Supplement to Theories of Meaning

Long descriptions for some figures in Theories of Meaning

Figure 1 description

Figures 1, 2, and 3 are similar.

The figure 1 title is “The relationship between character and content (a first pass)”. The figure consists of four blocks of text:

  1. “Character (a function from contexts of utterance to contents)” which connects to the next item with a plus sign
  2. “Context of utterance (the situation in which the expression is uttered)” which has an arrow pointing to the next item
  3. “Content” which in turn has an arrow pointing to the next item
  4. “Reference”

Figure 2 description

Figures 1, 2, and 3 are similar.

The figure 2 title is “The relationship between character, context, content, and circumstance in double-indexing semantics.”. The figure consists of five blocks of text:

  1. “Character (a function from contexts of utterance to contents)” which connects to the next item with a plus sign
  2. “Context of utterance (the situation in which the expression is uttered)” which has an arrow pointing to the next item
  3. “Content” which connects to the next item with a plus sign
  4. “Circumstance of evaluation (state of the world relevant to the determination of the truth of the sentence, as uttered in the context)” which has an arrow pointing to the next item
  5. “Reference”

Figure 3 description

Figures 1, 2, and 3 are similar.

The figure 3 title is “The role of intensions in possible world semantics”. The figure consists of five blocks of text:

  1. “Character (a function from contexts of utterance to intensions)” (note this is slightly different than the first item in figures 1 and 2) which connects to the next item with a plus sign
  2. “Context of utterance” which has an arrow pointing to the next item
  3. “Intension (a function from circumstances of evaluation to the expression’s reference with respect to that circumstance” which connects to the next item with a plus sign
  4. “Circumstance of evaluation” which has an arrow pointing to the next item
  5. “Reference”

Figure 4 description

The figure 4 title is “The relationship between Fregean content, Russellian content, intensions, and reference”. The figure consists of four vertical rows with each row having a title, a list with an associated downward pointing triangle (except for the bottom row), and a description (again except the last). From top to bottom:

  1. “Fregean contents” with the list of F1 F2 F3 … and a description “indefinitely many Fregean contents can be modes of presentation of a single Russellian content, R1”
  2. “Russellian contents” with a list of R1 R2 R3 … and a description “indefinitely many Russellian contents can share the same reference at every circumstance of evaluation, and hence determine a single intension, I1”
  3. “Intensions” with a list of I1 I2 I3 … and a description “indefinitely many intensions (i.e., functions from circumstances to a reference) can, with respect to a single circumstance, have the same value (i.e., reference), o1”
  4. “Reference” with a list of o1 o2 o3 …

Copyright © 2019 by
Jeff Speaks <jspeaks@nd.edu>

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