite their different approaches, both Ŭisang and Wŏnhyo recognized the core Hwaŏm concepts of “dependent arising of the universe” (Fajieyuanqi, 法界緣起) and “dependent arising from original nature” (Xingqi, 性起).

2.2.1 Dependent arising of the universe

The principle of “Dependent Arising of the Universe” outlines the essential nature of all existence. While the theory of dependent arising initially explained only the relationships among individual entities, the Hwaŏm School expanded this concept to illustrate the relationship between the universe as a whole and its individual parts. The school proposed that every individual being constitutes a fragment of the universe, and reciprocally, the universe permeates every individual entity. This profound doctrine is often encapsulated by the phrase, “one is all, and all is one”. Ŭisang saw equality in this teaching and strived to embody this sense of equality and harmony within his own community, despite the strictly stratified social structure of Shilla society at the time. Notably, he offered equal opportunities to his students, irrespective of their social class. In both interpretations, it is essential for each individual to recognize and respect the interconnected nature of all beings.

Modern Korean scholars interpret “one is all, and all is one” in two ways (Kim 1990: 216–218). In the 1970s, historians suggested this concept was used to bolster the kingship of the Shilla king. They saw the relationship between the king and his subjects as analogous to the interconnectedness of the one and all individual beings. In contrast, from the 1980s onward, Buddhist scholars began interpreting this concept as an expression of the inherent equality of all beings. They reasoned that the relationship between the one and all inherently implies equality; this equilibrium can only be sustained when all elements within the relationship are balanced, which in turn requires that each being be considered equal. Both groups also concurred that the principle of dependent arising of the universe played a significant role in unifying people. This core Hwaŏm philosophy has profoundly influenced the Korean mindset, instilling the belief in the interconnected and interdependent nature of existence.

2.2.2 Dependent arising from original nature

The theory of dependent arising from original nature posits that all phenomena arise from the original nature, often referred to as Buddha nature. This Buddha nature is concealed within the human mind, yet it often goes unrecognized due to human ignorance and delusion. This philosophy is encapsulated in a phrase from the Flower Garland Sūtra, “All originates from the mind. The mind is the world’s painter”. This belief—that the human mind holds the Buddha mind, and that this mind can shape the world—became a fundamental concept in Korean Buddhism.

Ŭisang underscored this idea and emphasized spiritual practices to aid individuals in recovering the original nature. He composed a remarkable poem called the “Seal-Diagram Symbolizing the Dharma Realm of the One-Vehicle of the Avataṃsaka” (Hwaŏmilsŭngpŏpkyeto, 華嚴一乘法界圖) which encapsulated the essential teachings of the Hwaŏm School. This exceptional poem took on a distinctive shape, consisting of precisely 210 words intricately arranged in a maze-like form, symbolizing a mandala. This distinctive shape bestowed an esoteric and magical quality upon the words, enhancing their impact.

Within the poem, Ŭisang depicted the world from the enlightened perspective, encouraging readers to diligently practice to attain enlightenment. It began by describing the entirety and tranquility of the untainted original nature, and then explored how the world arises interdependently from this very nature. When the mind attains its original nature, it ceases to discriminate between beings, transcends dualistic thoughts, relinquishes attachment to a self, and allows everything to flow following the laws of dependent arising.

The enlightened being who has fully realized the original nature perceives connections even among opposites, comprehends the entirety of the cosmos in a mustard seed, and recognizes boundless time in a single moment. Ŭisang concluded his poem by stating,

Finally, seated on the throne of the Middle Way, Ultimate Reality, From times long past he has not moved-hence his name is Buddha. (McBride 2012a, 105)

The theory of dependent arising from original nature emphasizes that all beings are manifestations of Buddha and have the potential to attain Buddhahood.

2.3 Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna and the One Mind

The Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna, one of the most influential Buddhist scriptures in East Asia, had a significant impact on Wŏnhyo’s philosophy of One Mind. This scripture expounds on the concept of the Tathāgatagarbha, aiming to reconcile the perspectives of the Mādhyamaka and the Yogācāra schools. The primary difference between these schools lies in their explanations of the nature of beings. All three teachings concur that beings exist temporarily as a result of causes and conditions, and none can be deemed to exist independently. The Mādhyamaka school posits that the nature of all beings is emptiness, implying their lack of inherent permanence. On the other hand, the Yogācāra school argues that all beings manifest through their storehouse consciousness, known as the eighth consciousness. However, the Tathāgatagarbha philosophy proposes that all beings possess the seed of the Buddha within them. This teaching later developed into the theory of Buddha nature.

The Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna introduces the concept of the One Mind (Ch. yixin; K. ilsim, 一心) as a unifying framework for discussions on the human mind. According to this scripture, the One Mind encompasses all terminologies that describe the original nature and is equated with the mind of sentient beings. It is explained through two aspects and three greatnesses (sanda, 三大). The One Mind embodies the aspects of suchness, aligning with the Mādhyamaka School’s understanding of the original nature as emptiness. It also encompasses the aspect of arising and ceasing, reflecting the manifestation of the storehouse consciousness through causes and conditions, in line with the Yogācāra School’s understanding of the original nature. The three greatnesses represent its essence, attributes, and function. This comprehensive understanding of the One Mind provides a holistic perspective on the nature of mind within the context of Mahāyāna Buddhism.

Using the insights gained from the Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna, Wŏnhyo was able to answer his three central questions that arose from studying Xunzang’s Yogācāra teachings: Can every being achieve enlightenment? Between the Mādhyamaka School and the Yogācāra School, which holds more accuracy? Is the One Mind a vessel of purity, impurity, or a composite of both? In response to the first question, Wŏnhyo maintained that all beings could achieve enlightenment, given that the One Mind contains the pure Buddha nature, but there could be rare exceptions. Regarding the second question, he considered the teachings of the Mādhyamaka School and the Yogācāra School to be equally valid since the Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna integrates their doctrines. As for the third question, he posited that the One Mind is inherently pure and transcends linguistic definition, although it could provisionally be described as a mixture of the tainted and the untainted.

Wŏnhyo’s responses to these questions led him to establish his One Mind philosophy, a name reflecting the profound depth of the involved concepts. “One” in this context denotes the One Mind’s transcendence over dualism, as it harmonizes all discourses without contradictions. “Mind”, on the other hand, implies that the One Mind possesses an indescribable intelligence (T1844, 206c–207a). All beings originate from and must return to the One Mind, marking it as an intrinsic part of all phenomena. Within this framework, Wŏnhyo systematically organized all terms pertaining to the mind. He categorized the true nature of all beings and the concept of suchness under the aspect of suchness. Similarly, he assigned the Buddha nature, the storehouse consciousness, the ninth pure consciousness, and the Buddha’s womb under the aspect of arising and ceasing (T1845, 227c).

Therefore, in Wŏnhyo’s One Mind philosophy, enlightenment is the act of returning to the One Mind. This can be achieved through the practice of the six paramitas—generosity, discipline, patience, diligence, meditative concentration, and wisdom—or by chanting to Amitābha with faith in the One Mind and the three Buddhist treasures: the Buddha, his teachings, and the Buddhist practitioners. To help more people return to the One Mind, Wŏnhyo suggested a practice of reciting the name of Amitābha, particularly for the illiterate population. He wandered through towns, reciting “Namu Amitabul” (meaning “I take refuge in Amitābha”) while tapping a wooden singing ball. The philosophy of the One Mind acknowledges the coexistence of the pure and impure minds within the One Mind. This insight underlines the human mind’s duality, containing both pure and impure aspects, and highlights the necessity for its cultivation.

Furthermore, Wŏnhyo utilized the One Mind concept as a foundational principle for harmony and reconciliation, from which he developed his unique theory of reconciliation, known as “Hwajaeng”.

2.4 Reconciling Buddhist Doctrines

Reconciling Buddhist doctrines (Hwajaeng, 和諍) is a theory founded by Wŏnhyo that represents a signature aspect of Korean Buddhism. It seeks to harmonize disputes within Buddhist doctrine, using key premises from the Mādhyamaka School and the Lotus sūtra.

The first premise is that all disputes arise from language. From his studies within the Mādhyamaka School, Wŏnhyo recognized the effects and limitations of language. This philosophy discerns two levels of truth: the conventional truth expressed in words, and the ineffable, ultimate truth. Language facilitates understanding, yet it fails to capture things in their entirety. Hence, teachings articulated through language cannot fully convey the complete truth of Buddhism. The second premise posits that all Buddhist schools encapsulate facets of Buddha’s teachings, regardless of the potential limitations of comprehension. This principle is inspired by the famous Lotus sūtra parable of the blind men and the elephant. In this parable, blind men each touch a part of an elephant, leading to varying interpretations of what the creature is. Wŏnhyo related this parable to Buddhist doctrinal disputes, viewing each school as recognizing only part of Buddha’s teachings while insisting that their interpretation was the sole correct one. With these principles as the foundation, Wŏnhyo developed his harmonization theory, known as “hwajaeng”, advocating for non-attachment to any particular doctrine. Free from polarization, he scrutinized each doctrine’s internal validity and legitimacy through a stance of non-obstruction, neither affirming nor denying any. He saw doctrinal disputes from Buddha’s higher perspective, transforming them into diverse facets of a unified body of teaching without any classification.

Interpretations of Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy have evolved over time in the historical context of Korea. The first association of Wŏnhyo’s name with the hwajaeng concept was documented in the writings of Ŭich’ŏn (義天, 1055–1101 CE), who sought to unify Buddhist doctrine and practice during the Koryŏ dynasty. Under Japanese occupation, Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy became associated with Unified Buddhism (Tongbulgyo), a characteristic unique to Korean Buddhism. This Unified Buddhism, perceived as a complete form of Buddhism integrating all Buddhist teachings, was employed to foster pride in Korean Buddhism by positioning it above other regional Buddhist traditions. After the liberation, the meaning of “hwajaeng” in Korea has transitioned from “unification” to “reconciliation,” mirroring the societal shift from an authoritarian to a more pluralistic Korean society. In contemporary times, Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy is suggested as a potential remedy for conflict resolution and social polarization.

2.5 Arrival of Sŏn Buddhism

In the seventh century, Sŏn (Ch. Chan, Jp. Zen) Buddhism was introduced to the Shilla Kingdom. Instead of elaborate rituals and complex doctrines, it offered a simple meditation practice. Chan Buddhism put forward the idea of realizing Buddhahood, which is the attainment of enlightenment. According to Chan Buddhism, all sentient beings possess Buddha nature and have the potential to become a Buddha. Buddha nature is not merely a seed of potential to become a Buddha, but the true mind of all beings. Therefore, Mazu Daoyi (709–788), the eighth patriarch in Chinese Chan, advocated the belief that the “Ordinary mind is the Way” and “This mind is Buddha.”

Mazu Sŏn found favor among the ruling provincial class (hojok) in Shilla since the ninth century (Huh: 2005: 32–33). His teaching has notable similarities with the doctrinal Huayan School, both of which were founded on the Tathāgatagarbha teaching and upheld the purity of the human mind. Mazu Chan emphasized practice and sudden enlightenment, urging practitioners to see all beings as manifestations of Buddha nature and their own minds as the Buddha mind.

3. Buddhism During the Koryŏ Dynasty

Throughout the Koryŏ dynasty, Buddhism assimilated into Korean culture, establishing its place in the people’s everyday lives. It embraced indigenous deity worship and adapted Buddhist rituals, particularly by blending with mountain god worship. Performing rites for life events—such as births, funerals, and ancestor worship—became an integral function of Buddhism. However, despite its crucial role in Korean society, Buddhism lost its dominant status by the end of the Koryŏ dynasty, with Neo-Confucianism emerging as the preferred philosophy.

3.1 Unification of Buddhist teachings

Two prominent monks proposed the way to unify Buddhist teachings, especially between doctrinal school and Sŏn Buddhism. Ŭich’ŏn advocated for the harmony of doctrines and practices and is known for achieving unification from a doctrinal perspective. On the other hand, Chinul advocated for a Sŏn approach to unify practice and Hwaŏm doctrine.

3.1.1 Harmonizing doctrine and practice—Ŭich’ŏn (義天, 1055–1101 CE)

Ŭich’ŏn, who studied Hwaŏm (Ch. Huayan) and Ch’ŏnt’ae (Ch. Tiantai; Jp. Tendai) Buddhism in Korea and China, established the Ch’ŏnt’ae school in Koryŏ. His arguments for harmonization drew from the teachings of Chengguan (738–839 CE), Wŏnhyo, and Zongmi (780–841 CE).

Upon his return from China, Ŭich’ŏn observed that the teachings of Hwaŏm and Ch’ŏnt’ae bore considerable similarities and explored the shared elements between them. Influenced by Chengguan, he proposed that the taxonomies used by both schools were identical (Lee 2002: 153–155). While Tiantai classified Buddhist teachings into five periods and eight teachings, Huayan divided them into five teachings. Tiantai’s classification integrated three standard categorizations. The fifth period is based on the evolving times of teaching. One pair of the four teachings was categorized by teaching method, the other by content type. Chengguan compared Huayan’s five teachings and Tiantai’s four teachings by content type and pointed out that Huayan’s five teachings included an additional one: the sudden enlightenment doctrine. Except for this additional teaching, the classifications used by both schools matched. While Tiantai’s taxonomy did not explicitly include the sudden enlightenment doctrine, as it was already incorporated in its teachings, the Huayan school emphasized Chan practice in its classification. Ŭich’ŏn also linked Hwaŏm’s three contemplations to the taxonomy, arguing that both schools proposed that all phenomena were interconnected, and the entire world could be perceived in all phenomena.

Although Ŭich’ŏn initially advocated for the study of various Buddhist doctrines, he did not imply that all teachings were equally beneficial for study. Later, influenced by Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy, his perspective evolved, and he sought to harmonize all Buddhist teachings and treat them with equal regard. Upon establishing the Ch’ŏnt’ae school, Ŭich’ŏn introduced Wŏnhyo as Korea’s first Ch’ŏnt’ae scholar and extolled him as the master of hwajaeng. He also recognized Chegwan (諦觀, died 970 CE) as the second Ch’ŏnt’ae scholar. A Koryŏ monk who had studied in China, Chegwan wrote an influential introductory book on the Ch’ŏnt’ae school, Essentials of the Four Stages of Teaching of Ch’ŏnt’ae (Ch’ŏnt’ae sagyoŭi, 天台四敎儀), summarizing the core teachings of Ch’ŏnt’ae.

Ŭich’ŏn considered Zongmi as the epitome of reconciling doctrinal teaching and Sŏn practice perfectly. He believed that the Sŏn and doctrinal schools held equal importance and were compatible. While the Sŏn school eschewed language, the doctrinal schools embraced it. These contrasting stances had their respective merits and flaws, rendering them complementary. Furthermore, adopting Zongmi’s perspective, Ŭich’ŏn sought commonalities between Confucianism and Daoism. Despite their differences with Buddhism, he observed that all three philosophies addressed filial piety. Consequently, he sought to harmonize these philosophies under a single system, scrutinizing their shared idea.

3.1.2 Reconciling meditation and doctrine—Chinul (知訥, 1158–1210)

Chinul, one of the most influential Buddhist philosophers in Korea, pursued a reconciliation of meditation and doctrine by identifying their shared ground. He considered meditation, namely Sŏn, and doctrine, specifically Hwaŏm teaching, as two distinct pathways leading to enlightenment.

Chinul’s approach to unifying practice and doctrine was inspired by Zongmi, although he developed his own variations. Zongmi categorized Chan Buddhism and doctrinal Buddhism into three levels each and unified them on each level. In other words, the first level of Chan aligned with the first level of doctrinal school, and so forth. Contrarily, Chinul did not adhere to this three-tiered classification of Sŏn Buddhism. Instead, he categorized Sŏn Buddhism based on whether it discussed sudden enlightenment, resulting in two classification levels. Then, he unified only the practice based on sudden enlightenment and the doctrine of perfect teachings. This was because both incorporated two ways of explaining enlightenment: the negative way and the affirmative way. The negative way outlined the limits of language and thought and revealed the nature of the mind. The affirmative way perceived the mind as the essence of all beings and demonstrated the mind’s role in creating things through dependent origination. While Zongmi used these approaches to explain doctrinal teachings, Chinul employed them to harmonize Sŏn and perfect teaching. Sŏn Buddhism primarily employs the negative way to challenge the boundaries of thought and the positive way to emphasize the potency of the mind’s nature. Perfect teaching, particularly the Xingqi theory in Hwaŏm, elucidated the tranquil nature and its dependent origination of all beings. Essentially, Chinul found that the Xingqi in Hwaŏm teachings aligned with the Sŏn teaching that each individual’s mind is the Buddha’s mind. Based on this discovery, he proposed that doctrinal teaching represented the word of Buddha while meditational teaching embodied the mind of Buddha.

In Koryŏ Buddhism, Buddhist philosophers consistently sought to integrate opposing teachings into a unified understanding of Buddhism. This unification process blurred the lines among Buddhist schools in Korea and, along with the political context of the time, contributed to the gradual unification of Korean Buddhism.

3.2 The Formation of Korean Sŏn Buddhism

During the mid-Koryŏ Dynasty, Chinul introduced a new form of practice called Kanhwa Sŏn, which became the primary practice in Korean Sŏn Buddhism. Considered the founder of the Chogye Order, the most significant Buddhist sect in contemporary Korea, Chinul’s practice embodied several characteristics. Key among these were the concepts of “void and calm, numinous awareness” (K.Kongjŏkyŏngji, 空寂靈知), “sudden enlightenment followed by gradual cultivation”, and the “dual practice of samādhi and prajñāna (K.Chŏnghyessangsu, 定慧雙修)”.

Sŏn Buddhism asserts that Buddha nature represents the true self of all beings, thus advocating for the realization of one’s nature, or in other words, “seeing your true self.” In this context, individuals have a personal self, but beyond that, there exists a real self, identified as suchness or Buddha. The Buddha mind is regarded as one’s nature, therefore all human perceptions and actions can be seen as manifestations of the Buddha nature. This teaching provides hope for universal salvation, but it simultaneously poses a question: why can’t ordinary people perceive the Buddha nature? In his work Secrets on Cultivating the Mind (Susimkyyŏl, 修心訣), Chinul provided an answer: just as we cannot see our own body, we cannot perceive the Buddha nature because we are immersed in it and it resides within us (Chinul SW: 208). This Buddha nature is recognized through “the mind of void and calm, numinous awareness.” The term “void and calm” suggests that the mind is insubstantial and reflects all things, similar to a placid lake. “Numinous awareness” involves self-contemplation, illumination of the Buddha nature, and the ability to respond to the interconnected world. The concept “the mind of void and calm, numinous awareness” corresponds to the subjective aspect of the Buddha mind, while the objective aspect is associated with Buddha nature. While these are not existentially divided, they are conceptually separated in the context of the principle of dependent origination. This pure and authentic mind is also referred to as the “original face” (K. pollae myŏnmok, 本來面目) in the Sŏn tradition. When compared to Zongmi’s concept of “original enlightenment and true mind” (Ch. Benjuezhenxin, 本覺眞心) referring to the pure mind, the terminology used by Chinul offers a more detailed portrayal of the characteristics of the true mind.

The debate between sudden enlightenment and gradual cultivation was a pivotal discussion in Chan Buddhism. Advocates from the Southern Chan school argued for sudden enlightenment, claiming that this immediate insight was sufficient, and no additional cultivation was required. Conversely, the Northern Chan school supported the practice of gradual cultivation, considering the human mind to be inherently pure but enshrouded by defilement that necessitated gradual removal for enlightenment. Chinul, adopting Zongmi’s approach, advocated for a dual practice of sudden enlightenment followed by gradual cultivation. He suggested that gradual cultivation after sudden enlightenment is necessary to prevent habitual actions’ recurrence and thoroughly eliminate defilements. He defined true cultivation as a process of cultivation without cultivating anything (Chinul SW: 227). This implies that, after sudden enlightenment, one realizes that deluded thoughts are essentially void, leaving no tangible defilement to be removed. Consequently, the cultivation process progresses without attachment, meaning the practitioner cultivates without clinging to the idea of eradication.

Chinul emphasized the dual practice of samādhi and prajñāna, the two pillars of meditation. Samādhi, or concentration meditation, guides the mind into a calm state, while prajñāna, or insight meditation, enables the mind to see things as they truly are. Without samādhi, insight cannot perceive things clearly, and without prajñāna, concentration cannot entirely eradicate defilements. Additionally, he expanded their interpretations, linking samādhi to Sŏn practice and prajñāna to doctrinal teaching, thereby fusing Sŏn and Hwaŏm in his practice. He further corresponded those practices to the essence and function (Chinul SW: 230). The essence is samādhi and the function is prajñāna. As essence and function are inseparable, so those two practices are inseparable, too. The balance between these two practices was pivotal in Chinul’s teaching, as demonstrated by his three approaches to Sŏn practice: “equal maintenance of quiescence and alertness” (K. sŏngjŏktŭngji, 惺寂等持), “faith and understanding according to the complete and sudden teaching” (K. wŏndonshinhae, 圓頓信解), and “shortcut” (K. kyŏngjŏl, 徑截). “Equal maintenance of quiescence and alertness” refers to the dual practice of Samādhi and prajñāna. “Faith and understanding according to the complete and sudden teaching” connected to the equal practice of Sŏn and Hwaŏm’s doctrinal teaching. Complete teaching refers to Hwaŏm teaching, and sudden teaching is Sŏn. The shortcut is Kanhwa Sŏn (Ch. Kanhua Chan, 看話禪) practice, leading to enlightenment directly.

Originating from Dahui zonggao (1089–1163), Kanhua Chan practice concentrates on gongan (K. kongan, Jp. kōan), words extracted from Chan dialogues. When implemented in practice, gongan is referred to as huatou (K. hwadu, Jp. watō). In his Treatise on Resolving Doubt About Observing the Keyword (Kanhwak yŏlŭilon 看話決疑論), Chinul advocated for this practice, deeming it the most effective way to liberate from the maladies in the conceptual understanding of the Buddhist truth (Chinul SW: 317). Even though doctrinal principles convey profound and sublime teachings, they are nonetheless constrained by language. The Sŏn tradition recognizes the limitations of language, which naturally creates a dichotomy between subject and object, leading to a dualistic framework. Chinul was aware of this dichotomy and distinguished between two aspects of hwadu: investigating the meaning (K. ch’amŭi, 參意) and investigating the word (K. ch’amgu, 參句). Investigating the meaning involves interpreting hwadu within a doctrinal context, while investigating the word utilizes hwadu to liberate oneself from conceptual knowledge. These two methods are also related to two types of hwadu, namely, the living word (K. hwalgu) and the dead word (K. sagu). The living word facilitates the practitioner’s return to the original state of emptiness, thus freeing them from the preconceived notions created by linguistic structures. Conversely, the dead word represents the opposite process.

Chinul’s practice framework predominantly rests on the principle of sudden enlightenment, understood as the realization of one’s Buddha nature. To engage in this practice, a practitioner should first firmly believe in their inherent Buddhahood. Following this, the Kanhwa Sŏn practice enables practitioners to experience the Buddha within themselves, leading to gradual cultivation. This grounding in the balance of two forms of meditation allows practitioners to perceive the two facets of Buddha nature: its calmness and its colorful arising. This gradual cultivation aims to eliminate defilements completely. Since Chinul’s time, this approach combining sudden enlightenment and gradual cultivation, with the addition of Kanhwa Sŏn practice as a shortcut, has been considered the standard practice in Korean Sŏn Buddhism. This synthesis is the hallmark of Chinul’s practice system.

During the Koryŏ dynasty, Korean Buddhism blurred its boundaries by unifying various Buddhist teachings in one system, and Korean Sŏn Buddhism finished forming its theoretical system and characteristics.

4. Conversations between Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism in the Chosŏn Dynasty

The Chosŏn Dynasty marked a challenging period for Korean Buddhism. The ruling Neo-Confucian scholars criticized and suppressed Buddhism for its perceived corruption and its teachings that opposed Confucian values. In response, Buddhists emphasized the similarities between Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism and embraced Confucian ethics, including principles of loyalty and filial piety.

4.1 Critique and Defense of Buddhism

Criticism of Buddhism from Neo-Confucian scholars began in the late Koryŏ Dynasty when corruption within Buddhism started to be taken seriously. A notable critic was Chŏng Tojŏn (1342–1398 CE), a founding figure of the Chosŏn Dynasty. In his work An Array of Critiques of Buddhism (Pulssi jappyŏn, 佛氏雜辨), he voiced his objections to both the philosophy and practices of Buddhism. In response to these critiques, Buddhist monk Hamhŏ Tŭkt’ong (涵虛得通, 1376–1433 CE) penned The Exposition of Orthodoxy (Hyŏnjŏngnon, 顯正論), aiming to address misunderstandings about Buddhism among Neo-Confucian scholars. While they never directly debated, these two works highlight the points of contention and defense regarding Buddhism during the Chosŏn Dynasty.

Chŏng believed Buddhist philosophy is inherently illogical, and its religious practice hurts Confucian values. His criticisms extended to various aspects of Buddhist doctrines, including transmigration, Karma, mind and nature, and ethical principles.

Regarding the concept of transmigration, Chŏng argued from a Confucian perspective that once the soul combines with Yin and Yang and separates into heaven and earth after death, it can never reunite, rendering rebirth impossible. He used the analogy of water drawn from a well, which, once taken, cannot return to the well. Additionally, Chŏng challenged the concept of transmigration by stating that, if it were true, the number of beings in the world would always be the same, while the total number of lives changes in real-world circumstances. In discussing the causes and effects of Karma, he argued that people’s fortune and misfortune are decided by timing, not only by cause and effect. He likened this to the process of making liquor, which only develops a good taste when the mixture of ingredients has had sufficient time to ferment.

Chŏng also highlights the inconsistency within Buddhist teachings concerning the relationship between the mind and the nature (K. sŏng, 性). From his Neo-Confucian perspective, nature represents the principle given by heaven, while mind is formed by material force (K. ki) encompassing both nature and emotion (K. jŏng). With this foundation, he criticizes Buddhism for its perceived internal contradiction in equating the mind with nature. He began by pointing out conflicting definitions of these concepts within Buddhist scriptures, where the mind and nature were both equated and differentiated. Delusion was associated with the mind, while awakening was linked to nature. Chŏng also took issue with phrases such as “Observe the mind and see nature” and “Mind is none other than nature” (Chŏng CB: 60) arguing that they created a logical fallacy similar to attempting to eat one’s own mouth.

Furthermore, Chŏng criticized two Buddhist arguments: “functional activity is the nature” and “mind and its trace”. Sŏn Buddhist masters would assert that all human activities were manifestations of the Buddha nature. Chŏng questioned this perspective, suggesting that if one accepted Buddhism’s idea, then acts such as killing others could be labeled as the functional activity of nature. In his Neo-Confucian philosophy, nature represented a pure moral principle-centered in mind, which interacted with external stimuli. Therefore, he believed that Buddhism’s argument was flawed. Regarding the concept of the mind and its trace, he critiqued Buddhism for separating them, citing a Buddhist sentence: “If the bodhisattva Mañjuśrī wanders taverns, his behavior is wrong, but his mind is right” (Chŏng CB: 64, 121). In his perspective, the mind equated to essence (K. che) and trace represented function (K. yong), making them inseparable.

Chŏng also offers a critique of the metaphysical foundations of Buddhism. Citing Buddhist teachings that state, “Good and evil are from mind. The myriad of phenomena is nothing but consciousness”, he argues that this viewpoint portrays the phenomenal world as an illusory creation of consciousness and mind, devoid of a solid foundation. Consequently, he asserts that such a perspective hinders the objective assessment of good or bad behavior based on moral principles called nature.

In terms of Buddhist practice, Chŏng, along with other Confucian scholars, thinks that Buddhism’s promotion of renunciation of familial ties and indiscriminate compassion were particularly problematic. Monks’ abandonment of their families and their celibacy contradicted Confucian values, which placed great importance on marriage and procreation as forms of filial piety. Additionally, Buddhism’s universal compassion conflicted with Confucianism’s emphasis on distinguishing between family and others. Chŏng also pointed out that monks, in their indiscriminate compassion, were even willing to sacrifice their bodies to leopards, behavior that he considered a violation of the practice of filial piety. In summary, Chŏng Tojŏn’s critique aimed to reveal weaknesses in the Buddhist moral framework.

In defense of Buddhism, Hamhŏ Tŭkt’ong maintained that Buddhism and Confucianism were not fundamentally different. Regarding the topics of transmigration and karma, Hamhŏ emphasized that these teachings motivate individuals to willingly engage in good actions rather than bad ones. Additionally, these teachings promote the importance of emotional control, which fosters self-discipline and encourages virtuous deeds.

While he did not directly comment on the relationship between the mind and nature, he viewed the mind as more than just an illusory empty entity; instead, he saw it as an active and luminous entity, somewhat akin to the Confucian concept of “bright virtue”, which is a characteristic of one’s nature. He also explained the interplay between nature and emotion as a relationship between essence and function. According to his perspective, nature and emotion are distinct, with a deluded nature giving rise to emotions. Much like Neo-Confucian scholars, he regarded nature as the pure aspect and emotions as the impure aspect that arises in relation to external stimuli.

When addressing practical ethical issues such as monk celibacy and universal compassion, Hamhŏ argued that the choice of monkhood could provide significant benefits not only to the monks themselves but also to their parents, family members, and even the nation. He contended that it represented the highest form of practicing filial piety and loyalty. Additionally, he equated Confucian virtues, including benevolence, justice, propriety, wisdom, and trust, with Buddhism’s precepts against killing, theft, sexual misconduct, alcohol consumption, and lying. Hamhŏ Tŭkt’ong’s approach to reconciling Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism continued to exert influence on Buddhist philosophy in Chosŏn.

4.2 Harmonizing Buddhism and Confucianism

During the later period of the Chosŏn Dynasty, the discourse seeking harmony between Buddhism and Confucianism gained more popularity. Although Confucian scholars recognized the similarities between the two—both addressing the nature of the mind and advocating for a simple life—they maintained criticisms of Buddhism. During this period of Buddhist suppression, a monk named Hŏŭngdang Bowoo (虛應堂 普雨 died 1565 CE), who was instrumental in Buddhism’s restoration, endeavored to harmonize the two philosophies. He equated Buddhist teachings with other teachings through the Flower Garland sūtra, asserting that both Confucianism and Daoism were applications of this sūtra. Bowoo attempted to explain Buddhist teaching through Confucian concepts and views in his book, The Treaties of One Rightness (Ilchŏngnon, 一正論). The title, “One,” signifies the origin of all beings and the cause of all change, correlating with the principle of heaven in Neo-Confucianism. All beings exist by obtaining the principle of heaven, which also facilitates the changes of the four seasons. “Rightness” refers to the pure, untainted mind of Buddhism and the right status of the human mind according to Confucianism. This righteous state encompasses Confucian elements of morality: the sense of compassion, shame, respect, and the discernment of right and wrong. Here, “One” also represents the world, and “Rightness” implies the human mind. Consequently, Bowoo asserts that these two become one, resulting in a unity of the world and the human mind. He expanded his argument by acknowledging that even though the human mind is connected to the principle of heaven, it is still influenced by material force, which can tarnish the human mind. Thus, he proposed the practice of Confucian methods such as reverence and extending knowledge as a means of purification.

Commonly, the concept of mind, nature, principle, and supreme ultimate (Ch. taiji; K. t’aegŭk) were employed to compare the two teachings. Over time, both Confucian scholars and Buddhist monks agreed on the similarity of the two teachings concerning mind cultivation and self-discipline. Although Buddhism was suppressed during this period, friendships between Confucian scholars and Buddhist monks led to mutual studies and deeper understanding.

5. The Response of Korean Buddhism to Modern Times

In modern times, Koreans encountered Western philosophy and Christianity. This encounter led to an assumption that traditional Asian elements, including Buddhism, might be considered irrelevant on the path to modern nationhood. Modernization in Korea was frequently synonymous with Westernization. Faced with this shift in perspective, Korean intellectuals embarked on a reevaluation of Buddhism’s role in a modern, Western-influenced society.

In pursuit of this reevaluation, they posed several crucial questions: Is Buddhism worthy of preservation? To what genre does Buddhism belong in Western academic classification? What are the similarities and the differences between Buddhism and Western thought? How can Buddhist philosophy contribute to the future world?

Moreover, the colonial and postcolonial reality significantly influenced the perception and development of modern Korean Buddhism, prompting greater engagement with social issues than during the Chosŏn period.

5.1 Investigating the value of Buddhist philosophy in the modern era

5.1.1 Placing Buddhism in the western intellectual context

Korean Buddhists, much like other East Asian Buddhist intellectuals, have undertaken efforts to interpret Buddhism within the framework of Western thought. One of the issues they grapple with is the differentiation between religion and philosophy in Western discourse, a distinction that does not exist in Eastern discourse. Consequently, East Asian Buddhist intellectuals, including Koreans, have proposed that Buddhism encompasses both religious and philosophical elements. Depending on the individual intellectuals, they may have differing perspectives on these two aspects of Buddhism.

For instance, Paek Yongsŏng, a Buddhist monk and reformer, places emphasis on Buddhism as a religion. Han Yongun (1879–1944), a writer and reformer, directs his focus toward its philosophical elements. Yi Jongch’ŏn, a scholar who studied under Inoue Enryō at Tokyo University, regards the doctrinal teachings of Buddhism as philosophical elements, while considering the practice of Buddhism as the religious component (Yi 1918: 35–36). On the other hand, Paek Sŏnguk, the first Korean to study philosophy in Germany, argues that Buddhism is a religion founded on philosophy. In his article titled “Buddhist Metaphysics,” he asserts that Buddhism is philosophy because it objectively studies truth obtained from reality, and it is religion because it involves the worship of various deities (Paek 1925: 21–22).

In the late 1910s and the 1920s, Korean Buddhist philosophers, under the influence of Inoue Enryō (井上 円了 1858–1919), began to view Buddhist philosophy as metaphysics. Inoue, the most influential philosopher for East Asian intellectuals at the time, described Buddhist philosophy as pure philosophy, examining the essence of the universe and the principles of truth, aligning with German idealism. Consequently, Korean Buddhist philosophers delved into metaphysical issues, such as the relationship between phenomena (dharma) and the actual reality of all phenomena (suchness, Skt. Bhūtakoṭi). The term “actual reality of all phenomena” corresponds to the concept of essence in Western philosophy. In the context of Buddhist philosophy, it refers to truth, the ultimate culmination for all beings and a representation of things as they are. Kim Ch’ŏlu, a Buddhist scholar, explores the non-dualism within Buddhist metaphysics. Kim asserts,

Buddhism’s primary principle is that phenomena are the actual reality of all phenomena. Less developed religions separate the actual reality of phenomena from phenomena, thus failing to explain the relationship between the actual reality of phenomena and human beings. Buddhism, as an advanced religion, proposes the unity of phenomena and the actual reality of phenomena, elucidating that all phenomena constitute the actual reality of phenomena. (Kim 1919: 53)

Furthermore, Paek Sŏnguk delves into the dynamic tension within the actual reality of phenomena, which conveys the concept of Buddha as the ultimate universal truth. This universal truth can be dissected into object and subject when examined in relation to dharma. In this context, Buddha serves as the inherent subject in the truth, and this perspective stands in contrast to that of Nishida Kitaro (西田幾多郞, 1870–1945), a prominent philosopher of the Kyoto school. Nishida highlights the concept of absolute emptiness that transcends divisions between subjects and objects, asserting that it is the only reality where separated beings can unite.

5.1.2 Aligning Buddhist Philosophy with Modern Thought

During this era, social evolution theory emerged as a prevailing intellectual trend, asserting that all cultures must progress, and only those that advance and adapt can survive. In this context, Han Yongun took on the challenge of demonstrating the relevance of Buddhism by identifying its modern elements. He discovered thoughts of free will and egalitarianism in Buddhist teachings and argued that Buddhism held the potential to contribute to a better world than social evolution theory would.

Drawing inspiration from the works of Liang Qichao (1873–1929), a prominent modern Chinese thinker (Han 2016: 105–108), Han Yongun equated free will with the Buddhist concept of suchness, the true nature of all beings. In comparing Kant’s philosophy with Buddhism, Liang Qichao interpreted suchness as the moral subject possessing free will, whereas the state of ignorance prior to enlightenment reflects the absence of free will. Liang further argued that while Kant’s moral subject pertained to individuals, Buddha’s suchness applied universally to all human beings. Han Yongun embraced this interpretation, using it as a basis to assert Buddhism’s superiority over Western philosophy. It is worth noting that a similar idea regarding the power of the human mind had been previously mentioned in Korean Buddhist philosophy.

Moreover, Han Yongun characterized Buddhism as embodying egalitarian principles. Within Buddhist philosophy, two worlds exist: the world of conventional truth and the world of ultimate truth. The former, which emerges from the principle of cause and effect, holds a variety of distinct beings. Conversely, the world of ultimate truth represents the inherent nature of all beings, manifesting itself as pure emptiness. Building upon this philosophical foundation, he articulated,

Looking from the viewpoint of inequality, there is nothing that is not unequal, but from the viewpoint of equality, there is nothing that is not equal. What, then, is inequality? It refers to the fact that all things and phenomena are subject to the laws of necessity. What does equality mean? It refers to the free, unconstrained truth that transcends time and space. (Han 2016: 112–113)

In this manner, Han Yongun modernized the interpretation of Buddhist teachings. Furthermore, he postulated that the future would be a Buddhist world because its foundational teachings guarantee freedom for all beings in an egalitarian setting. Later, he integrated socialist ideas into his concept of egalitarianism, envisioning a form of Buddhist socialism.

5.1.3 Comparison of Buddhism to Christianity

In response to the competition posed by Christian missionary works, Paek Yongsŏng (1864–1940) embarked on a comparative analysis between Christianity and Buddhism with the aim of demonstrating the superiority of Buddhism (Paek 2016). He argued that Christianity lacked a comprehensive understanding of the mind, even though it shared similarities with the concept of a fair exchange of good deeds and their rewards. Expanding on this viewpoint, he critiqued the notion of God as a separate creator distinct from his creations. According to Buddhist philosophy, the original mind gives rise to all beings, and that Buddha’s mind resides within the minds of individuals. He also criticized the idea of divine punishment for original sin, as it seemed harsh for a creator to chastise individuals after permitting them to err.

5.1.4 The Identity of Korean Buddhism

Amid the effort to align Buddhism with Western thought, there emerged a movement to preserve traditional Korean Buddhism and rediscover Korea’s distinct identity. Monk Sŏkjŏn (1870–1948) started teaching Buddhist classics to individuals passionate about Korean studies and the essence of Korea’s spirit. Among his students, Ch’oe Namsŏn (1890–1957) wrote two articles delineating the identity of Korean Buddhism: “Overview of Korean Buddhism: A Diachronic Approach to Korean Buddhism” (1918) and “Korean Buddhism: Its Position in the Cultural History of the East” (1930). Through these works, he emphasizes that Korean monks played an active and significant role in the evolution of Buddhism in East Asia, rather than merely assimilating Chinese Buddhism. He asserts that Korean Buddhism surpassed other East Asian forms of Buddhism, both in its philosophical depth and artistic expression.

Ch’oe Namsŏn gives special attention to the Hwajaeng philosophy of Wŏnhyo, which encapsulates all Buddhist teachings and practices as one. He dubbed this form of Buddhism as “unified Buddhism”, “completed Buddhism”, or “synthesis Buddhism”, asserting it as the distinctive identity of Korean Buddhism. Ch’oe’s arguments continued to be well-received by Korean Buddhist scholars even after Korea’s liberation, leading to “Unified Buddhism” being perceived as a defining characteristic of Korean Buddhism. This view persisted until 1985 when it was questioned by Shim Jaeryong (Shim 1999: 171–181).

In response to modernization, Korean Buddhism pursued preservation and reform strategies. Monk Sŏkjŏn and Ch’oe Namsŏn emphasized its distinctive identity, positioning “Unified Buddhism” as a uniquely Korean concept. Meanwhile, Han Yongun and Paek Yongsŏng strove to modernize Buddhism, incorporating Western thought and advocating its popularization. Korean Buddhist intellectuals explored metaphysical aspects in Buddhism. These collective efforts have embedded Korean Buddhism within the modern era.

5.2 Popularizing Buddhism

The essence of modernity lies in its emancipation from mysticism, embracing human reason and the growth of individual rights. These notions also resonated with the transformation of Korean Buddhism during this period. Most laypeople of that era predominantly engaged in offering prayers to Buddhist deities for their well-being, a practice considered incompatible with the ideals of modernity. Consequently, Buddhist intellectuals began to emphasize individual practices for enlightenment and the development of more accessible daily-life practices, while also directing their attention to pressing social issues.

5.2.1 Enlightenment and social engagement

Paek Yongsŏng identified enlightenment as the unique and pivotal aspect of Buddhist thought, aiming to reestablish its original intent in the lives of laypeople. Rooted in Sŏn Buddhism, “enlightenment” denoted the realization of one’s intrinsic Buddhahood. Great enlightenment, in this context, signifies the attainment of the original nature of the human mind—Buddha nature. According to Paek, all individuals should attain this realization and assist others in doing the same. The attainment of enlightenment serves as a means for individuals to discover their own identities and inner strength. To popularize this notion, he established the Order of Great Enlightenment (Daekakgyo) in 1922 and initiated the Daegak school movement, offering meditation classes to laypeople, which was previously unavailable to the public.

However, their commitment extended beyond personal enlightenment, as they emphasized social engagement rooted in the Buddhist teaching of “saving sentient beings.” Paek Yongsŏng and Han Yongun were not just theorists but also activists who actively participated in social movements, such as the independence movement. While Han Yongun was intrigued by social Buddhism, he didn’t develop his own comprehensive theory. In contrast, Paek Sŏnguk expanded his philosophical journey to include social theory. After a thorough examination of cosmology, he posited that a single principle (illi) constructed the cosmos. Applying this principle to the human world, he argued that it could transform this impure land into Pure Land (Paek 2021: 81).

According to Paek, this principle applied to three aspects of human life: in legal life, it dictated the rules of human communities; in economic life, it ensured fair distribution; and in spiritual life, it bestowed meaningful existence. Paek contended that each facet of life should maintain its boundaries and balance, with spiritual life taking the lead. An excessive focus on legal life might suppress economic equality and individual freedom, while an overemphasis on economic life could turn humans into mere working machines. If spiritual life remained intertwined with the other spheres, it might disrupt the intended direction, ultimately benefiting humanity and guiding a more humane existence. In his social theory, Paek Sŏnguk effectively fused Hwaŏm Buddhist philosophy with modern social theory.

5.2.2 Won Buddhism

Won Buddhism, a relatively modern Buddhist movement, was founded by Park Jungbin (1891–1943), who later came to be known as Sot’aesan. Interestingly, Park did not undergo formal training in the Buddhist tradition; instead, his connection to Buddhism emerged after enlightenment, which he recognized as akin to the descriptions of enlightenment found in Buddhism. Won Buddhism predominantly embraces Buddhist teachings but reformulates them in a manner that is more accessible to laypeople. Central to its philosophy is the belief that Buddhism should transcend distinctions between Buddhist clergy and lay practitioners, as well as between Buddha and sentient beings. The doctrinal foundation of Won Buddhism is articulated in the Scripture of Won Buddhism (Wŏnbulgyo kyojŏn).

At the core of Won Buddhism’s doctrinal framework lies the concept of the “One Circle Form” (irwŏnsang), symbolizing the dharmakaya Buddha, which represents the essence of all beings and Buddhas, as well as Buddha nature. This concept is depicted in a circular form because it signifies the perpetual transformation between being and non-being, revealing their inherent emptiness and completeness. The ultimate objective of Won Buddhism is to attain Buddhahood, aligning with the aspirations of other Buddhist traditions. To achieve this enlightenment, Sot’aesan introduced the framework of four beneficent sources of human life and three practices. The four beneficent sources are heaven and earth, parents, brethren, and law, as they grant life and support one’s existence. The three core practices in Won Buddhism mirror the traditional Buddhist triad of samādhi, wisdom, and precepts. These practices are structured as follows: cultivation of the spirit (chŏngsin suyang), inquiry into facts and principles (sari yŏn’gu), and careful selection of karmic actions (chagŏp ch’wisa).

These practices are adapted from the foundational principles of Buddhism and serve as a guide for spiritual development. In daily life, practitioners are encouraged to engage in regular meditation referred to as “timeless Zen” (Musisŏppob) and adhere to the nine essential dharmas of daily practice, aimed at dispelling afflictions. Among these nine rules, three correspond to the fundamental practices mentioned earlier, emphasizing the transformation of negative mindsets into positive virtues, including belief, zeal, dedication, gratitude, self-reliance, and goodwill.

5.2.3 Buddhism of Engagement

In the 1980s, Minjung Buddhism emerged as part of the Minjung movement in South Korea, a social movement dedicated to the liberation of the “minjung”. The term “minjung”, which means “common people”, refers to those who are oppressed by the ruling class but who nonetheless have the potential to become agents in shaping history. Alongside Minjung movement activists, young Buddhists established the Minjung Buddhism Society in 1975. Chŏn Jaesŏng wrote “The Theory of Minjung Buddhism” and published it in the journal Dialogue (Daehwa) in 1977. Although the article did not present intense, argumentative discourse, it did introduce the basic principles of Minjung Buddhism and encouraged young Buddhists to participate in the Minjung Buddhist movement.

Minjung Buddhists derived their theoretical framework from Buddhist philosophy, adapted via Marxist theory. They sought a Buddhist teaching that resonated with Marxist ideology and found numerous similarities between Marxism and early Buddhism. Both systems embrace atheism, materialism, empiricism, and egalitarianism. Early Buddhism explained the world without reference to gods, depicted matter as the basis of human existence, emphasized empiricism, and advocated for egalitarian communities of monks akin to the primitive communities described by Marx. A Buddhist monk, Pŏpsŏng, brought together the varied threads of Minjung Buddhist philosophical discourse and highlighted how Minjung Buddhism reinterpreted fundamental Buddhist concepts to reveal the revolutionary characteristics of Buddhism. The concepts included dependent arising, karma, and Pure Land, with all new interpretations pointing towards emphasizing the self-reliance of the minjung.

The principle of dependent arising supports the social engagement of Buddhism. It situates each individual’s life in the broader scope of history and reveals history to be a tapestry woven from the threads of individual lives. Additionally, one’s deeds and social activities lead to social change because people and society are interconnected. This new interpretation formed the basis for the argument that the minjung has the capacity to promote change.

Minjung Buddhists also understood karma as people’s creative activity that shapes the world and transforms themselves. Utilizing the concept of “karma,” they emphasized human self-reliance, asserting that without human action or karma, no change or revolution can occur. They drew parallels between the Marxist concept of “motion”, a fundamental principle in dialectical materialism that denotes the continuous change in the world and human thought, and karma. They proposed that the motion of the world is a universal principle and karma embodies this principle in humans. That is, karma is the expression of human engagement with the world, and it constitutes a part of the world’s overall motion. One’s past karma influences the present, and present karma molds the future, implying that the entire world is shaped by the power of karma. The emphasis on human self-reliance in the concept of karma is strongly tied to the idea of the minjung, which signifies not just oppressed but also agents of historical and social change. Both Minjung Buddhism and Minjung theology highlight the potential of the minjung to bring about revolution.

Minjung Buddhists aimed to establish an ideal society called Pure Land (Jŏngto). Traditionally, Pure Land Buddhist philosophy encompasses two aspects: being reborn in Amita Buddha’s Pure Land, and creating the Pure Land in this world at this moment. Minjung Buddhists accepted the latter, arguing that we can live in the Pure Land when we strive to overcome the contradictions of society and individuals. Through Minjung Buddhism, Korean Buddhists envisioned a social revolution.

After the democratization of South Korea in 1987, the Minjung Buddhist movement gradually waned. Most of its members transformed the movement into a more socially accessible form known as “practical Buddhism” (Silch’ŏn Bulgyo), which later evolved into “socially engaged Buddhism” (Ch’amyŏ Bulgyo). They have led environmental protection, Korean unification, and other social movements. The philosophy of Minjung Buddhism became the theoretical foundation for socially underpinning for socially engaged Buddhism, which is rooted in the belief that individuals are the agents of societal change and that people’s creative actions can transform the world.

Two notable groups actively involved in social issues blend these principles with traditional Buddhist philosophy: The Jungto Society and Indra’s Net Community. The Jungto Society adopted the Minjung Buddhists’ objective of creating the Pure Land in our current world. However, the Jungto Society does not focus on political revolution; instead, its primary concerns are individual happiness and a harmonious world based on non-dualistic Buddhist philosophy. Meanwhile, the Indra’s Net Community embraces the Hwaŏm philosophy of an interconnected world, encapsulated in the idea that “one is all, and all is one”. The metaphor of Indra’s net implies the teaching that all beings are interconnected. As such, the Indra’s net Community concentrates on restoring the connection between people and the earth through ecological movements and care for all life forms on earth.

5.3 Women and Korean Buddhist Philosophy

In the modern era, women struggled for gender equality and sought liberation within a patriarchal society. Kim Iryŏp (1896–1971), a leading figure among the “New Woman” (Sinyŏsŏng) of her time, actively confronted these issues and discovered profound insights within Sŏn Buddhism. Prior to her life as a Buddhist nun, she gained recognition as a prominent writer among female intellectuals and was deeply involved in the women’s movement. Following her ordination as a nun, she wholeheartedly dedicated herself to Buddhist practice and philosophy, although not explicitly engaging in the women’s movement. Nevertheless, her explorations delved into women’s issues at a more fundamental level (J. Park 2017b). Nearly three decades later, she published a book, Reflections of a Zen Buddhist Nun and rekindled her connection with society. In her essays, she skillfully applied traditional Sŏn teachings to address gender-related problems and presented a novel approach to philosophical inquiry.

Within her essay collection, Kim Iryŏp employed her personal experiences as a foundation for philosophical contemplation, all within the context of Buddhist teachings. Through her life journey as a woman, she sought answers to profound questions regarding human existence, identity, societal constraints, and love, all framed within the context of Buddhist principles. Her essay titled “Having Burnt Away My Youth” (Kim 2014, 140–198) provides a detailed account of her philosophical odyssey.

During her Sŏn practice, she encountered the concept of the “great self,” representing a universal existence that transcended individual selves. Kim Iryŏp made a clear distinction between the individual self, often referred to as the “small self,” and the authentic universal great self. This great self was not an independent entity but rather symbolized the totality of all beings. In the context of gender-related issues, the “small self” represented the confined “I,” constrained by societal gender norms, while the “great self” epitomized the liberated self, free from societal restrictions. Prior to her engagement with Buddhist philosophy, she had primarily focused on seeking liberation amid the conflict between her individual self and societal norms. However, as a Buddhist nun, she achieved freedom by transcending this dualistic thinking, thereby attaining existential liberation.

Furthermore, she introduced the concept of “creativity” as the pathway to liberation from the constricting small self and the embrace of the expansive great self. This creativity was synonymous with each person’s original mind, which served as the wellspring of one’s existence. Recognizing this original mind led to the realization of becoming a “complete being,” someone whose existence harmonized with the universe. Kim Iryŏp’s philosophy vividly illustrated how Buddhist teachings could serve as a powerful tool for both personal and social transformation.

Another noteworthy Buddhist nun, Daehaeng (1927–2012), the founder of the Hanmaŭm Sŏn Center (Hanmaŭm Sŏnwŏn), revolutionized traditional Buddhist practices in response to the needs of people. Her focus was on healing individuals, and she proposed Hanmaŭm thought and Juingong practice as methods for healing. “Hanmaŭm” signifies the concept of “one Mind” (ilsim), an alternative expression of Buddha nature and essence. Hanmaŭm existed equally within all beings, and all beings derived from it. “Juingong” referred to the insubstantial doer, the individual manifestation of Hanmaŭm. Daehaeng advocated a practice of surrendering everything to Juingong, as it represented the center and true master of oneself. Juingong practice did not necessitate specific times or places for sitting meditation; instead, one could simply call upon Juingong whenever the need arose. This practice was highly accessible to ordinary people in their daily lives.

These women Buddhist philosophers reshaped traditional Buddhist philosophy and demonstrated the capacity of Buddhist teachings to address profound existential questions. Their dedicated efforts also contributed to the enrichment of the tapestry of Korean Buddhist philosophy.

Bibliography

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Other Internet Resources

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