The Nature of Law

First published Sun May 27, 2001; substantive revision Tue Apr 29, 2025

Lawyers tend to raise questions about the content of the law or about what the law requires on this or that issue. These are always local questions, answers to which are bound to differ depending on the jurisdiction. By contrast, philosophy of law is interested in a general question: what is law? This question presupposes that there are certain characteristics that law exhibits by its very nature, or essence, as law, whenever and wherever it happens to exist, characteristics that may be discernible through philosophical analysis. General jurisprudence, as the philosophical project is sometimes called, aims to give an account of law’s nature, in the service, ultimately, of several explanatory goals. A satisfying account is supposed to shed light on what determines the content of legal norms; on law’s normative significance—both how it purports to guide behavior and why it gives agents reasons for compliance; and on the relationship, if any, between law and other bodies of norms, such as the norms of morality or custom.

But here, as elsewhere in philosophy, there are deep disagreements about the desiderata for a satisfying account. It might even be somewhat misleading to suggest that there is a single question—what is law?—that unites the field, as opposed to several related questions. For instance, there are at least two senses in which the term “law” is used in jurisprudence: to refer to a kind of norm (a legal norm), or to refer to a kind of normative system (a legal system). Corresponding to these two senses are different questions. One concerns the general conditions under which a norm gets to be a norm of law—whether the conditions refer only to the norm’s source, such as its enactment by some political institution, or also its content, such as its moral virtues. This is the question of the “grounds of legal validity.” A different but related question concerns the distinctive characteristics of a body of norms that make it a system of law. This is the question of the existence and persistence conditions of a legal system. Additionally, some philosophers focus primarily on explaining and justifying the normativity of law, and only secondarily on law’s nature. Their questions are several: how do legal norms give rise to reasons for action, what kinds of reasons are involved, and are there distinctively legal obligations.

Section 1 considers these questions in turn and explains the main substantive debates. Section 2 highlights some further methodological issues that have generated recent discussion. As we’ll see, over the course of the last few centuries, two main rival philosophical traditions have emerged about the grounds of legal validity. The older one, with origins in classical Greek and Roman legal philosophy as well as late mediaeval Christian scholarship, is called the natural law tradition, and in its more secular and modern formulation associated principally with the work of Ronald Dworkin, “non-positivism.” Its unifying principle is the proposition that the grounds of legality are partly moral in nature. As the famous dictum, commonly attributed to (among others) Cicero, Saint Augustine, and Aquinas, has it: lex iniusta non est lex (unjust law is not law) (see e.g., Aquinas, Summa Theologica, I-II, Q. 96, Art. 4.) Since the early 19th century, the claim that the moral content of norms partly determines their legality has been fiercely challenged by the legal positivism tradition, promulgated by Jeremy Bentham, John Austin, Hans Kelsen (see the entry on the pure theory of law), H.L.A. Hart, and arguably anticipated in Hobbes’ political philosophy. According to legal positivists, the conditions of legal validity, and the grounds of law more generally, are a matter exclusively of social or non-moral facts.

1. General Jurisprudence

1.1 The Grounds of Legal Validity

A society may follow all kinds of norms that prescribe or prohibit forms of behavior, such as the norms of etiquette, morality, or tradition. But if the society has a legal system, then some of its norms will be legal in nature. What determines whether a norm qualifies as a legal norm of the community? We begin with a positivist answer to this question. Positivists maintain that a community’s legal norms are determined exclusively by the beliefs, desires, and conduct of its members—in other words, by social conditions. What those precise conditions are has been subject to some debate. Early legal positivists, for instance, held that the laws of a community are determined by the commands issued by its “sovereign,” construed as an agent, possibly a collective, with the capacity to elicit obedience by credibly threatening sanction (Austin 1832). These early theorists followed Hobbes in thinking that law is, by its very nature, an instrument of social control employed by those with power (military, economic, social, …) (cf. Kelsen 1945/61).

There are a few things to note about this proposal. First, it aspires to be perfectly general: true of all legal norms in any actual or possible legal system. Second, the sense in which a sovereign’s commands determine the law is supposed to be non-causal and constitutive. The causes of a legal norm’s existence may be several and antecedent to any sovereign command. For instance, if a queen wishes to raise revenues to prosecute a war, the war may be part of what causally explains her commands and any resulting legal norm. But the occurrence of the war is not why the norm qualifies as law. According to the Command Theorist, to be a legal norm just is to be the content of a sovereign command (for further discussion, see Part II).

The Command Theory was challenged by later positivists on several grounds. One set of objections centered on the content of legal norms, not all of which impose duties. Whereas duty-imposing norms, such as a norm that creates a tax obligation, can be easily understood in terms of the content of a command (“pay taxes!”), the same is not true of “power-conferring” norms (Hart 1961). These are norms that confer various legal powers, say, to make wills, contracts, or even new laws. A norm that specifies criteria for a legally enforceable contract is hard to represent as the content of a command. To whom is the command directed? Can it be said to require anything at all insofar as it merely specifies how a type of legal action can be performed? What, if any, are the consequences of non-compliance? One could perhaps try to construe the norm in terms of a command directed at other legal officials—to enforce a contract that meets the relevant criteria. But this reconstruction arguably distorts the norm’s content, or so critics maintained. A different objection questioned whether coercive relations among agents are necessary or sufficient for the emergence of legal norms. The theory seems to rule out the possibility of a cooperative and well-intentioned community establishing a legal system without any enforcement mechanism, one the relies solely on voluntary compliance (Raz 1994). Another problem is that it’s not obvious whether the theory can explain the complex reasons people have for following the law, which do not necessarily concern the prospect of sanction (for further discussion, see 1.3).

The Command Theory’s shortcomings led Hart to develop an alternative version of positivism that has been extremely influential. Hart argued that in every legal system, the legality of first-order norms—say, norms that prescribe or prohibit forms of behavior—is determined, ultimately, be a set of more fundamental or higher-order norms, what he called “rules of recognition, change, and adjudication.” These higher-order norms are legal wholly in virtue of being embraced by “official” members of the community as worth following. Hart called this special attitude of endorsement and obedience: “the internal point of view.” On the resulting picture, socially embraced rules and conventions take center stage that needn’t be fully articulated in any founding document or legal text, but that specify the means of creating, modifying, and extinguishing laws. These foundational norms underwrite all familiar “sources of law,” such as constitutional or legislative acts and judicial decisions. Most contemporary versions of legal positivism, discussed further below, presuppose this basic Hartian framework.

An important upshot of the framework is that a norm’s legality needn’t depend on its moral merits. This “Separation Thesis,” as it has come to be known, is the main source of controversy in jurisprudence and, also, some confusion (see discussion in Gardner 2001). Positivists do not deny that wherever law exists, there is likely to be significant overlap between its content and moral requirements. Nor do they deny that law, perhaps by its very nature, deals with matters of moral concern. What they reject, at a minimum, is a modal claim: that the legality of a norm depends necessarily on its moral merits. Some positivists go further. “Exclusive” legal positivists deny even the possibility of the moral merits of a norm determining its legality. To put the point in Hartian terms, exclusive positivists argue that a community’s rule of recognition cannot make the legality of a norm depend on its moral merits (see Raz 1994 and discussion in 1.3). Their view entails that the content of the law can always be discerned, in principle, without recourse to a substantive theory of morality. By contrast, “inclusive” legal positivists maintain that the moral merits of a norm may ground its legality but only if a higher-order legal norm, itself grounded exclusively in social facts, recognizes morality as a source of and constraint on the law. On this picture, whenever the moral merits of a norm contribute to its legality, it is wholly in virtue of contingent socio-legal conventions within the community (Waluchow 1994, Coleman 1994, Kramer 2004).

The Separation Thesis—whether understood in the exclusive or inclusive sense—is controversial for several reasons. One reason it that its denial has been a key tenet of an older tradition, namely, Natural Law Theory, whose influence extends across legal history. Early natural lawyers maintained that law, wherever and whenever it exists, must conform in its content to some basic precepts of universal morality—what theorists called “natural law.” Most famously, Aquinas maintained that law just is an “ordinance of reason” promulgated by one who has “care for the community.” On one interpretation of Aquinas’ claim, unless what the authorities require is consistent with “reason,” the requirement is no law at all. Notably, the famous dictum that an “unjust law cannot be law” wasn’t simply a theoretical posit or implication; it was likely informed by historical legal practice. The idea that the norms of universal morality enjoy a kind of trans-jurisdictional and a priori legality, either as default law or inviolable law, was very widely embraced by jurists and legal officials (see discussion in Atiq 2023). Ordinary juridical intuitions have changed, however; and these days, it is very difficult to maintain that unjust law cannot be law (but see Flanagan & Hannikainnen 2022). In light of clear counterexamples, the natural law tradition has undergone considerable refinement (see e.g., Finnis 1980, Moore 1992, Murphy 2006/12, Crowe 2019). Its leading defenders focus not so much on the legality of individual norms within a legal system, but that of an entire system of norms. And they afford morality a more subtle role within law, a role that may or may not be inconsistent with the Separation Thesis as we’ll discuss in 1.2 (see also the entry on natural law theories).

The main contemporary challenge to the Separation Thesis stems from Dworkin’s body of work. Dworkin argued that positivists cannot explain central aspects of legal reasoning and practice. One set of arguments appealed to the role of “principles” in adjudication. Judges and other legal officials tasked with figuring out the law frequently base their conclusions on principles of justice and fairness. Dworkin (1977) argued that the moral content, logical form, and deliberative significance of these principles cannot be captured or explained by social or conventional rules. A different argument (1986) focused on the pervasiveness of “theoretical disagreement” within law: officials routinely dispute the basic criteria of legal validity within their system. Since positivists take the basic criteria to be grounded in a degree of social consensus, they seem committed to thinking that in many modern legal systems the criteria are highly indeterminate. But jurists in those systems presuppose a degree of determinacy that outstrips consensus and, so, appear to implicitly reject legal positivism.

Based on these arguments, Dworkin developed an alternative “non-positivist” account of the grounds of legal validity that differs quite radically from both positivism and natural law theory. He argued that the distinction between what the law is and what it ought to be is much more blurred than legal positivists would have it. The argument relied on two main premises. First, Dworkin maintained that determining what the law requires, or the content of legal norms, necessarily involves “interpretation.” Any statement of the form “according to the law in S, x has a right/duty etc., to y” is a conclusion of some interpretation or other of the community’s social practices. Second, interpretation always involves evaluative considerations. An interpretation amounts to an account of what the law requires that “fits” to some degree the social practices of the community (judicial decisions, legislative actions, and so on) and, at the same time, morally “justifies” the practices. The “best” interpretation is one that optimally balances considerations of fit and justification and, so, portrays the community’s law—what it requires—in its best possible light. Dworkin took himself to be offering not just a theory of adjudication, or a heuristic for figuring out the law, but an account of the very nature of legal norms inspired by judicial practice. In his own words, “propositions of law are true if they figure in or follow from the principles of justice, fairness, and procedural due process that provide the best constructive interpretation of the community’s legal practice” (Dworkin 1986, 225).

Both Dworkin’s Interpretivism and his arguments against positivism have been challenged on various grounds. Positivists maintain that the role of principles in adjudication, properly understood, poses no threat to their view. Exclusive positivists argue that Dworkin mistook judicial law-making for law-discovery and that legal discovery is not nearly as “interpretive” as Dworkin makes it out to be (Hart 1961, ch7, Raz 1972). Inclusive legal positivists argue that Dworkin overgeneralized from practices unique to American and English common law and that the contingent practices are easily explained by inclusive positivism (Waluchow 1994, Kramer 2004, Berman 2022). Likewise, Dworkin’s argument from theoretical disagreement has faced several objections. Some positivists argue that genuine theoretical disagreements are in fact quite rare (Leiter 2009). Others argue that jurists engaged in such disagreements are filling gaps in the law or arguing about what the law ought to be (Plunkett & Sundell 2013, Watson 2023). Additionally, Dworkin’s own view seems vulnerable to objection given its counterintuitive implications, such as the upshot that an entire legal community may be mistaken about its laws simply in virtue of being mistaken about what’s “morally best” (Marmor 2011: ch4). But these issues, together with the overarching question of how ordinary legal practice constrains a philosophical account of law, continue to be debated.

Some contemporary non-positivists have developed an alternative to Interpretivism that they claim is inspired by Dworkin’s (2011) later work. Instead of construing legal norms as entailed by the “best interpretation” of social practices, defenders of the “One System” view argue that legal norms are simply grounded in (or identical to) those moral norms that obtain in virtue of the community’s social practices. On Greenberg’s (2014) development of the view, the law just is the “moral impact” of the legally relevant social facts. His principal argument relies on the claim that jurists take legal norms to exhibit certain characteristics that only genuinely moral norms could possess, such as being “rationally intelligible” based on the social facts (2004). Other defenders of the One System view maintain that legal officials make no distinction between what subjects legally ought to do and what they morally ought to do (see e.g., Hershovitz 2023 and discussion in 1.3). However, the One System view is widely seen as hard to defend given its counterintuitive implications about legal content (Dindjer 2020, Watson 2022), contestable assumptions about ordinary legal practice, and questionable interpretation of the use of deontic language by lawyers and jurists (Wodak forthcoming).

More moderate versions of non-positivism contest the Separation Thesis by arguing that there might be normative criteria of legal validity even if the law can be, and often is, morally defective (Simmonds 2008, Alexy 2010, Atiq 2020). These “minimal” conditions concerning, e.g., the overall rationality or reasonableness of legal norms, may be derivable from what it takes for a legal system to exist (see discussion in 1.2). One general challenge for all non-positivist theories, including natural law theory, interpretivism, the one-system view, and any moderate alternatives, is to give an account of the nature of moral and, more broadly, normative facts (see generally the entry on metaethics). Many non-positivists defend a thoroughly objectivist stance with respect to the nature and content of moral norms (see e.g., Finnis 1980, Dworkin 2011, Crowe 2019). Others argue that non-positivism can be defended independently of one’s metaethics (Atiq 2025a: 68–70).

1.2 The Existence Conditions of Legal Systems

Hart’s theory, though principally focused on the criteria of legal validity, suggests a general recipe for what counts as a legal system. A community needs a system of norms that exhibits higher-order structure, and designated officials must adopt the internal point of view towards, at a minimum, the higher-order norms of the system—in particular, its Rule of Recognition. Recall that Hart’s theory was based, in part, on an extensional objection to the Command Theory: it is questionable whether a system of raw power and coercion—the “gunman situation writ large”—qualifies as a legal system (Hart 1994: p19). But Hart’s own theory has been challenged on extensional grounds (see e.g., Fuller 1978, Shapiro 2011). Fuller’s famous test case involves a hypothetical king, “Rex,” who purports to govern a society based on rules that are radically ad hoc, specific, non-public, retroactive, unclear, unstable and inconsistent. Fuller suggests that Rex fails to create a legal system because a bona fide system of law necessarily exhibits a degree of order—what he called the “inner morality of law”—based on, among other things, the generality, publicity, non-retroactivity, and consistency of its norms (see also Dworkin 1965). A less controversial way of putting Fuller’s point is that it isn’t clear whether Rex’s attempt at making law succeeds, and even if it does, the legality of the resulting system is not so intuitive, a fact that invites explanation (Atiq 2025a: 23–27).

The characteristics that Fuller took to be essential to a legal system have come to be known as the “Rule of Law” virtues (Raz 1979/2019, Kramer 2007, Waldron 2008). The ingredients of the Rule of Law remain controversial, not just within legal philosophy, but in political philosophy more broadly (see e.g., Waldron 2008, Railton 2018, and the entry on the rule of law). However, among legal philosophers there is broad agreement that the Rule of Law understood along Fullerian lines defines a “kind-relative” standard for evaluating law: that is, a legal system is better, qua legal system, if it instantiates characteristics like generality, publicity, and consistency (see discussion in Atiq 2025b). Notably, kind-relative standards of evaluation are pervasive (Thomson 2008). While the standard for being good “as a knife” is different from the standard for being good “as a clock,” some general observations can be made about this mode of evaluation. For instance, to say that something is good “as an x”—e.g., as a scientific theory or as a weapon of mass destruction—is not to say that it is good, period, or morally good (on this point, see Marmor 2004, Scanlon 2025). What’s being said exactly is subject to some debate, but it is tempting to think there must be an explanation for why instances of certain kinds, such as law, are uniquely evaluable in terms of a select class of characteristics.

On the positivist side, there are at least two influential explanations. Fuller (1978) invokes a “functional” explanation. Generally, kind-relative virtues (like being sharp) appear to be characteristics that enable the performance of those functions (such as cutting) that inform our conception of what it is to be an instance of the relevant kind (a knife). And one might expect this mode of explanation to extend to the kind-relative virtues of institutional and abstract artifacts, such as law. Accordingly, Fuller argues that law has a constitutive function—in particular, subjecting people’s behavior to the “guidance of rules”—and the Rule-of-Law characteristics enable law to perform this function (cf. Hart 1994). That is what makes characteristics like consistency and non-retroactivity distinctively legal virtues. Raz (2019; cf. 1979) argued against such accounts and defended an alternative proposal: the Rule of Law constitutes “the specific virtue of the law as law” because “[it] protects us from wrongs for which the law’s existence creates opportunities.” Raz maintained that the specific wrong that is risked wherever law exists is “abuse of power,” and the Rule-of-Law characteristics mitigate this risk.

Both natural lawyers and more moderate non-positivists have questioned the adequacy of such explanations. Natural lawyers maintain that the Fullerian Rule-of-Law characteristics do not exhaust the class of distinctively legal virtues. It is not just characteristics like generality or publicity that make a legal system better as a legal system, but also the degree to which the system conforms to moral requirements. The striking claim that the moral merits of law are kind-relative merits has arguably supplanted, as the core natural-law thesis, the traditional dictum regarding unjust laws. Natural lawyers have defended the thesis in different ways. Some argue that a system of norms is better as a legal system when it is morally good because “prototypical” or “characteristic” examples of legal systems are either morally good or aim at morally good outcomes (Finnis 1980, cf. Murphy 2005/06). Others treat legal norms as commands that presuppose that subjects have moral reasons to comply, commands that are defective as commands when the relevant presuppositions are false (Alexy 2010/21, Murphy 2012). A more recent approach treats law as an artifact that serves the function of creating a sense of obligation within the community, a function that is allegedly frustrated when the law is morally unjustified (Crowe 2019).

Although a detailed examination of these theories is not possible here, one issue that stands out is that the considerations natural lawyers invoke to explain why the moral merits of law are kind-relative merits do not seem consistent with, or informed by, a general theory of kind-relative virtue (Atiq 2025a: 36–43). For instance, not every prototypical feature of knives—such as having only a single sharp edge—bear on the kind-relative standard for being good as a knife. Likewise, not every regular use to which a knife can be put or function it might serve (e.g., to open containers) bears on the relevant standard. Mutatis mutandis for other goodness-fixing kinds. So, even if legal systems are prototypically good, or are often leveraged to promote morally good outcomes, that doesn’t necessarily explain why moral goodness would be a distinctively legal virtue.

In order to preserve explanatory unity, more moderate non-positivists agree with positivists that law’s kind-relative virtues should be understood narrowly—in more or less Fullerian terms—and explained, as kind-relative virtues usually are, as characteristics that enable the law to perform its constitutive function(s); but they levy a different challenge. The thinly described functions that positivists take to be constitutive of law, such as subjecting conduct to the guidance of rules, may not explain all of the Rule-of-Law virtues. For instance, while the law must be consistent and non-retroactive to effectively guide conduct, it is not so clear why it must also be general in application rather than particular. Explaining the full spectrum of Rule-of-Law virtues may require identifying some other function that law constitutively serves, perhaps a function that must be understood in essentially normative terms, such as fostering “procedural fairness” in society (Atiq 2025b).

How do such claims about law’s functions or virtues relate to the Separation Thesis? Natural lawyers have given a broad range of mostly non-definitive answers to this question (see discussion in Murphy 2012). Meanwhile, positivists maintain that the claims are entirely consistent with positivist criteria of legal validity. For instance, Shapiro (2011) embraces the notion that legal systems are systems of interlocking norms adopted as part of an overarching “plan” with a “moral aim”—namely, the realization of the general good. However, he argues that even if “it is part of the nature of law to have a moral aim” that doesn’t entail that “the failure to attain this end undermines the law’s identity as law,” and so the moral goodness of a legal system isn’t a precondition for its existence or for the legality of individual norms (p392). The proposal confronts various challenges concerning what it means to attribute a shared moral plan to members of a community (see Plunkett 2013). Another problem with Shapiro’s argument is that although it is true that instances of functional kinds can be more or less at good at performing kind-functions, radical failures to perform kind-functions do seem to interfere with kind-membership (consider a blunt piece of scrap metal intended as a knife but that’s entirely useless at cutting things). If that’s right, then a system’s radical failure to realize law’s moral or normative aims may well prevent it from qualifying as a legal system, an implication that threatens the Separation Thesis. But these issues are far from settled. One productive upshot of recent debates is the growing recognition that a satisfying account of law’s nature will invariably need a view on more general concepts and phenomena of philosophical interest, such as artifacts, functions, and kind-relative evaluation.

1.3 The Normativity of Law

It is widely assumed that the law makes a genuine difference to what subjects have reason to do independently of its content. But why should the law make a content-independent normative difference and how does it purport to guide its subjects? The Command Theory offers a simple answer: our reasons for obeying the law are of the same species as reasons for complying with the gunman’s threat (“your money or your life”). The motivational psychology of the obedient can be explained in terms of ordinary prudence and the belief that the law’s threats are credible. As discussed previously, early legal positivists, such as Bentham (1893), Austin (1832), and Kelsen (1945) took coercion to be an essential feature of law, one that distinguishes it from other normative domains. Their analysis of law and legal content entailed a straightforwardly reductive account of legal normativity.

Despite its enduring influence outside of philosophy, the account is widely seen as inadequate. Hart argued that the law’s sanctions, unlike the gunman’s threats, are viewed by participants within legal practice as justified, and deviations from legal norms tend to be criticized in ways that are hard to square with the Command Theory and its “predictive” model of the psychology of the compliant (Hart 1961, 82, cf. Kelsen 1945). However, Hart didn’t clarify why people regard the law’s sanctions as justified or, for that matter, the ingredient thoughts that make up “the internal point of view”—that is, the normative attitudes of officials who view the law as “worth following” (see discussion in Holton 1998, Toh 2005, Kaplan 2023a). Still, Hart’s criticisms are generally viewed as successful and have been developed further. One problem with the Command Theory is that it doesn’t explain the reasons many of the law’s subjects and legal officials have for following the law when the content of legal norms is unclear or subject to reasonable disagreement.

A more promising approach is found in Joseph Raz’s (1994) account of legal authority. Raz argued that the law is, essentially, an authoritative institution: it is a de facto practical authority and “claims” legitimate authority. A practical authority mediates between subjects and their reasons for action by issuing directives ostensibly based on those reasons. An authority is legitimate if and only if subjects are more likely to do what they have independent reasons to by following the authority’s directives instead of trying to figure out for themselves what’s reasonable. For example, the legal directive to stay under the speed limit is an instance of legitimate authority because by following it drivers respond to their reasons more effectively than if they tried to figure out the appropriate speed in the various circumstances one encounters on the road.

Raz’s theory suggests that subjects have content-independent reasons to comply with the law insofar as the law is a legitimate authority. The theory also has implications concerning legal content that are favorable to Exclusive Legal Positivism (see 1.1). If the law consists of authoritative directives, legal norms must stem from agents capable of forming an opinion on how subjects ought to behave, distinct from the subjects’ own judgments about their reasons for action. If the law claims legitimate authority, it must be the kind of thing that’s capable of making or presupposing such claims. In short, authority requires authorship. Additionally, the content of an authoritative directive must be identifiable in a way that doesn’t defeat the point of the directive, which is to settle the question of what subjects should do. Raz concluded from these considerations that the content of legal norms must be discernible independently of moral or other evaluative considerations. Raz’s argument directly challenges theories that treat “unauthored” moral norms as law as well as those that treat morality as a possible criterion of legal validity (see discussion of Inclusive Legal Positivism in 1.1). But the argument’s starting points, including the assumption that all legal norms must fit the model of a directive, are contested (see generally Kramer 2004).

A different puzzle about legal normativity stems from the positivist thesis that legal norms are essentially grounded in social conventions. Some legal philosophers claim that conventional rules cannot, by themselves, obligate. For instance, Leslie Green (1996, 1967) observes that Hart’s “view that the fundamental rules [of recognition] are ‘mere conventions’ [sits] uneasily with any notion of obligation,” which Green considers a problem because the rules of recognition point to “sources [of law] that judges are legally bound to apply.” Others argue that legal conventions are coordinating conventions in Lewis’ (1968) sense, but distinguishable in that subjects are morally obligated to solve the underlying coordination problems (cf. Finnis 1989). An influential approach takes law’s fundamental conventions to be constitutive rules, similar to the rules of games and other social activities. The practices constituted by such rules realize unique values that may, in turn, ground reasons to participate or otherwise support the practice, at least conditional on one’s interests. Some philosophers appeal to the Rule of Law: legal systems that conform to the Fullerian requirements realize something of moral value independently of the substantive content of legal norms (Fuller 1978, Waldron 2008). One problem for this view is that a legal system’s compliance with the Rule of Law is compatible with a great deal of injustice and oppression, so it’s unclear how the Rule of Law can underwrite a general obligation to follow or support the law (Kramer 2007). In fact, one might conclude from these difficulties that subjects’ reasons for complying with the law can only be grounded in their own subjective attitudes, such as respect for the law (cf. Raz 1979), or their prior commitments to obey the law (see Valentini 2024, Jimenez forthcoming).

Some of these discussions concerning our obligations risk conflating two different issues. The moral question of whether judges, or anybody else, should respect the rules of a legal system can only be resolved by moral and more broadly normative arguments. This question is extensively discussed in the literature on political obligation (see the entries on political obligation and legal obligation.) At the same time, there is arguably a practice-internal sense of obligation on which an agent who participates in a practice—say, a judge or some other official within a legal system—is obligated to follow its rules. A referee in a soccer game is “obliged” to follow the rules of the game, and the fact that the game is conventional poses no difficulty in making sense of this notion. Some construe this sense of obligation in terms of a practice’s “perspective” on our genuine practice-independent obligations (Raz 2009, Coleman 2011). The challenge, on this view, is to explain what it means for a practice to have a perspective on what agents should do, and in a way that’s compatible with a range of complex arguments and constructions involving the “internal” ought (see e.g., Perry 2023). Others invoke practice-internal norms and practice-internal values to explain the relevant species of deontic judgments (Kaplan 2023b), and endeavor to clarify the scope and force of official “obligations” to follow the law in terms of legal content (Atiq 2019). On either approach, a legal obligation to follow the law doesn’t settle the moral question. Even if law, unlike soccer or chess, is a kind of practice that people have a practice-independent obligation to participate in, the latter must emerge from all things considered normative considerations.

Notably, the existence of a distinctly legal concept of obligation, or distinctly legal reasons, remains very much contested (Greenberg 2014; Enoch 2011; Wodak 2019, forthcoming). Some (e.g., Enoch) argue that there is no deep difference in the way that legal norms affect subjects’ reasons for action compared to other types of norms. Meanwhile, proponents of the One System View treat claims about legal obligation as identical to, or at least grounded in, claims about moral obligation (Greenberg 2014, Hershovitz 2015). Still others have endeavored to make sense of practice-internal deontic claims as expressive of a speaker’s “acceptance” of the practice and its norms (Toh 2005/10, Finlay & Plunkett 2018) or, even, as a kind of pretense or “fiction” concerning what agents should do (Wodak 2019, forthcoming).

This concludes our review of the main substantive debates in general jurisprudence. In recent years, there has been some impetus to shift the focus away from the Hart-Dworkin debate, the Separation Thesis, and other traditional issues (see e.g., Hershovitz 2015). As discussed, there is growing interest in the artifactual and functional nature of law (Burazin et al. 2018, Marmor 2023, Ehrenberg 2016, Atiq 2025a). Another new and potentially fruitful avenue of research draws on the philosophy of language to shed light on questions of legal interpretation and legal content (see e.g., Asgeirsson 2015, Marmor 2014, Wodak forthcoming). This linguistic turn is not uncontroversial, however, given skepticism among some legal philosophers about the idea that legal interpretation is fundamentally a linguistic enterprise (Greenberg 2011, Dworkin 1986). Finally, there is growing interest in clarifying the metaphysical notions—such as of grounding and essence—that legal philosophers use to state their central theses (Rosen 2010, Marmor 2023). Some of these more methodological debates are the focus of Part 2.

2. The Methodology of Jurisprudence

Methodological debates in jurisprudence concern both its subject matter—that is, what a philosophical account of law is supposed to be an account of—and the explanatory demands that a satisfying account is supposed to meet. There are five main approaches to these issues that we’ll discuss in turn. One view takes the subject of investigation to be a concept of law, and jurisprudence to be a form of conceptual analysis. This approach is often associated with Hart’s influential work: The Concept of Law (1994). A second approach is skeptical of conceptual methodologies and takes legal philosophy to be in the business of offering a metaphysical or reductive explanation of law itself, not some concept of it. A third approach conceives of general jurisprudence as another branch of meta-normative inquiry, which renders it continuous with other subfields in philosophy like metaethics. A fourth view—the prescriptive approach—focuses on practical questions such as whether adopting a positivist or non-positivist conception of law leads to better social outcomes. A fifth view, associated principally with Dworkin’s work, takes legal theory to be a fundamentally “interpretive” enterprise that is both descriptive and evaluative. A general issue these methodological debates raise is whether and to what extent moral commitments must shape or constrain an account of law’s nature.

2.1 Conceptual Analysis

Some theorists take a concept of law to be the primary target of philosophical analysis. Their goal is to characterize the concept in a way that is compatible with our intuitions about it (or about cognate concepts of legal validity, legal obligation, and the like). But what does it mean to characterize a concept? Depending on one’s theory of concepts (see the entry on concepts), it might mean characterizing the concept’s criteria of application (on a classical/criterial theory), typical and atypical instances (on a prototype/exemplar theory), or the concept’s functional role in reasoning and action (on a broadly use-theoretic or inferential approach). The characterization is constrained by our conceptual intuitions, which might include extensional judgments regarding the instances that fall under the concept, as well as judgments about a priori connections across distinct concepts. To illustrate, a criterial theorist offers an account of the necessary and sufficient criteria for correctly applying the concept of law to norms or systems of norms. The account’s success turns on whether it yields intuitively correct results about particular cases and does so in an explanatorily satisfying way as opposed to an ad hoc manner. For a more in-depth discussion of the methodology of conceptual analysis in legal philosophy, see Raz (2004), Shapiro (2011, 16–22).

A key question this approach raises concerns the source and reliability of the ‘raw data’ for the theory—namely, our basic conceptual intuitions. What does it take have the right intuitions about the concept of law? Jurisprudence has been strongly influenced by two competing answers to this question.

The first takes reliable conceptual intuitions to be mainly a matter of linguistic competence. That is, to possess the concept of law one simply needs to know the semantic rules associated with the word “law” as it’s employed in juridical contexts (in contrast, e.g., to scientific usage). This sort of view was famously discussed in chapters 1 and 2 of Dworkin’s Law’s Empire (Dworkin 1986, 32, 43–46). It traces back to the kind of ordinary language philosophy that’s associated with L. Wittgenstein, J.L. Austin and Gilbert Ryle. Recently, philosophers who endorse similar methodological assumptions but hope to canvas a broader range of intuitions have adopted the methods of social psychology to test how the “folk” use the legal concept to classify cases that feature in philosophical thought experiments (see e.g., Flannagan & Hannikainen 2022).

But the linguistic account of conceptual intuition faces serious challenges. Perhaps the biggest source of concern is that it implies an account of legal theories that is vulnerable to Dworkin’s (1986, 43–46) “semantic sting” argument, which can be summarized as follows. If legal theories are “semantic” in nature, then disagreements about the grounds of legal validity must boil down to disagreements about the criteria for applying the term “law” correctly. But now a dilemma arises. Either legal practitioners possess the same concept or they do not. If they possess the same concept, then it seems they cannot fail to agree about the grounds of legal validity. After all, if they have the same concept, they should know the criteria for applying the associated term correctly and hence the grounds. But this is implausible since legal practice is rife with disagreement about the grounds of legal validity (see 1.1). On the other hand, if legal practitioners do not share the same concept of law, then their disagreements must be a case of talking past each other. But that, too, is implausible. Fundamental disagreements among sophisticated practitioners, as Dworkin puts it, is not “a grotesque joke” (Dworkin 1986, 44; but see Plunkett & Sundell 2013). Accordingly, there must be something wrong with construing legal theories as semantic accounts of the criteria for applying the word “law” correctly.

Dworkin concluded based on his argument that legal theories aren’t exercises in conceptual analysis. One could accept this conclusion without adopting Dworkin’s own account of what legal theorists are really up to (see discussion in 2.2 and 2.5). Alternatively, a defender of conceptual analysis might respond that “concept mastery” is not simply a matter of knowing the rules that govern the associated term. On this way of going, concept mastery involves possessing a wide range of substantive beliefs or intuitions about a concept in circumstances of full information and having been exposed to a broad range of counterfactual considerations. This richer view of conceptual analysis in legal theory is discussed in, e.g., Raz (2004, 4–7); Stravopoulos (2012, 78–79); Shapiro (2011, 16–22); Finnis (2007: p. 276), and Atiq (2025a: 4–9, 59–65). It is perhaps also the sort of view presupposed by Hart. On this view, legal practitioners might use the same concept of law and be perfectly competent with the semantic rules associated with legal terminology, yet nevertheless disagree about the law’s grounds because they haven’t fully understood the concept or its application conditions.

Even if this approach avoids Dworkin’s semantic sting, it remains vulnerable to other criticisms (Marmor 2011, 215–217; Raz 2004, 10; Leiter 2007, 177–79). One question it raises is whose concept of law, exactly, constitutes the proper target of legal theory. Is it a concept of law possessed by legal practitioners in a particular jurisdiction (or embraced by philosophers at elite universities)? Or is it a universally shared concept? Worries loom either way. If the target is a “local” concept, then legal theory seems parochial in a way that philosophy aspires not to be. If it’s a universally shared concept, it’s unclear why there are any interesting truths to discover beyond obvious platitudes accessible through linguistic competence alone. It’s worth noting, here, that this is an instance of a more general puzzle about how a philosophical analysis of a shared concept can be both correct and informative at the same time (see the entry on analysis). And there a range of responses to the general problem that might be applicable here as well (see e.g., Chalmers & Jackson 2001).

A different question the approach raises is why we should care about anybody’s concept of law in the first place (Marmor 2013, 216–217; Leiter 2007, 177–79; Raz 2004, 7, 10). Granted, there are interesting sociological questions to be asked about what various groups of people believe about law. But it is not obvious that there is anything distinctively philosophical about such questions. Philosophers, on a standard conception, are interested in what people believe about a given concept as a route to understanding what the concept refers to (Raz 2004, 4, 10). Accordingly, one might think that what legal theories aim to capture is not anybody’s concept of law, but rather the nature of law itself.

This challenge can be addressed in a few different ways. One response treats law as a social phenomenon that’s partly constituted by people’s own understanding of it. On this view, people’s conceptual intuitions about law ground what law really is (Stravopoulos 2012, 79; cf. Raz 1979: 221, Raz 2001). Still, one might wonder why we should limit ourselves to asking questions about concepts if law can be studied directly. A different response to the problem emphasizes connections between the concept of law and other core concepts of philosophical interest (of normativity, artifacts, and so on). On this view, philosophical interest in the concept of law is part of a larger effort to keep our overall conceptual scheme in order. A third and more radical response embraces a Platonic conception of concepts, according to which they are not mental representations at all, or even necessarily tied to words or language, but rather abstract objects akin to the objects of mathematical inquiry. Accordingly, it is an abstract object—the concept of law—that philosophers investigate using their a priori methods (cf. Bealer 1998). This account faces familiar epistemic puzzles about access and how different people who all determinately grasp the same concept of law could end up disagreeing about its nature (Sarch 2010, 468–73). One might respond to this epistemic challenge by embracing pluralism: there are as many Platonic concepts as there are consistent definitions. But the question we raised earlier arises again: why care about some philosopher’s favorite concept as opposed to any other concept? In any case, one point of similarity between the Platonic view and the reductive approach we are about to discuss is that both consider the primary target of investigation to be something that admits of an objective characterization independently of anyone’s conception of it.

2.2 Metaphysical Reduction

Given their doubts about conceptual analysis, some theorists have proposed that legal theories are primarily in the business of describing and explaining the nature of law itself. More precisely, “reductionist” views take illuminating the nature of law to be a matter of explaining what the law is, and how it operates, in terms of more fundamental facts (Rosen 2010, Marmor 2023). A successful reduction would demonstrate that legal facts are constituted by, or fully grounded in, other more foundational facts in the way that the facts of chemistry might be reduced to the facts of physics. Construed along these lines, positivism reduces facts about what the law is to social facts—e.g., facts about people’s behavior, beliefs and dispositions. Reductionist views needn’t completely eschew the methods discussed in 2.1, but they must offer a different explanation of the relevance of intuition. For a more in-depth discussion of these issues, see Rosen (2010), Schroeder (2007, 61–83), Chilovi & Pavlakos (2019); and Marmor (2023); as well as the entries on metaphysical grounding and scientific reduction.

Notably, reductionists face a version of the “shared subject matter” objection to conceptualist views. What ensures that legal philosophers are all investigating the same set of facts or phenomenon? Why assume, in particular, that non-positivists are in the business of explaining the ostensibly social phenomenon that interests positivists? Such questions are pressing both because law—understood as a kind of norm or normative system—is not something we easily pick out by ostensive reference (contrast scientific phenomena), and because legal philosophers tend not to share the same starting points or a priori intuitions about their subject. So, there is a risk of talking past here just as there is on the conceptual view. One possibility is that there is enough overlap in starting points for exchange between positivists and non-positivists to be productive even if there isn’t a single shared subject matter. It may turn out that legal philosophers are interested in a range of distinct but related facts that invite reduction and that raise a common set of explanatory puzzles concerning, e.g., their normativity.

One reductionist approach, prominently defended by Brian Leiter (2007), is known as “naturalized jurisprudence.” Like other reductionist views, naturalized jurisprudence takes the aim of legal theories to be explaining the nature of law itself (not anybody’s concept of law). But a distinguishing characteristic is the insistence on a purely empirical methodology and rejection of intuitionistic or a priori methods (see the entry on naturalism in legal philosophy.). Leiter (2007: 81, 180–99, 184) argues that our intuitions about law are too unreliable to be afforded much epistemic weight (as others have argued with respect to intuitions in other areas of philosophy; cf. Cummins 1998, Johnston & Leslie 2012). Instead, “philosophical theorizing [should be] continuous with and dependent upon scientific theorizing” (Leiter 2007: p35). The way to achieve such continuity is for legal philosophers to determine which “concept of law figures in the most powerful explanatory and predictive models of legal phenomena such as judicial behavior” (p184). But a question arises as to why judicial behavior, in particular, invites explanation and prediction as opposed to, say, people’s judgments about law more broadly. More generally, the naturalist must motivate their account of the “legal phenomena” that invite explication. On a broader conception of our explanatory goals, it may turn out that naturalized jurisprudence is just one part of, and so largely compatible with, a version of the conceptual view where the express goal is “to develop a concept for use in a theoretical explanation,” albeit an explanation, in part, of shared intuitions (Finnis 2007: p276).

2.3 Metanormative Inquiry

Perhaps the conceptual and reductive methodologies, properly understood, aren’t as incompatible as they might appear. On some conceptions of general jurisprudence, e.g., construed as just another branch of “metanormative” inquiry (partly inspired by H. Kelsen’s theory of normativity; see the entry on the pure theory of law), there is room for both methodologies. Plunkett and Shapiro (2017) point out that the goal of meta-normative inquiry is to explain how normative thought, talk, and entities (if any) fit into reality. Metaethics is one branch of metanormative inquiry, which focuses on how ethical thought, talk and entities (if any) fit into reality. Metalegal inquiry is another branch that similarly investigates both legal language and legal reality. The key insight, here, is that there is more than one question or set of questions that legal philosophers should be interested in. Thus, instead of replacing other methodologies, the meta-normative view, if sound, simply rejects a privileged starting point for jurisprudential inquiry. Some theorists might start with the metaphysics of legal content or systems of law. Others might privilege semantic analyses of legal statements. What matters is whether our commitments are compatible overall and can be subsumed under a general and more comprehensive theory.

2.4 Prescriptive Ethics

The methodologies we’ve discussed so far are, or at least purport to be, descriptive. By contrast, some approaches to understanding law are explicitly prescriptive: their goal is to identify a conception of law whose adoption by, say, judges, lawyers, and others will lead to desirable outcomes, regardless of whether the conception is consistent with what law really is or our pre-theoretical understanding of law.

One prominent advocate of an exclusively prescriptive project is Neil MacCormick (MacCormick 1985; see also Campbell 1996; Murphy 2001; Postema 1989; Schauer 1996; Waldron 2001, Jiménez 2023). MacCormick (1986, 35–36) argues that there are compelling normative arguments in favor of adopting a positivist conception of law. In particular, he suggests that values like autonomy and freedom of conscience militate in favor of keeping the question of what the law requires entirely separate from the question of what morality requires, at least in certain spheres of conduct governed by law. The idea seems to be that a legal system is more likely to promote the relevant values when its core practices (e.g., adjudication) are regulated by, and its officials believe in, the Separation Thesis (see 1.1). Other theorists have contended the exact opposite—namely, that positivist thinking has contributed to the failure of lawyers to adequately respond to injustices perpetrated by legal orders (Radbruch 2006).

The normative questions raised by the prescriptive approach are surely significant, but needn’t be in competition with the questions raised by either the conceptual or the reductionist approach. It might turn out that positivism provides the best account of a shared concept of law, or perhaps the best reductive account of legal facts, even though there are reasons for changing our practices or adopting a new concept that, say, comports with natural law theory. That said, some of the interest in prescriptive accounts likely traces to the worry that legal theories purporting to be purely descriptive are pushing some hidden ideological or political agenda (for more on this, see, e.g., John Gardner’s introduction to Dickson 2004). In fact, it has recently been suggested that the debate between positivists and anti-positivists is “tacitly” a “meta-linguistic negotiation” over how to use the term “law,” a debate that is fueled, ultimately, by competing commitments in “ethics … about how we should live and what kind of institutions should govern our lives” (Plunkett 2016). This is a controversial view in part because it implies that philosophers who expressly reject the prescriptive characterization are mired in a form of false consciousness. But perhaps the descriptive-prescriptive divide in legal theory is not as sharp as it might appear. We turn, finally, to methodologies on which evaluation and prescription have an essential role to play in descriptive legal theory.

2.5 Constructive Interpretation

Perhaps the most influential argument that legal theory is inherently evaluative proceeds from the premise that legal theory is an interpretive endeavor in Dworkin’s (1961) sense. Recall that legal practitioners, on Dworkin’s portrayal, interpret the social practices within their system in a way that’s guided by both considerations of “fit” and “justification” (see 1.1). The justificatory aspect of interpretation involves coming up with an account of legal content that doesn’t just broadly fit what people say and do in the community, but that’s morally attractive to some extent. Dworkin maintained that philosophers should embrace the same approach to understanding legal content. Their goal shouldn’t be analyzing some concept or reducing legal facts to more foundational facts. Rather, it should be reconstructing the behavior and self-understandings of participants within legal practice in a way that portrays the practice in a positive light (Dworkin 1986; Perry 1995, 129–31; see also Nye 2021 and the entry on legal interpretivism).

An interesting upshot of Dworkin’s view is that assessments of theoretical adequacy in jurisprudence require moral evaluation, which would seem to make legal theory an inherently evaluative project. Deciding whether some philosopher’s interpretation of legal practice is “correct” involves taking a stand on which of the available ways of construing the practice is morally optimal. Of course, this doesn’t necessarily require asserting that the law, on any particular construal, is good—full stop. But it does seem to require saying that some interpretations of legal practice are in some sense morally better than others. For example, one way in which an interpretation might be “morally better” is if it portrays participants in legal practice as well-intentioned rather than malicious. However, the precise criteria for morally evaluating competing theories on the interpretivist approach remain unclear.

Critics of the argument from interpretation maintain that a core premise on which it depends is unmotivated (see Dickson 2001, 105). Why assume that understanding all legal phenomena—including the content of the law, the necessary and sufficient conditions for the existence of a legal system, and the nature of legal obligation—requires interpreting legal practice? Even if the interpretivist turns out to be right about what legal practitioners are up to in adjudication (though even that’s contested; see 1.1), it wouldn’t follow that philosophers should embrace their assumptions, at least not without further argument. The interpretivist might respond that there is no other interesting or practically consequential notion of “legal content” besides the practice-internal notion, but that is debatable (the law, after all, isn’t just what legal officials say it is). A different response appeals to the connection between legal content and communication. It is often argued that the content of the law depends on the content of speech acts, and determining the content of speech acts requires interpretation (see 1.3). However, even if understanding the law requires interpretation of some kind or other, it does not follow that it requires a constructive interpretation in Dworkin’s sense—i.e., attributing content or meaning to speech acts in a way that casts speakers in a morally good light (Marmor 2011, 127–28). And the latter claim is what proponents of the argument from interpretation need to establish.

A different argument for the importance of evaluation in legal theory appeals to the “internal point of view” that legal practitioners tend to adopt towards the law (see part 1). Taking the internal point of view towards the law seems to involve endorsing it, seeing it as in some sense justified or as providing reasons for action (Shapiro 2011, 96–97; Perry 1995, 99–100). An adequate theory of law must account for the nature of this point of view insofar as it is essential to law, and since it involves a positive evaluation of the law, one might infer that an adequate theory of law must engage in evaluation. One finds versions of this argument in, e.g., Perry (1995, 121–25) and Waldron (2001, 423–28.). But whether it succeeds remains unclear. In general, it seems we can explain the kinds of considerations that others endorse without endorsing those considerations ourselves. It is thus unclear why understanding legal practitioners’ endorsement of the law in their respective jurisdictions should require viewing their law (or the law in general) as valuable or justified.

In the end, “methodological pluralism” may be the most apt characterization of the state of play in jurisprudence. As we’ve seen, a key dividing line concerns whether an account of law’s nature needs to be informed by commitments in ethics. The conceptual and reductive approaches seem to allow that there can be purely descriptive accounts of law—i.e., accounts that describe and explain the nature of law without being committed to any moral or all-things-considered evaluations of the law (or of anything else). Meanwhile, the prescriptive and interpretive approaches question both the value and possibility of understanding law without regard to moral considerations. It shouldn’t escape the reader’s notice that this methodological debate about the inherently normative nature of legal theorizing mirrors one at the substantive level: the principal point of contention in jurisprudence is whether moral and more broadly normative facts have an essential role to play in determining legal content, in securing the existence of a legal system, and in explaining law’s normativity. This is no coincidence. One’s substantive views about a subject likely inform one’s sense of the best methodology for understanding it. Thus, e.g., interpretivists and proponents of the “one system view” who conceive of legal norms as genuinely normative, or as identical to moral norms, are more likely to insist that jurisprudence is continuous with ethics. Despite such disagreements, the fact that adherents of these competing traditions continue to engage productively suggests that there are probably multiple projects worth pursuing as part of a shared effort to understand the nature of law and legal practice.

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Emad Atiq <eatiq@cornell.edu>
Andrei Marmor <am2773@cornell.edu>
Alexander Sarch <a.sarch@surrey.ac.uk>

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