Figure 1 description

Three parallel connected diagrams stacked vertically. Seven horizontally equidistant vertical lines go through the diagrams and are labelled, left to right, as “atomic”, “molecular”, “macro-molecule”, “uni-cellular”, “smaller metazoan”, “larger metazoan”, and “socio-cultural ecological”.

The top diagram is labelled “a: regular periodic”, A sine-wave like line goes from left to right with the apex of each wave intersecting a vertical line and the nadir falling half-way between the lines. The intersections have little images representing the label of the line (e.g., “atomic” is represented by a diagram of an atom while “socio-cultural ecological” has a compressed city).

The second is labelled “b: random fluctuations”. It has a line many ups and downs. Above the line is written “(wrong choice of variables?)”.

The third diagram is labelled “c: dissipative wave: (pro-reduction?)”. Diagram c has a wave with the same high points as in Diagram a but the amplitude declines as it goes from left to right; the wave is also labeled halfway with “entification greater at lower levels” and at the end “OUR WORLD?”.