Medieval Political Philosophy

First published Fri Jan 10, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Cary Nederman and Alessandro Mulieri replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous authors.]

Someone unfamiliar with the Middle Ages in the Western Christian, Jewish, and Islamic worlds might evince doubts about whether political philosophy existed at all during that period. Weren’t these forms of religious thought and practice monolithic, theocratic, even authoritarian, leaving no room for philosophical reflection about political matters? The answer is: Once one jettisons superficial assumptions, one finds that, between roughly 900 and 1400 AD, vital, diverse, and sophisticated theorizing about politics was produced by Christians, Jews, and Muslims alike. Moreover, the impact of medieval political philosophy continued to be felt in Western and Eastern cultures long after the close of the Middle Ages. Many key ideas about law, power, and the relationship between religion and politics that were debated during the medieval era resonated for centuries thereafter—and even today. Nor were these three traditions sealed off from one another. Rather, considerable cross-fertilization occurred. In particular, philosophers in the Islamic world enjoyed access to the writings of ancient Greek philosophers such as Plato and Aristotle during a time when they were virtually unknown in the Christian West. Eventually, these classical texts, along with commentaries on them, were transmitted to Europe by means of their translation from Arabic, Hebrew or Greek languages into Latin. In sum, the political philosophies pioneered during the Middle Ages can lay valid claim to a place at the table alongside those of Greco-Roman antiquity and of post-medieval vintage.

1. The Scope of Medieval Political Philosophy

In the popular imagination, the Middle Ages is often equated with the “Dark Ages”, a period during which culture and reason gave way to social disintegration and the excesses of mystical faith. In part, this unfavorable estimation arises from a failure to realize that historical periodization involves judgments of value which are themselves political or ideological. The very term “Middle Ages” stamps an entire civilization as a kind of interregnum between what was “really” important, namely, classical times—usually meaning Plato, Aristotle, and perhaps Cicero and Seneca—and modernity. Yet reality is much more muddled than such tidy categories would imply. In fact, any era of history is inextricably linked to its past, however despised or revered. After the collapse of the Western half of the Roman Empire, people living in the Eastern part of the Empire continued to read and comment on many Greek classics. Moreover, after the spread of Islam in the eighth century throughout the Middle East and the Mediterranean world, Islamic and Jewish scholars possessed access to the great texts of ancient Greek philosophy, as the result of a comprehensive attempt in the Middle Ages in the Islamic world to transmit Greek culture via a massive project of translating such works from Greek into Syriac and then into Arabic or directly from Greek into Arabic (Gutas 2000). Even in Western Europe, during a time in which most ancient Greek philosophy had been lost, the great twelfth-century English scholar and churchman John of Salisbury reminds us that we, like the students of any age, can see farther only because we are standing on the shoulders of the giants who came before us (John of Salisbury Metalogicon: 257).

People born during the period we term “medieval” continued to reflect on and write about political questions and problems; their texts abound in archives and libraries. Moreover, the philosophical observations generated during the Middle Ages form an important contribution to political thought. Medieval philosophers repeatedly addressed many of the issues which define “perennial” elements of political reflection. The intellectual in the Middle Ages, no less than in other eras, wanted to discover the qualities of the good polity and the proper roles and functions of the individual within society. He (or occasionally she) was concerned with the dilemmas posed by violence, corruption, and the abuse of authority, for example. Medieval scholars sought to expound and defend doctrines and ideas unknown to previous generations and to make sense of them in the light of the past. The hegemony of revealed religion, the persistence of pagan classical texts and ideas, and the development of new social and political structures—all of these factors shaped the distinctive philosophical outlooks on politics typical of writers during the Middle Ages. In turn, numerous attributes of medieval political practice and thought exercised a decisive influence on more recent history. Principles of law, government, liberty, and rights so cherished by modern citizens may be traced to medieval sources (Tierney 1982; Oakley 2010, 2012, 2015).

Before one can undertake a survey of medieval political philosophy, however, it is necessary to confront squarely the historiographical question of what counts as “medieval”. In the Islamic context, the Middle Ages coincides with what is often described as the “Golden Age of Islam”, a period between the eighth and fourteenth centuries in which Islam enjoyed unrivaled cultural, political, and economic hegemony in the Middle East, the Mediterranean, and North Africa. Islam reached as far as Spain—al-Andalus—and Sicily—Ṣiqilliyya—(the latter between the ninth and the eleventh centuries). During this period, the Islamic world saw the development of different forms of political power, which ranged from several Islamic caliphates (among others, the Umayyad, the Abbasid, the Fatimid mainly in the Middle East and North Africa, the Almoravids and Almohads in al-Andalus, the Kalbids in Sicily), many of which patronized the development of culture and the arts, to occasional city-states such as the taifa in Spain. In this context, philosophy was also used as an instrument to reflect on the structure of the ummah (the community of the believers) and the role and function of religion as law, but also the prerogatives of the ruler, who was often modeled along the lines of a Platonic philosopher-king (filtered through neo-Platonic ideas) and a prophet or imam (Abbés 2022; Butterworth 2004; Gutas 2004). A similar pattern could be observed among Jewish thinkers who lived in the Islamic and Christian worlds. For them, philosophy’s conceptual instruments were used to shed further light on social and political issues stemming from rules prescribed by Jewish divine law and jurisprudence. Scholars have debated about whether it is possible to talk about the existence of political philosophy in medieval Islamic and Jewish thought, given the strong interlinkage of metaphysics, theology, and philosophy that characterized political reflection in this period (Abbés 2022; Gutas 2004; Syros 2011b). However, several studies (Abbés 2022; O’Meara 2003) have shown that the tradition of late Platonism and Neo-Platonism in antiquity also contained a coherent political philosophy. This neo-Platonic framework played a crucial role in influencing how Islamic and Jewish medieval philosophers theorized about such genuinely political ideas as law, religion, human sociability, and government.

Scholars incline toward locating the origins of the Western Middle Ages properly speaking in a deep historical break—what the historian Robert I. Moore (2000) termed “the first European revolution”—occurring around the year 1000, marked by a series of fairly rapid social, political, economic, religious, and cultural changes. This period saw the formation of most of the main regional and institutional units that would persist well into the modern world and of the languages (post-classical Latin and the vernaculars) and cultural artifacts that came to define Western civilization. Of particular relevance to political philosophy was the emergence of codified legal systems—based on, but not slavishly beholden to, Roman law—as well as the circulation and study of classical non-Christian texts, first from Roman antiquity, and then gradually from ancient Greece, especially Aristotle, newly translated into Latin over the course of the thirteenth century (Baldwin 1971; Colish 1997). Not only were these sources investigated in their own right, but they were applied to and became fodder for the emergent political conflicts of the first half of the second millennium. Such controversies arose from a number of different disputes about the ordering of political authority: between the church (whether the pope, bishops, or the community of priests and believers generally) and temporal authorities (such as territorial princes, urban municipalities, and imperial power), between the Roman pontiff and the Holy Roman Emperor (both pretenders to a sort of universal jurisdiction), and between and within divergent regional units of secular power (from the universal emperor, to kings and lesser princes, to incorporated cities).

Two main features characterized political philosophy in the medieval period. First, it was the complex outcome of a dynamic interaction between theoretical and theological problems, encompassing also very practical concerns as well as ideological interests. Theorists continuously undertook practices of reading, interpreting, explaining, and writing in light of describing or understanding specific political settings that varied depending on context. For example, some Byzantine thinkers drew on Aristotle’s ideas to discuss the prerogatives of imperial power and its relationship to the mixed regime (Metochites Essays; see Kaldellis 2011). In Western Europe, after Aristotle’s Politics was translated from Greek into Latin around 1260 by William of Moerbeke (Flüeler 1992; Lambertini 1999), many Latin Christian thinkers used its ideas (in combination with Roman sources such as Cicero [Nederman 2020]) to analyze the political regimes that they knew best or to defend and/or attack specific typologies of government. Several writers used Aristotle to defend the mixed regime (Blythe 1992). Ptolemy of Lucca explained the Italian comunes of his own time by drawing on the idea of the Roman respublica alongside the Aristotelian notion of demokratìa, while Marsilius of Padua drew on Aristotelian language to attack the papal theory of plenitudo potestatis. Likewise, in medieval Jewish political thought, one finds considerable attention devoted to how the Platonic and Aristotelian ideas of the mixed regime reflect the monarchy that governed the Jews under Saul (Melamed 2003; Nelson 2010). Muslim thinkers discussed in depth how Aristotle’s political naturalism might help to conceptualize the ummah (Syros 2020). Quite often, in political treatises authored by Christian, Muslim, and Jewish authors, we find sentences such as “as it can be found in”, “as it happens today”, and “as can be seen in these days”, marking the topical nature of the ideas under discussion.

Second, political philosophy in the Middle Ages hardly separated considerations of power, government and society from ethical analysis. Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics, a text that enjoyed wide readership during the Middle Ages across the Christian (West and East), Islamic, and Jewish worlds, contains important teachings relevant to political philosophy. The Ethics was translated into Arabic and thereafter commented on by numerous figures, including al-Fārābī (the existence of whose commentary is widely reported, although today it is lost; see Neria 2013), Ibn Rushd, Ibn Bajja (who did not write a proper commentary but used this text in his works), and the Nasirean Ethics. The latter, written in Persian and then translated into Arabic (Naṣīr al-Dīn 1964) in the fourteenth century by al-Ǧurǧānī, exercised considerable influence on subsequent Muslim political thought. The Nicomachean Ethics was also known in the twelfth-century Byzantine world where, in the circle of Princess Anna Comnene, some authors—for example, Eustratius of Nicaea and Michael of Ephesus—wrote commentaries on it in Greek that were translated into Latin, along with the Nicomachean Ethics, by Robert Grosseteste in the thirteenth century. The number of commentaries on Aristotle’s text in the Christian Latin world is considerable (among others, it was commented on by Thomas Aquinas, Albert the Great, John Buridan, and Radulphus Brito as well as by several anonymous university professors or magistri). Consequently, political philosophy came to be defined as a science that deals with rules and actions of an ethical nature (on this debate see Gutas 2004; Abbès 2022; Melamed 2005; Syros 2011b). Islamic and Jewish philosophers often model political philosophy on the example of medicine and divide the former into theoretical and practical parts. These two elements roughly correspond to what we would today define as ethics and politics.

In the medieval Christian Latin world, an important debate about the status of practical philosophy may be found in many commentaries on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics and Politics. For example, medieval commentators discussed Nicomachean Ethics VI.8, according to which prudence and politics are the same dispositions but their essence is different (see Lambertini 2008), and some took Aristotle’s word politics in this passage to refer to practical science (including ethics and political philosophy). Commentators further discussed: (1) the relationship between ethics or moral science (scientia moralis) and politics or political science (scientia civilis); (2) the epistemic status of practical sciences vis-à-vis other theoretical sciences such as natural philosophy and metaphysics; and (3) the connection between practical philosophy and prudence as an intellectual virtue. (For an overview of these debates, see Costa 2010; Lambertini 2008 and 2021; Toste 2022.) As there are disagreements about how to reply to these questions, some authors (for example, Peter of Auvergne and John Buridan) clearly differentiate practical science (that is, politics as a form of scientific knowledge) from moral and political action as the domain of prudence, whereas others even ascribe to moral and political science the same apodictic status as metaphysics (see Marsilius of Padua). In fact, this would hardly be surprising, because in the Middle Ages political themes were very often intertwined with debates in theology, metaphysics, natural philosophy, and epistemology.

In sum, political philosophy during the Middle Ages, so far from being monotonous or monolithic, offers a diverse array of intellectual traditions and paths to the study of politics. The questions examined by its practitioners touch on nearly every topic that one would expect to find in philosophical investigations undertaken in ancient and modern times. Thus, wholesale rejection of the field as “merely medieval”, and consequently mired in arcane debates of little interest to political philosophers generally, represents a gross distortion of the actual historical record.

The following entry focuses on fifteen of the most consequential political philosophers in the medieval traditions of political thought between the tenth and the fifteenth centuries. The sections are arranged in roughly chronological order (in many instances the birth and/or death years of a particular figure are unknown). Within the Islamic world, attention is devoted to Al-Fārābī, Ibn Rushd, and Ibn Khaldūn. The primary Jewish philosopher surveyed is Moses Maimonides. The largest share of the entry concerns political philosophy in the Christian West (but there is also occasional attention to Byzantine thinkers such as Michael of Ephesus), both prior to the dissemination of Aristotle’s Politics and Nicomachean Ethics (John of Salisbury) and after those texts became available. This is because philosophical works that are specifically or exclusively devoted to political themes are more frequent in the Christian Western than in the Islamic and Jewish worlds. In the latter, far more often than in the Christian West, discussions of political ideas are contained within metaphysical, theological or epistemological treatises. Most of the Christian Western authors discussed were affiliated with the great universities of Western Europe, either as students or teachers or both. These include Thomas Aquinas (Paris and Cologne), Ptolemy of Lucca (Paris), James of Viterbo (Paris), John of Paris (Paris), Marsilius of Padua (Paris), William of Ockham (Oxford), and Nicole Oresme (Paris) as well as the numerous commentators on Aristotle’s Politics. Many of them also became enmeshed in the political conflicts of the age, especially between the papacy and various secular rulers. Thus, the writings of James, John, Marsilius, and Ockham in particular demand to be read against the backdrop of medieval politics. The sources of the education received by Dante Alighieri and Christine de Pizan are less certain, but both were steeped in the same classical and Christian texts as their university-trained colleagues.

One quality shared by the thinkers covered here is a deep concern about the relationship between public affairs and religion. Specifically, is temporal government a creation of God or of human beings (or perhaps some combination thereof)? This question immediately raises a set of ancillary issues about whether earthly rulers and communities should be assigned some function in the promotion of piety and worship, as well as whether they are required to submit to religious authority. The solutions offered to these dilemmas varied widely, however. Several of these philosophers regarded religion to be wholly or mainly irrelevant to human politics. Others viewed secular political power as a tool to be put in the service of the faith. Indeed, a few theorists went so far as to place religious persons and institutions under the direct control of temporal government. Whatever the answer given, the earthly dimensions of their respective religions were never far from the minds of medieval political philosophers.

2. Al-Fārābī

In a certain sense, one could argue that the very origins of political philosophy in the medieval world must be placed within the Islamic context. Before the eleventh century in the West, little discussion occurred about the topics we associate with political philosophy. The first milieu in which we find examples of thorough theoretical and philosophical debates with political implications is the Islamic context of the ninth and tenth centuries under the Abbasid caliphate and, more specifically, in the works of Islamic philosopher al-Fārābī (c. 870–950 CE). Little is known about al-Fārābī’s life, and its details are mostly obscure due to the lack of reliable historical sources (Orwin 2017: 5). Scholars have suggested that he was probably a Shia scholar of Turkmen or Persian origin and lived in Aleppo and Baghdad. He composed several philosophical-political works, among them The Enumeration of the Sciences, The Book of Religion, The Attainment of Happiness, a Summary of Plato’s Laws, The Political Regime, and Aphorisms of the Statesman. Al-Fārābī is also said to have composed a commentary on the Nicomachean Ethics, which is now lost. As is the case for most Islamic political philosophy, al-Fārābī’s works show a clear dependence on Plato, often filtered through neo-Platonic sources. However, scholars debate over whether al-Fārābī actually had direct access to Plato’s texts or just to paraphrases or fragments of them (Gutas 2004).

The complex relationship between philosophy and divine science or religion is the foundation of al-Fārābī’s political thought. He claims that philosophy, the knowledge of “the principles of the existents” which can help “the wise” achieve the attainment of happiness, is superior to religion because the latter “is a sketch of these things or of their images in the soul” (PR: 75). At the same time, religion is also the combination of opinions and rules “prescribed for a community by their first ruler”, where such an association can be “a tribe, a city or district, a great nation, or many nations” (Book of Religion: 93). Therefore, Fārābī s treatment of the relationship between philosophy and religion is also political. In fact, he claims that philosophers are kings and prophets and, to fuse Islamic beliefs with Greek philosophy, presents the ruler as a Platonic philosopher-king or an individual who has achieved moral and intellectual perfection. If the philosopher is also a prophet as well as the head of the ummah, this means that his political activity, i.e., his government of the masses of people who are not wise, must be studied in depth. Therefore, for al-Fārābī, philosophy in general, and political philosophy more particularly, is seen as a way to explain and clarify the content of Islamic revelation and its ethical and political implications for society as a whole. This is also the reason why Fārābī claims that political philosophy and political science have a central role in his ideas about the organization of human knowledge and the sciences. In fact, in his The Enumeration of Sciences (ES: 76–77), he ascribes a central role to political science in his classification of the sciences. He claims that political science (al-‘ilm al-madanī) also includes the dialectical study of theology (kalām) and Islamic jurisprudence (fiqh) and that it is the first and most important science, even more so than metaphysics.

In addition, al-Fārābī distinguishes theoretical and practical components of political science, anticipating Ibn Rushd and many other Jewish and Christian thinkers. Drawing a parallel with medicine, Fārābī explains that political science has a theoretical component that seeks the general and universal principles of moral and political behavior and a more practical and operative component which examines how these principles can help achieve the goals of human perfection. Therefore, the role of political science is also that of explaining how the imam-philosopher-king and prophet can achieve a conjunction with the active intellect and can also serve to guide the masses and the non-wise to virtue through religion. As Fārābī writes, intellectual happiness is something that “is [cognized] by means of the theoretical-rational faculty—not by any other of the rest of the faculties” (PR: 63–64), which is when a human being “uses the principles and the first cognitions that the active intellect gave him” (PR: 64). At the same time, most human beings are unable to access these truths or to achieve conjunction with the intellect. They can then only access philosophical truth imperfectly and through forms of symbolic representation, which are not as perfect as philosophy but allow them to attain intellectual perfection according to their specific intellectual capabilities. The human beings “in whose souls” philosophical truths “are found as they are imagined and who accept them and pursue them as though they are like that are the faithful” (PR: 75). This distinction also has political implications because philosophical discourse is targeted at the few philosophers in a society, whereas religious discourse is aimed at non-philosophers or the masses who, for Fārābī, still participate in the intellectual and ethical happiness pursued and achieved by philosophers.

Al-Fārābī provides a conceptualization of the Islamic concept of ummah as a multi-ethnic and multi-lingual idea of the commonwealth which is at odds with the pure ummah that existed in the time of the prophet (Orwin 2017: 202). According to Orwin, Fārābī promotes an idea of the commonwealth that includes several ethnic ummahs that do not necessarily require a uniform religious ummah, implicitly opening the possibility for allowing a certain degree of religious variation within an Islamic empire. In fact, in the Political Regime, Al-Fārābī explains that

it is possible to imitate these things for each group and each nation, using matters that are different in each case. Consequently, there may be a number of virtuous nations and virtuous cities whose religions are different, even though they all pursue the very same kind of happiness. (PR: 41)

Al-Fārābī’s original theory of the concept of democracy is also worth highlighting (Khalidi 2003; Orwin 2015). Even if Fārābī considers democracy to be a non-virtuous regime, he nonetheless claims that it is the best among all the non-virtuous regimes. Therefore, the democratic city is that from which a virtuous city is most likely to emerge compared to others. He provides a description of the democratic city as a multi-ethnic and multi-lingual city (a description that might echo the Baghdad of his own times). However, the “freedom” of the city (which is more a form of “license”) leads him to believe that power there, despite being potentially anarchic (with no distinction between rulers and ruled), can easily be turned into a despotic monarchy. The democratic city is then corrupt because happiness is aimed at earthly pleasures and not at the true intellectual fulfillment which is the purpose of the virtuous city.

The only work of al-Fārābī with political relevance translated into Latin was his Enumeration of Sciences, rendered by Gerard of Cremona (1114–1187) as Liber de scientiis. This text had some influence in the Christian world and, as far as the political domain is concerned, there are isolated examples of one of his very particular ideas—that political science (scientia civilis), which encompasses ethics, was superior to metaphysics in the hierarchy of the sciences. For example, this Farabian theory likely influenced Roger Bacon’s conceptualization of moral philosophy and Dante Alighieri’s defense of the primacy of moral philosophy in the Convivio. Traces of this theory might also be found in Marsilius of Padua who ascribes to practical sciences such as ethics and political science the same apodictic status as metaphysics (Quillet 1979; Mulieri 2019). (For further discussion, see the entries on al-Fārābī and al-Fārābī’s philosophy of society and religion.)

3. John of Salisbury

The twelfth century is commonly considered to be a period of intellectual renaissance in the Latin West in such fields as philosophy, literature, and law. One of the beneficiaries of this revival was political philosophy. The 1100s witnessed the emergence of sustained and systematic reflection about the nature and purpose of political society and about the normative standards by which political institutions ought to be judged. No one contributed more to this renaissance of political theory than John of Salisbury (c. 1115/20–1180 CE). Despite active engagement in ecclesiastical affairs, he found time to compose works on education, history, and hagiography, as well as his singular contribution to political philosophy, the Policraticus (completed in 1159). (For an extensive survey his life and career, see the entry on John of Salisbury, as well as Bollermann & Nederman 2015; Nederman & Bollermann 2020).

A massive treatise running to some 250,000 words, the Policraticus elucidated the moral and political standards by which governments are to be evaluated, placing emphasis on the edification of rulers and their servants. Subtitled Of the Frivolities of Courtiers and the Footprints of Philosophers, the Policraticus (the word is a neologism of John’s invention) is often described as the first complete work of medieval Latin political philosophy (Nederman 2015). John begins with a long satirical critique of the temptations associated with public life, surveying the many forms of courtly entertainment which distract officials from the performance of their duties. He stresses the importance of the moral instruction of the ruler and the necessity for the king to surround himself with literate and wise counselors; an evil prince with equally vicious advisors will necessarily be a tyrant who enslaves and oppresses his people (John of Salisbury Policraticus: 13–25). John asserts that a well-organized political community will resemble a healthy human body, guided by the soul (priesthood), ruled by a wise head (the king), and populated by all the limbs and organs (from the counseling heart to peasant feet) necessary for the efficient, just, and mutually beneficial functioning of the entire organism (Policraticus: 65–68). When this is achieved, the Policraticus states, the order implicit in nature is realized, the divine will is obeyed, and the earthly as well as eternal happiness of all members is assured.

Like most works of medieval philosophy, the Policraticus depends heavily upon authoritative sources as a means for extending and enhancing its arguments. Thinkers such as John believed that the case for a specific claim was strengthened not only by rational demonstration but also by the antiquity and the eminence of the authorities one could adduce in support of it. Thus, we encounter throughout the Policraticus extensive quotations from and citations of both pagan and Christian sources, including Scripture and the church Fathers as well as the texts and doctrines of pagan antiquity, particularly thorough in the areas of rhetoric, philosophy, and poetry. He styled himself a devotee of Cicero’s philosophical commitment to the moderate skepticism associated with the New Academy and knew the available texts of the Ciceronian corpus—although not directly Cicero’s two major works of political philosophy, De re publica and De legibus, whose ideas were transmitted through Christian intermediaries like Lactantius and St. Augustine (Grellard 2013; Nederman 2020: 62–84). Likewise, John integrated into the Policraticus many citations from the major and minor Latin poets; among his favorites were Virgil, Horace, Juvenal, Lucan, and Ovid (O’Daly 2018).

Of the philosophical and literary works of the ancient Greeks, John knew little in comparison with later centuries; like virtually all Western people of his time, he read no Attic Greek. He enjoyed access to some of Plato’s philosophy by means of an available partial Latin translation of and commentary on the Timaeus. John was also closely attuned to the reintroduction of Aristotle’s writings into the Latin West, demonstrating familiarity with the entirety of Aristotle’s Organon, that is, the six treatises on logic (Bloch 2012). He gleaned from the Organon some important elements of Aristotelian moral philosophy (such as the doctrine of the golden mean and the psychology of moral character) which he incorporated into the Policraticus (Nederman & Brückmann 1983).

The paucity of classical models of politics posed something of a dilemma for John, since his intellectual instincts resisted the postulation of innovative concepts unsupported by long-standing tradition. His solution is one that was not uncommon during the Middle Ages: he created a bogus authority—in essence, he perpetrated a forgery—in order to legitimize ideas that were otherwise original to him (Martin 1984). (This is a technique that had already been employed, for instance, in widely cited texts such the Donation of Constantine and the Pseudo-Isidorian Decretals.) Specifically, John fabricated a work called the “Instruction of Trajan”, purportedly composed by the Roman imperial writer Plutarch. He attributes to this treatise many of the most significant and insightful features of his political theory, especially the claim that the political system can be analyzed in detail as an organism or living body whose parts are mutually devoted to and dependent upon one another. The framework for the entirety of Books V and VI of the Policraticus is allegedly borrowed from the “Instruction of Trajan”.

Because it was composed over the course of several years and touches on a bewildering array of topics and issues, the Policraticus might appear to be more of a rambling and disjointed collection of stories and observations than a focused and coherent piece of philosophical argumentation. But while this claim seems plausible on initial inspection, the careful reader will discern in the Policraticus a number of unifying elements which lend it intellectual coherence. Perhaps the most surprising theoretical feature of the Policraticus is its treatment of the relationship between secular and spiritual spheres and powers. John is not a strictly ‘hierocratic’ thinker, if that term denotes the claim that all political authority flows from God through the church to earthly rulers, so that the use of power is always to be regulated and limited by ecclesiastical officials. Instead, he permits secular government to be conducted without direct interference from the church (Nederman & Campbell 1991). Like the soul in the body, he asserts, the priesthood fixes the general aims of the healthy political organism (namely, the conditions necessary for salvation). But the head of the body is responsible for ensuring and supervising the actual physical welfare of the organism as it pursues its path through life. Thus, there exists a common good within the community that is unique and distinct from, although conducive to, the ultimate spiritual end of salvation. It is the promotion of this common good—the realization of a just society on earth—that forms the primary temporal duty of princes and of all their subjects.

John believes that, at least so far as life on earth is concerned, men play an active role in creating their own happiness both as individuals and as political creatures. He claims that the political system must be guided by the principles of nature, which he regards as “the best guide to living” (Policraticus: 84–85). Yet nature does not strictly determine human behavior. Rather, men must actively cooperate with nature by means of experience and practice. Human beings conform to the course suggested by nature, a feat which is accomplished by developing and perfecting their knowledge and virtue. This is true at the personal as well as the social level: just as humans cultivate their own individual qualities by improving upon their natural attributes through effort and education, so they achieve a well-ordered political community by acknowledging and performing the natural duties demanded by justice toward their fellow creatures. Nature may fix the path of the good life, but men must exercise their minds and wills so as to discover and follow this route.

Thus, John’s political and moral philosophies are inextricably interwoven. Nowhere is this more evident than in his notion of moderation, especially as the salient characteristic of the good ruler described in the Policraticus. John’s king exercises power in a moderate fashion, neither releasing his subjects wholly to the caprice of their own volition nor controlling their behavior so strenuously that they become incapable of using their legitimate free will (Policraticus: 49–54). Royal moderation is equivalent to respect for the proper sphere of liberty which belongs to each and every member of the political community. By contrast, immoderate conduct is regarded by John as the defining mark of tyranny. The discussion of tyranny is one of the best known and most influential features of the Policraticus. Unlike preceding classical and medieval authors, who conceived of tyranny purely in terms of the evil or destructive use of public authority, John identifies the tyrant as someone who weds the ambitious desire to curtail the liberty of others with the power to accomplish this goal. The prince, as the pinnacle of temporal political organization, represents both the ordinary assurance of the security and liberty of his subjects and the authoritative source of earthly law and jurisdiction within his realm. Thus, a tyrant is inevitably accompanied by the destruction of the other parts of the community as well. In order to combat the threat of tyranny, John believes that the other members of the polity are charged with a duty—stemming from the principle of justice itself—to criticize, correct and, if necessary, even to kill a tyrannical ruler (Policraticus: 25, 206–213; Nederman 1988). Moreover, he takes this duty to be a generalized one: it pertains not merely to royal magistrates but to all segments of the body politic, since all are equally obligated (by their membership in society) to enforce the terms of justice.

4. Ibn Rushd

Philosophy, in all its different varieties (including metaphysics, natural philosophy, and psychology), thrived in medieval Islamic Spain (al-Andalus), although it also experienced periodic theological backlashes. From the very beginning of the Islamic age, one of the earliest Umayyad Caliphs of Spain, Al-Hakam II (961–976 CE), promoted the study of philosophy (falsafa) and science and encouraged translations of texts from Greek into Arabic (Black 2011). Greek ethical and political texts were included among those that could be studied in the library of Al-Hakam, such as Plato’s Laws and Republic (Black 2011: 118).

After the end of the Umayyad rule in Spain, different (and often unstable) political regimes were established from the eleventh until the beginning of the twelfth century. Then, in 1106, the Almoravids, a dynasty originating in Northern Africa, brought together several Berber tribes, and conquered medieval Spain (Black 2011: 118–119). The Almoravids opposed developments in philosophy, defended literalism in the reading of sacred and jurisprudential texts, and championed Sunni orthodoxy against Sufism and other movements that were considered heterodox. In 1145, the Almoravids’ power in Spain was overthrown by the rise of a new dynasty that, like the former, had consolidated its power first in the Maghreb: the Almohads. The latter had previously been under the leadership of Ibn Tūmart (c. 1080–1130 CE), a Berber who had studied in Baghdad. He was considered a mahdī (a traditional sacred figure in Shia Islam) who was said to have spoken to the great Islamic theologian al-Ghazālī (Black 2011: 118–119). After Ibn Tūmart, the Almohads paid particular attention to moral reform but rejected literalism and the strict interpretations of sharia and the theology promoted by the Almoravids, thus favoring once again the development of philosophy and the arts, albeit in a regime of rigorous moral and religious reform. The rise of the Almohads in Muslim Spain had a great impact on the lives of two of the most important philosophers of al-Andalus, the Islamic thinker Ibn Rushd (1126–1198 CE), and the Jewish thinker Moses Maimonides (1138–1204 CE). Indeed, while Ibn Rushd contributed to the cultural revolution promoted by the Almohads, as part of the cultural elite (the talaba) that the new dynasty formed in Marrakesh (Fierro 2018; Geoffroy 1999), the establishment of their power in Cordoba, and the decision that all Jews and Christians must convert to Islam, led to the exile of Maimonides among many others.

Ibn Rushd (1126–1198 CE), often Latinized as Averroes, lived in Muslim al-Andalus and was an influential judge (qadi), theologian, and philosopher who is considered to be one of the greatest representatives of medieval Muslim philosophy. (For a more complete account of his contributions, see the entry on Ibn Rushd.) His commentaries on Aristotle’s works, many of which were translated into Latin, earned him the title of “The Commentator” in the Christian world. Some ideas of Ibn Rushd about metaphysics, psychology, and natural philosophy have indirect political implications. For example, he continued the line of thought proposed by Ibn Bajja (Latinized as Avempace) in the Andalusian context concerning the solitary nature of the philosopher. He also advances an account of theoretical perfection according to which a sage can ensure the complete actualization of the ideal forms of the intellect to perfect philosophy (Brenet 2006: 478–482). This theory is also confirmed in Ibn Rushd’s Decisive Treatise, which seems to follow al-Fārābī in maintaining that the truths of philosophy are accessible only to a minority of people and that philosophical knowledge itself can be made accessible to the masses only in the form of religious beliefs. However, his philosophical elitism is not always so strict because it also remains open to the possibility that collectivities can contribute to wisdom. This latter interpretation would also more easily explain those passages of the Decisive Treatise in which Ibn Rushd speaks about the formation of the sciences and arts as a collective effort pursued by successive generations of human beings. In fact, in his commentary on Plato’s Republic, Ibn Rushd further argues that it is impossible or unlikely for one man to achieve all intellectual and moral virtues without the help of a multitude of other human beings (Ibn Rushd Republic B: 5).

In his commentaries on the Nicomachean Ethics and Plato’s Republic, Ibn Rushd provides the bulk of his political philosophy. His commentary on the Ethics is considered a middle commentary, meaning that therein, he very often paraphrases Aristotle’s work (for more on how Ibn Rushd undertakes this paraphrasis, see Harvey & Woerther 2014). While the full version of the original Arabic text is now lost, the commentary was translated into Latin by Hermannus Alemannus in 1240 as well as into Hebrew (by Samuel ben Judah of Marseille) in 1322. In the Epilogue of this commentary and at the beginning of his Paraphrasis or commentary on Plato’s Republic, Ibn Rushd discusses the epistemological status of ethics and politics. For him, ethics and politics are practical sciences and, following Aristotle, he claims that practical and theoretical sciences are distinct in that the former are aimed at action and, unlike the latter, are not concerned with necessity but with entities that are contingent and possible (Woerther 2018: 227). Moreover, Ibn Rushd compares the status of ethics and politics to the two different components of the medical sciences: the question of what constitutes health and illness and consideration of how health is secured and illness is cured (Woerther 2018: 224). Likewise, ethics analyzes actions in general by investigating how habits are acquired along with the relationship between action, will and behavior, whereas politics studies how these habits are related to the soul and can be realized and perfected (Woerther 2018: 224–225).

Ibn Rushd’s commentary on Plato’s Republic probably dates to 1194, i.e., one year before he was sent into exile for reasons that were never completely clarified but that presumably have to do with the complex relationships between traditional and more forward-looking legal scholars present at the Caliph’s court. As in the case of the Ethics commentary, the original text of the commentary on the Republic is lost, meaning we only have a Hebrew translation (by Samuel ben Judah between 1320 and 1322) and a Latin translation (by Elija del Medigo at the end of the fifteenth century). Therefore, the commentary enjoyed a certain influence among later medieval Jewish authors. The paraphrase is a middle commentary and thus contains a literal report of many Platonic ideas. In fact, there are numerous questions about the kind of relationship that Ibn Rushd established with Plato’s text. We cannot even be sure that he read the actual text of Plato’s Republic (if he did, he certainly read it in an Arabic translation since he knew no Greek) or if he had access to the Platonic text through the paraphrasis of Plato’s Republic that had been authored by the great Greek physician Galen (Belo 2009). The commentary is divided into three different treatises: Parts I and II are on the virtuous and ideal state and are concerned with the education of the young and the philosopher-king, while Part III deals with non-virtuous states. In his commentary, Ibn Rushd tells us that “since Aristotle’s book on governance [the Politics] has not yet fallen into our hands” (Ibn Rushd Republic B: 4), he had decided to comment on Plato’s Republic as a substitute.

Ibn Rushd does not limit himself to commenting on Plato’s ideas, but also engages with them in original ways. For example, the whole commentary is based on the idea that there is a strong relationship between Plato’s ideas and what Ibn Rushd defines as “our divine law”, that is, Islamic law (Ibn Rushd Republic B: 12). Nevertheless, scholars disagree as to the nature of this relationship, with some arguing that it is a matter of harmony (Rosenthal 1953) and others suggesting that it is more one of tension (Gauthier 1909; Namazi 2022). On several key topics, such as the virtues of the philosopher-king, war, women, crime and punishment, he subtly complements Plato’s ideas by providing his own interpretations and does so while taking into account the particular audience he is addressing. An example of this strategy can be found when he talks about the condition of women in the commonwealth. Ibn Rush restates the proto-feminist ideas of Plato in the Republic, claiming that women should also be allowed to be guardians. In fact, Ibn Rushd claims that “the nature of men and women is of one kind” and he stresses, based on this notion, the “the women in this city will practice the [same] activities as the men, except that they are weaker at it” (Ibn Rushd Republic B: 58). This means that, as in Plato, women can follow the same educational path as men and become guardians of the ideal city-state. However, Ibn Rush also complements Plato’s argument by saying that a cost-benefit advantage accrues from including women in government and the affairs of the city. As he explains, since women do not participate in any activity in the cities of al-Andalus, they have come to resemble “plants” and become a “burden” which was “one of the causes of the poverty of these cities” (Republic B: 59).

Ibn Rushd’s text also provides several references to the political reality of al-Andalus. For example, in the third book, at 92.4–8 (Republic B: 124–125), Ibn Rushd claims that the kingdom of the Almoravids declined due to its transformation from a “governance based on the nomos” into a timocracy and then into a government based on hedonism until it ultimately perished. Ibn Rushd also criticizes the government of his own times, i.e., those of the Almohads, by saying that their power had declined into a timocracy (Republic B: 121 and 145). Mention must also be made of Ibn Rushd’s theory of democracy, which is different from that of al-Fārābī. While for Fārābī, democracy was lawless (and was thus a synonym for anarchy), Ibn Rushd sees democracy as a government in which the law plays a role. He also refers to Cordoba and other contemporary cities as examples of democracies. After saying that democratic cities are not stable and perish rapidly, he adds that this is “the case with democratic cities existing in this time of ours and in that which preceded [it]” (Republic B: 127), a likely reference to the regimes of taifas in al-Andalus—independent cities and regimes that emerged periodically after the end of Caliphate periods. In fact, Ibn Rushd explicitly defines Cordoba as a “democratic” regime that had then fallen into tyranny under the Almohads (Republic B: 133).

Ibn Rushd’s philosophical and political ideas also exerted an important influence in the Christian world, especially among philosophers and writers who supported pro-imperial ideals (Gilson 1948; Marenbon 2001; Nardi 1960). Philosophers as diverse as John of Jandun c. 1285–1328) and Antonio Pelacani da Parma (c. 1275–1328), who were strongly influenced by Ibn Rushd but did not write specifically political works, were close to the Italian Ghibelline and pro-Empire milieu (Brenet 2019; Calma 2015). Moreover, two major Christian theorists and writers of the beginning of the fourteenth century, Dante Alighieri and Marsilius of Padua, drew on ideas of Ibn Rushd to legitimize their pro-Empire ideas against the papal claim to the plenitude of power, i.e., the idea that the power of temporal rulers should depend on the papacy or ecclesiastical authorities. However, the debate is still open among scholars whether Ibn Rushd’s ideas led to the development of a political Averroist tradition (Mulieri 2019; Syros 2012).

5. Moses Maimonides

Moses Maimonides (1138–1204) is perhaps the greatest Jewish thinkers of the Middle Ages. Originally from Cordoba, al-Andalus, on account of the Almohad conquest of al-Andalus he had to move to Egypt in 1166, where he achieved fame as a Rabbinic scholar, philosopher and physician. (A more detailed account of his career is provided by the entry on Maimonides.) Among Maimonides’ writings, we may single out the Mishneh Torah, a massive compendium of Jewish law which is a major reference work in rabbinic literature, and the Guide of the Perplexed, composed in Judeo-Arabic, his most important philosophical text, which was influenced by neo-Platonic and Aristotelian philosophy, and which had a considerable impact on medieval and early modern philosophy. Maimonides’ political philosophy is mostly contained in the latter work (although it is also scattered among minor texts such as the early Treatise on the Art of Logic) and aims to integrate the Greek neo-Platonism of Islamic authors such as al-Fārābī with the study of Jewish Divine law in the Torah. Maimonides provides his own definition of political science in the Treatise on the Art of Logic, in which he states that philosophy or science is divided into theoretical and practical philosophy. While the former include mathematics, physics, and theology or metaphysics, practical philosophy (which is sometimes translated as political science) is divided into: (1) the “self-governance of human beings”; (2) the “governance of the household”; (3) the “governance of the city”; and (4) the “governance of the nation” (Art of Logic: 14). The narrow domain of political science, i.e., the governance of the city, “imparts to its citizens knowledge of true happiness and imparts to them the [way of] striving to achieve it” (Art of Logic: 190). In other words, practical and political sciences are prerequisites for the pursuit of theoretical happiness, which is the aim of philosophical life.

As was the case in al-Fārābī, the relationship between philosophical and practical life plays a crucial role in Maimonides’ Guide of the Perplexed. Maimonides is also an Aristotelian and is therefore convinced that the natural needs and wants of the body (which also motivated, and in turn made possible, the natural association culminating in society) are essential in creating the conditions for the pursuit of intellectual happiness, which is the highest form of human perfection (Perplexed: II.36; III.51). However, Maimonides does not consistently pursue the model of solitary intellectual confinement that can be found, for example, in Ibn Bajja’s idea of the sage (and, to a certain extent, in Ibn Rushd). In fact, he maintains that the philosopher has the natural and ethical duty to extend a certain measure of his intellectual happiness to the masses who are not philosophers and who will be able to access philosophical truths only imperfectly according to their abilities and in the form of religious beliefs. Since religious beliefs define a society which is shaped by Judaism and therefore shape its legalistic dimensions, the study of the laws and norms that govern society is fundamental to understanding how theoretical happiness can be spread to the whole of society. This is why, following al-Fārābī, Maimonides maintains that the philosopher must also be a prophet and a lawmaker. The philosopher-legislator-prophet makes the intellectual truths of philosophy known to non-philosophers in society in a simpler and more literal way by evoking the imagination, which is a faculty of knowledge capable of making philosophical truths known to people who are not philosophers. Therefore, the teaching of divine law must aim to perfect both the welfare of the soul and the welfare of the body. Yet, the ideal philosophical life of the sage should not be extended to the masses because if adopted by people who are not philosophers, the stability of society, which needs the support of political life in order to sustain its main aim of pursuing philosophical life, would be undermined (Perplexed: II.37).

Scholars (Strauss 1952; Kreisel 1999; Pines 1957) have undertaken an important discussion of the status of political philosophy in Maimonides’ thought and in comparison with other Islamic and Jewish authors. There is also debate about whether it is even possible to speak of the existence of a political philosophy in medieval Jewish authors and, if so, how to characterize it (Lorberbaum 2003; Melamed 1993, 2005; Strauss 1935; Syros 2020). There is no doubt that in the Jewish tradition, as in the Islamic one, political themes are always intertwined with metaphysics or divine law. Maimonides is a good example of this tendency and also demonstrates an original appropriation of many previous themes from Islamic philosophy. One important difference between Maimonides’ idea of the philosopher-prophet and lawmaker, as contrasted with the thought of both al-Fārābī and Ibn Rushd, is that the latter tend to identify the philosopher-lawmaker-legislator with the king whereas Maimonides partially modifies this identification, applying the label of king only to Moses and to no other prophet in the Jewish tradition. Compared to Ibn Bajja’s and Averroes’ reinstatement of the Platonic idea of the philosopher-king, Maimonides appears to advocate a more positive view of the attitude of the philosopher-prophet toward the masses. As in al-Fārābī, the prophet-philosopher for Maimonides fulfills a moral obligation to improve the education and knowledge of the masses who are, in turn, led to follow him as an example and model. This is because, as he writes, “an individual can only attain all this through a political association, it being already known that man is political by nature” (Perplexed: II.511). Based on his idea that only Moses can be king, Maimonides also proposes an ideal polity in which Moses is the main leader insofar as he is a prophet, a judge, and a king, where the Torah is the constitution and the Sanhedrin, a Jewish juridical and administrative body, is assigned legislative and judicial functions that can lead to changes in the laws.

The Guide of the Perplexed not only influenced the Jewish tradition but was also translated into Latin as Dux neutrorum and enjoyed wide circulation during the thirteenth and fourteenth centuries at the University of Paris. For example, Vasileios Syros has pointed out a clear echo of Maimonides’ concept of civil religion in Marsilius of Padua’s Defensor Pacis (Syros 2011b).

6. Thomas Aquinas

Thomas Aquinas (c. 1225–1274) is generally considered to be the towering figure of thirteenth-century philosophy. A man of prodigious learning, he turned his pen with equal vigor to virtually every branch of knowledge under discussion in his time, including political philosophy. (His life and writings are recounted in the entry on Thomas Aquinas.) Aquinas emerged as the leading exponent of the idea that the teachings of the pagan Aristotle were consistent with the tenets of the Christian faith. Hence, he upheld the capacity of reason unilluminated by divine revelation to grasp truths about nature (and even some about God); yet he remained committed to the view that certain truths (indeed, the higher insights into the mysteries of divinity) were accessible only by way of direct experience of God as found in Scripture.

Making a case for Aquinas as a political philosopher proves somewhat more difficult than it might seem at first glance. Certainly, many scholars have identified him as “the one great thinker of the Middle Ages”, an interpretation, however, that “is an invention of modern neo-Thomism” and that “would have startled anyone at the University of Paris in the thirteenth century” (Tierney 1987: 646; see also Briguglia 2018: 55–65). The study of political ideas was in fact tangential to Aquinas’s overarching enterprise. He was first and foremost a theologian whose primary concern was the investigation of the boundaries between Christian faith and revelation, on the one hand, and rational philosophical inquiry, on the other. Consequently, Aquinas’s remarks on the social and political order must be extracted mainly from arguments embedded in his theological and philosophical writings.

Aquinas’s reflections about politics are spread throughout a variety of genres typical of scholasticism. For instance, he composed an attenuated commentary on the initial two-plus books of the Politics, the intellectual value of which some scholars now tend to dismiss in preference to its continuation by Peter of Auvergne (Lanza 2021: cixl-clxxxvi). His other main stand-alone contribution to political thought, On Kingship, was a fragment on the nature of government, especially royal and tyrannical regimes, as its title suggests. The text of the latter breaks off early in Book 2, left to be finished up in a total of four books under the title On the Government of Rulers (De regimine principum) by Ptolemy of Lucca. The most sustained analysis of political themes, however, is located in Aquinas’s massive Summa Theologiae. There is no single section of the Summa which encapsulates the whole of his political philosophy. Rather, he touches on various questions pertaining to politics in the midst of relevant theological discussions. Therefore, we should look upon the Summa not as a cohesive statement of Aquinas’s political teachings but as further evidence of how political philosophy for him cannot be properly detached from its broader theological framework.

As perhaps the most prominent philosopher of the thirteenth century to integrate the newly discovered learning from Aristotle’s philosophical corpus (the Ethics and Politics were among the last Aristotelian works to be translated into Latin) into Christian doctrine, Aquinas promoted the value of naturalistic rationalism. In other words, the rational capacity possessed by human beings, far from being incompatible with supernatural enlightenment, attains its full potentiality with divine assistance. The politically interesting corollary to this position is that the presently corrupt condition of human nature does not constitute its total perversion. Instead, post-lapsarian humans are an incomplete image of how God created humanity in its original condition, prior to the Fall from grace occasioned by Adam and Eve. Even in a state of perfect innocence, Aquinas suggests, there would have been individual differences of age, gender, and intellect that required attention and which would have qualified some people for leadership. Such a preeminent authority existed to facilitate the common good and would have been necessary even before the Fall (ST Ia 96 A3–4 [APW: 2–4]). Aquinas thus tacitly accepts that political life is an essential feature of humanity’s original and therefore natural condition. The foundations of government are detached from the idea (found in St. Augustine of Hippo, for instance) that political authority came into existence as a by-product of original sin in order to remedy its consequences. Aquinas preferred to assimilate politics to human nature as divinely created—a Christianization of the Aristotelian teaching in Politics 1253a2–3 that man is a “political animal” (DR bk 1 ch I [APW: 5–6])—and as such would have existed even if the Fall had never occurred (see Toivanen 2021). By implication, the exercise of political power had a purpose in and of itself, and so did not depend for its legitimacy upon the approval of the church.

In Aquinas’s account of politics, the desire for achieving the common good, which brings humans together initially, is conditioned by natural inequalities. He begins with the principle, which contains echoes of Book 1 of Aristotle’s Politics, that the disparities that give rise to government and law are themselves part of a divinely ordained scheme embedded in nature. Aquinas thereby posits a direct connection between irremediable natural differences and the emergence of political communities. Since inequalities are unalterable by individual human beings, they must be redressed at the level of politics for the common good. Not all people were created equal in the sight of God; for precisely this reason, Aquinas can claim for the secular political realm a unique set of natural ends that move beyond the remediation of sin.

Throughout his writings related to political matters, Aquinas manifested substantial interest in the various forms of constitutional order, especially as classified and evaluated by Aristotle (Tierney 1979; Blythe 1986; Aroney 2007). The structure of the first book of On Kingship suggests that he intended to examine monarchy more from the perspective of the governed. Aquinas indicates that the community is prior to kingship and that royal power is justified solely by its function of maintaining communal bonds. This viewpoint may be seen in many of the fundamental claims proposed in On Kingship. Aquinas asserts that the reference point for judging a well-governed community arises by reference to the common good (DR bk 1 ch II [APW: 8]). Aquinas captures the common Greek distinction made in Aristotle between rule by the one, the few, and the many as a way of classifying both good (kingship, aristocracy, polity) and evil (tyranny, oligarchy, democracy) constitutions. But he goes on to adapt the language of oppression—a residue stemming from Isidore of Seville’s Etymologies (Nederman 2019: 6–7)—to the effect that oligarchy and democracy are counted as collective tyrannies rather than corrupt systems structured according to their own unique misunderstandings about justice, as in the Politics (DR bk 1 ch II [APW: 8–9]). Thus, both the socio-economic dimension of Aristotle’s analysis of oligarchic and democratic regimes, and his attempt to see such constitutions as internally related less to one another than to their opposite number, are submerged by Aquinas’s presentation.

An emphasis on tyranny is to be expected in a treatise devoted to kingship, as it was in John of Salisbury’s Policraticus. Indeed, in a later chapter of On Kingship, Aquinas engages in a tyrannology that touches on the other imperfect regimes only inasmuch as they are instructive for the understanding of the evils of the tyrant and the perfection of the king (DR bk 1 ch XI [APW: 30–34]). Accepting Aristotle’s ranking of the best and worst systems within both ideal and corrupt constitutions, Aquinas sets out to excoriate the tyrant. Here it may seem that he is less harsh concerning oligarchy and, especially, democracy in comparison with tyranny. The tyrant appears to constitute such an evil for the community that any polity would gladly accept democracy (or even oligarchy) over tyranny (DR bk 1 ch IV [APW: 12–13]). But the force of this case is merely rhetorical. In fact, Aquinas soon points out that there are gradations even within forms of tyranny. “If monarchy is changed into tyranny”, he proposes, “less evil flows from this than when the government of a number of men becomes corrupt” (DR bk 1 ch VI [APW: 16]). He reasons that the corruption engendered by oligarchy or democracy leads to internal dissension within the community, which is ultimately more harmful than the rule of a single evil man, who may be less inclined to “set about oppressing his subjects and become an extreme tyrant”. Likewise, Aquinas follows Aristotle in observing that historical study of the origins of tyrannical regimes demonstrates that they are more likely to arise from societies in which a multitude rather than a monarch previously ruled (DR bk 1 ch VI [APW: 17]). In sum, Aquinas wishes no one to infer from his statements about democracy and oligarchy that he is “soft” on them or has afforded any grounds to prefer them to the government of kings, or even “moderate” tyrants. The argument that one should refrain from living under a kingship, the best of regimes, because it might turn into the worst of constitutions, tyranny, is wholly specious, in Aquinas’s view.

The attitude toward constitutional systems in the Summa diverges in some respects from the position one finds in On Kingship (Blythe 1992: 40–41). In the Summa, Aquinas’s stated preference for the ideal government is Aristotle’s mixed constitution or “polity” rather than kingship. Moreover, he seems to regard the mixed system as a hybrid of several types of regimes that in the Politics are incommensurable. “Such a polity is the best form of government”, he says,

inasmuch as it is a benign mixture of kingship, because there is one man who presides; of aristocracy, because it is the rule of several according to virtue; and of democracy, that is, popular power, because the rulers can be elected from the people and it is up to the people to elect the rulers. (ST IaIIae 105 A1 responsio [APW: 54])

According to Aquinas, this form of government corresponds to that instituted by Moses and his successors according to divine authorization. The Aristotelian imperfection ascribed to democracy is thus erased by Aquinas and replaced by the legitimation of popular rule as a valid, if not ideal or perfect, system (Blythe 1992: 51–54). Later, in the same chapter of the Summa, Thomas apparently contradicts the remarks made in On Kingship concerning the relation between tyranny, kingship and rule by larger groups: “Because the power granted to a king is so great, it is easy for kingship to degenerate into tyranny …” (ST IaIIae 105 A1 ad 2 [APW: 55]). Thereafter, Aquinas evinces the Isidore-tinged fear about the oppression wrought by the tyrant, only now he views this as a rationale for the selection of rulers from “among the people”, so that there would be a constant (democratic) check upon any temptation to indulge in tyrannical behavior (ST IaIIae 105 A1 ad 4 [APW: 56]).

Aquinas’s single most influential, yet also most vexed, contribution to the history of political philosophy is his conception of law, and especially natural law, as it appears primarily in the Summa (e.g., Goerner 1979, 1983, 1990; Hall 1990; MacIntyre 2006: 41–63; McCormick 2018; Farrell 2023). He distinguished between two senses of “law”, designated by the Latin words lex and ius, which, for purposes of clarity, are ordinarily rendered into English as “law” and “right” respectively. Both are manifestations of divine decree but perform distinct functions in his thought. Aquinas defines lex as “a kind of rule or measure of acts, by which someone is induced to act or restrained from acting” (ST IaIIae 90 A1 responsio [APW: 77]). By contrast, ius constitutes the end to which the virtue of justice aspires, that is, an equalized or balanced relationship between men based on the Roman law principle of “rendering to each his due” (ST IIaIIae 58 A1 responsio [APW:169]). These two meanings of law are distinct but interrelated: “Lex is not the same as ius, properly speaking, but an expression of the idea of ius” (ST IIaIIae 57 A1 ad 2 [APW: 160]). Law, as distinguished from right, is a conscious enactment of a reasoned will, the object of which is a common good (ST IaIIae 91 A1 responsio and ST IaIIae 93 A1 responsio [APW: 84, 102]).

Aquinas classifies law according to four primary forms: eternal, divine, natural and human. Eternal law reflects God’s rational volition for the good of all His creation. Divine law is propounded to the human race alone by virtue of its unique capacity for salvation (ST IaIIae 91 A4 ad 1 [APW: 90]). Natural law “participates” in eternal and divine law inasmuch as the reason divinely implanted in every human being—Christians and unbelievers of all sorts alike—is oriented toward the well-being of mankind as a whole (ST IaIIae 91 A2 [APW: 86–87]). Finally, human law encompasses specific applications of the precepts of natural law for the benefit of the members of various temporal communities (ST IaIIae 95 A2 [APW: 130–31]). These distinct modes of law must be seen in terms of the theological context in which Aquinas works. Since he attributes to secular authority certain wholly natural functions apart from the remediation of sin, he is compelled to offer a precise relationship between the divine order and the conditions of mere mortal humans. He must provide a reply, in short, to the question: What position does the government by and for men occupy in relation to the rest of God’s ordained creation and to God Himself?

Aquinas’s answer is embedded in his systematization of lex (and its connection to ius) posited in the Summa. The eternal law, according to which God rules the universe, constitutes the foundation for all other categories of law, since the “rational pattern of the Divine wisdom bears the character of law in relation to all things which are moved by it” (ST IaIIae 93 A2 [APW: 102] In non-rational creatures, this is manifested by their implanted instincts, which urge them to play their divinely ordained role in creation. Since man’s nature includes a non-rational element, all humans participate directly in eternal law through their inclinations toward self-preservation and the perpetuation of the species, neither of which are pursued consciously (ST IaIIae 93 A5 [APW: 110]). In addition, by virtue of the uniquely human possession of reason, Aquinas asserts, men also enjoy the opportunity to cooperate actively in the realization of divine law, insofar as their rational powers allow them to partake in God’s decrees by recognizing consciously His hand at work. So to the extent that rational creatures are capable of apprehending the divine scheme, and hence consciously participating in it, eternal and divine law are manifested in natural law (ST IaIIae 93 A2 [APW: 104–5]). Natural law captures Aquinas’s insight that men do not merely follow God’s commands mindlessly, but instead conduct themselves according to law because they comprehend their place in creation. This is the case regardless of whether they are aware of the existence of the One True God, inasmuch as all human beings (no matter their religious convictions) are endowed by reason.

In turn, men apply natural law in particular and concrete ways by formulating their own legal codes appropriate to the immediate circumstances in which they find themselves, which Aquinas labels human (or sometimes positive) law. What distinguishes human statute from natural law is its specificity, the former supplementing the latter and relaxing (or even dispensing with) its provisions as required. Since natural law simply affords a rational guide for human activity, such modifications are not contrary to its spirit (ST IaIIae 97 A1 [APW: 150–1]). On the contrary, the translation of the universal dictates of natural law into the particulars of human law furthers the realization of the very point of law: the advancement of the common good—in this case, of the earthly political community (ST IaIIae 96 A1 [APW: 138–9]). That is, natural law and human law intersect in setting the correct standards that determine how members of a communal order (whether the human race as a whole or a given system of temporal government) shall conduct themselves in order to realize their divinely consecrated purposes. If human law does not cohere with the end of the common benefit, as enshrined in natural law by the divine will, it would not merit the title of law at all, since it would undermine the basis on which law itself rests. Consequently, Aquinas suggests in the Summa that positive statutes not in accordance with natural law and common good have no binding claim on obedience, since “such laws do not bind in the court of conscience (synderesis)” (ST IaIIae 96 A4 responsio [APW: 144]; on conscience, see the entry on Aquinas’ moral, political, and legal philosophy). Indeed, they may be refused and resisted by those on whom they are imposed, provided that such a refusal would not result in some still greater evil (ST IaIIae 96 A5 [APW: 146]). In sum, Aquinas’s theory of law yields a systematic conceptualization of a hierarchy of legal order, grounded in Christian principles, yet sufficiently flexible as to permit the variations among legal codes that characterize different human communities.

7. Ptolemy of Lucca

Thomas Aquinas started but never finished writing his treatise On Kingship, as previously mentioned. Rather, the work’s completion (around 1300) was left to his student Ptolemy of Lucca (c. 1236–c. 1327) and disseminated under the title On the Government of Rulers (De regimine principum). Unlike his teacher, Ptolemy was not primarily a philosopher or professional scholar. Instead, he served in a number of roles within the Dominican Order and died as bishop of Torcello (Blythe 2009a). Likewise, his literary output was not typically scholastic. Instead, Ptolemy mainly composed historical treatises (including a universal history of the Roman church) and biographies of important ecclesiastical figures (Blythe 2009b). In many ways, the views he articulated in On the Government of Rulers reflect and apply his historically minded orientation to salient issues of political philosophy. Although originally attributed in toto to Aquinas, Ptolemy’s contribution to On the Government of Rulers sets a decidedly different tone than the chapters now ascribed to his teacher. Specifically, while On Kingship defended the superiority of monarchical regimes, the continuation authored by Ptolemy is now widely regarded as one of the premiere medieval defenses of republicanism, and of republican Rome in particular. Ptolemy praised republican institutions as “more suitable for producing a certain civility” and argued that God rewarded the ancient Romans for their civic virtue and just system of laws (On the Government of Rulers: 121).

In spite of this veneration of Rome, scholars have generally asserted that the fundamental principles undergirding Ptolemy’s political theory stem from his devotion to Aristotelian scholasticism (Davis 1984: 231 note 21, 278; Canning 1996: 148–149; Blythe 2002: 135). Yet he looks to historical Rome rather than to Aristotle’s Politics for the quintessential example of the best form of government. Ptolemy’s arguments rest very heavily on his impressive (for its time) knowledge of Roman political institutions, leading figures, and history. Indeed, it would not be too great a stretch to assert that, in comparison with other prominent political thinkers of the late thirteenth and early fourteenth centuries, the level of knowledge about Rome in the republican period displayed in On the Government of Rulers is virtually without parallel. In addition to standard Latin sources for the history of the Republic, such as Cicero, Sallust, Vegetius, and Valerius Maximus, Ptolemy mined authorities less commonly cited in his day, such as Livy and Eutropius. Moreover, he found ways to transform sacred texts into key witnesses to secular history. For instance, Ptolemy provides an ingenious rereading of Augustine’s City of God 5.18 which strips out the Saint’s moral condemnation of republican rapaciousness and vice, replacing it with a positive valuation of the motives behind and accomplishments of Roman patriots (Davis 1984: 57–60). Likewise, the books of Maccabees are looted as a treasure trove of historical information about the political, social, and physical characteristics of Rome, often employed side-by-side with pagan sources as a confirmation or supplement. Judged by the preponderance of the citations in Ptolemy’s portion of On the Government of Rulers, the Latin accounts of the organization of the Republic and the conduct of its leaders, instead of Aristotle’s concept of politeia (that is, the mixed constitution), formed the central reference point for his argument. The superiority of the Roman Republic posited by Ptolemy provided the salient lens through which he filtered the reading of ancient texts—sacred as well as profane, philosophical as well as historical.

In particular, Rome embodied what Ptolemy calls “political lordship” (his term for republican government, in contradistinction to “regal lordship” or monarchy), which is his preferred system of governance on account of the “mildness” of its rule. In support of this position, Ptolemy gives reasons such as the limited terms of officials, the system of payment, the nature of citizens, and the constraints placed by law on governmental power. Ptolemy relies on Roman sources, rather than on Aristotle, to uphold such claims. In almost every instance where a positive example of constitutional order is provided, it is drawn from the ancient republic of Rome. For example, Ptolemy’s initial definition of political rule is followed immediately by a reference to Roman governance:

Political rule exists when a region, province, city or town is governed by one or many according to its own statutes, as happens in regions of Italy and especially in Rome, which for the most part has been governed by senators and consuls ever since the city was founded. (On the Government of Rulers: 120)

Likewise, Ptolemy’s discussion of political leaders concentrates on the Romans as providing the supreme instantiations, naming “ancient Roman leaders, such as Marcus Curius, Fabricius, and many others”, who “took care of the Republic with their own riches, which made them more bold and more solicitous for the care of the polity” (On the Government of Rulers: 121–122). Relying primarily on Roman sources, Ptolemy thus argues that Rome constituted the very archetype of political rule.

Ptolemy’s interpretation of Rome’s development coincides with and reinforces his Christian providential account of history. According to this view, the path of Roman governance, like that of all earthly regimes, was directed by the hand of God toward a definite end. One cannot escape this linear and teleological notion of history in Ptolemy’s thought. While the success of the Romans resulted directly from their political and military skills and their civic self-sacrifice, its ultimate cause was the will of God, who was pleased by the Romans’ method of governing. Moreover, the excellence of the Roman constitution and the virtue of its citizens played key roles in Rome’s achievements. But the invention of the republican institutions that permitted the conquest of the world was the product of divine inspiration (Ptolemy On the Government of Rulers: 153–154). Ptolemy’s admiration for the Roman Republic is thus intimately tied to his Christian understanding of human history. In Ptolemy’s view, the character of the Romans and of the Roman Republic was such that they could spread righteous rule across the globe in preparation for Christ’s coming. In addition to the practical advantages of the pax Romana for the spread of the Christian religion, Roman civic virtue and love of justice promoted a benevolent and self-sacrificing spirit that prefigured the kingdom of Christ. The historical success of Roman government was, for Ptolemy, in no way a matter of blind natural forces or chance, but instead reflected a providential plan directing the course of human events toward a preordained goal.

There is also a naturalistic component to the defense of the Roman Republic in On the Government of Rulers. Ptolemy proposes that government arises primarily from the material needs of mankind and the relative vulnerability of human beings in nature. Though citing Aristotle on the political nature of man, Ptolemy places far more emphasis on biological and material necessity than the Philosopher ever would:

The necessity of establishing a city comes first from a consideration of human need, which compels a person to live in society. (On the Government of Rulers: 220)

Ptolemy goes on to illustrate how plants and animals have no need of clothing or of fortifications, while humans are quite vulnerable without them. Likewise, when struck by disease, humans require the aid of those educated in the medical arts (On the Government of Rulers: 220–221). Ptolemy ends this discussion with the remark that

for all these reasons I conclude that the city is a necessity for human beings, and that it is constituted on behalf of the community of the multitude, without which humans cannot live decently. (On the Government of Rulers: 221)

He thereby sets a clear naturalistic standard for the evaluation of various regimes.

The Roman Republic was for Ptolemy distinctively suited to redress the failings of the human condition. The primary “natural” duty of government is to assure that those whose preservation is threatened are served and hence that the bonds of human society are maintained and strengthened (Ptolemy On the Government of Rulers: 181). The Romans excelled in this regard, according to Ptolemy. Thus, they particularly merited their lordship. He identifies three elements of the superlative virtue of Romans: love of country, zeal for justice, and civil benevolence (Ptolemy On the Government of Rulers: 154). He illustrates these three principles copiously with citations to Roman historians and philosophers (Ptolemy On the Government of Rulers: 154–162). Ptolemy aimed to demonstrate the confluence between the qualities of Roman character nourished in the Republic and the requirements of righteous governance. God and Rome converged.

8. Commentators on the Politics

The first known commentary on Aristotle’s Politics in the Middle Ages can be found in the Byzantine milieu of the twelfth century. Michael of Ephesus (an author from the early or middle of that century who commented on several other works by Aristotle, including the Nicomachean Ethics) authored some comments (scholia) in which he focused on selected ideas from Aristotle’s Politics. Michael’s comments are mainly aimed at clarifying aspects of Aristotle’s ideas but also reflect some political and practical problems in his own time and in the Byzantine context. For example, Michael indirectly criticizes the imperial regime of the Komnenoi (the House of Komnenos) in which he lived by questioning the legitimacy of monarchy (Kaldellis 2011: 135–138). Michael’s scholia are the only extant example of a commentary-text on the Politics in the Byzantine world (although there are other authors who draw on this text in order to discuss political problems, such as Theodoros Metochites or Theodoros II Laskaris). This suggests that the Politics was perhaps not very widely known in Byzantium.

As opposed to the Islamic and Jewish contexts, where Aristotle’s Politics never received complete translations, its Latin translation played an important role in Christian Europe. If, as we saw, Ibn Rushd complained in 1196 that Aristotle’s Politics was not available in al-Andalus, requiring him to comment on Plato’s Republic as a substitute, around 65 years later it was translated from Greek into Latin by William of Moerbeke, a Flemish bishop who had lived in the Byzantine empire. Moerbeke produced two translations of this text. One (the translatio imperfecta) was made between 1260 and 1264, includes Book 1 and a considerable section of Book 2, covering from 1252a1 to 1273a30 in Bekker’s edition (Flüeler 1992: 15–29; Luscombe 1997: 314). Another translation (the translatio perfecta), probably completed before 1267, includes all the books of the Politics but in an order different from the version we have today (Flüeler 1992: 15–29). A serious problem for Moerbeke was that the Politics included many specific and technical words that applied to the political life of ancient Greece but that were completely unfamiliar to a medieval audience. Hence, Moerbeke sometimes just transliterated Greek words into Latin, or in some cases even left the original Greek words in the Latin translation. These are among the reasons why one of the chief task of medieval commentators on the Politics was also to clarify the meanings of words that were crucial to understanding key conceptual points of Aristotle’s political theory.

However, in the Latin Middle Ages, Aristotle’s Politics was usually not part of the official canonical university curricula. The Politics was mostly read in extraordinary lectures (lectiones extraordinariae), meaning that this text was not included within the compulsory program that any student had to study in order to receive a degree. At that time, teaching on the Politics was only possible if university masters (magistri) decided to lecture on it or if the faculty wanted to include it in the university program as optional. Hence, there were only occasional lectures on the Politics in Western medieval universities. Apart from these extraordinary lectures, there is some limited evidence attesting to the possible presence of this text within teaching curricula, some of which were ordinary (for example, in Oxford, Cracow, and Prague; see Luscombe 1997: 214–215).

In the Latin Middle Ages, we find a considerable number of commentaries on the Politics. While limited when compared to other commentaries on the works of Aristotle, they are still notable given its sparsity within ordinary university curricula. In a seminal study, Christophe Flüeler listed about 30 versions of commentaries on Aristotle’s Politics in the initial 150 years after the translation of the Politics, more than 50 in the fifteenth century (Flüeler 1992: II, 1–100). Flüeler also lists 58 surviving anonymous commentaries and mentions a list of 49 commentaries that have been recovered in extant manuscripts, 35 of which can be attributed to particular authors and the remainder of which remain anonymous (Flüeler 1992, II, 92–99). Albert the Great wrote what was probably the first detailed Latin commentary on all the books of the Politics c. 1265 or a little afterwards (see Flüeler 1992: 29). Thomas Aquinas commented on the Politics up to Chapter 26 of Book III.6), which was later continued by Peter of Auvergne. Whereas Albert and Aquinas provide relatively detailed literal expositions of Aristotle’s words in an attempt to clarify the ambiguities of his text, Peter of Auvergne’s part tends to interpret the ideas of Aristotle and sometimes even integrates or adds comments to it (see Dunbabin 1982: 725–728). The Aquinas/Peter of Auvergne commentary was widely influential both in its immediate medieval context and in the early modern period (Lanza 2013).

After this first wave of commentaries, we see a second wave that dates to the end of the thirteenth and through into the fourteenth and fifteenth centuries. The commentaries were sometimes literal, such as those by Guy of Rimini and Nicole Oresme (author of the first known French vernacular translation of and commentary on the Politics) and sometimes by quaestiones, in which the author chose parts of the text that he considered significant and expounded on them. Among the latter, Peter of Auvergne also authored a remarkable commentary by quaestiones (Dunbabin 1982: 732–734) recently edited by Marco Toste (Questiones). Among others, a commentary known as the Anonymous of Milan provides 90 quaestiones which are quite similar to those of Peter of Auvergne. Some of these commentaries are particularly original (meaning that they interact with Aristotle’s text to reinforce specific political ideas of the author himself, as in the case of Oresme). Others, however, aim to clarify the Politics (for example, those by Guy of Rimini or Walter Burley; see Dunbabin 1982: pp 728–732), even if they often focus on it to address political transformations taking place in their own contexts.

Two patterns appear to be relatively common (despite their many specificities and differences) among all the commentaries on the Politics: (1) their aim to elucidate the Aristotelian text and to explain or clarify some parts of it (a task which becomes particularly pertinent in the quaestiones); (2) their tendency to read Aristotle’s political ideas or examples in light of the specific institutional and political circumstances in which the commentaries were written. Starting with the first point, among the masters who author these commentaries, there is a genuine theoretical and philosophical interest in many elements of Aristotle’s text. Some theoretical problems present in the Politics (for example, Aristotle’s definition of human beings as political animals, his theory of the naturalness of community, his idea of citizenship, and his discussion of natural slavery) attracted the attention of those medieval authors who tried to elucidate the meanings of these ideas in light of the opinions of other authors. These discussions of Aristotle’s political ideas have allowed some contemporary scholars to study the commentary tradition by focusing on specific themes. For example, Dunbabin and Syros take the idea of the wisdom and unity of the crowd as their guiding theme (Dunbabin 1982; Syros 2006), while Juhana Toivanen has focused on the topic of the political animal (Toivanen 2020) and Toste and Lidia Lanza concentrate on other specific themes (Lanza 2013; Toste 2020).

However, the authors of the Politics commentaries also seek to understand Aristotle’s ideas within the specific political and institutional contexts of the world in which they lived. Some studies have stressed that the majority of authors who were Italian or close to the Italian scene tended to read certain ideas in the Politics on popular governments in light of the experiences of the Italian medieval city states (Blythe 1992). Other scholars, however, claim that the authors who commented on this text, especially in the northern European context (where royal power was more common than in Italy), pay more attention to the topics of law and kingship (Luscombe 1997: 313). This distinction has been criticized since most theoretical issues within the commentary tradition remain common regardless of where they were produced and the practical implications that they might entail (Nederman 1996; Briguglia 2018). Indeed, attempts to apply Aristotle’s political ideas about popular government, the mixed regime, kingship, law, and the like to definite institutional and political settings should not lead us to think that the commentaries had a primarily practical purpose. They were mostly university texts. This distinguishes them from the many other late medieval works that put to use Aristotle’s Politics for direct political and ecclesiological purposes.

9. James of Viterbo

In 1296, the French King Philip IV (the Fair) initiated a struggle with the papacy regarding his right to tax and exercise control over the French church and its minions. The controversy had been conducted through both legal wrangling (such as royal decrees and ecclesiastical censure) and through polemical quarrels, in which increasingly extravagant claims were made by both parties and their advocates. The reigning pope, Boniface VIII, asserted for himself universal lordship over the entirety of the possessions and offices of the temporal realm, accruing to him because of his unique status as successor to Christ through his occupation of the See of St Peter. The proponents of the cause of the French crown argued in response that the king was subject to no superior in earthly affairs within his jurisdiction, and could thus collect revenues from, appoint officials to, and impose judgment upon the church. After two rounds of engagement, the dispute was ultimately resolved by the death of Boniface in 1303. A by-product of the Franco-papal contest was the composition of a series of tracts by university-affiliated scholars who applied their philosophical training to defend one or the other cause. Given the erudition displayed in these texts, they represent one significant facet of medieval political philosophy, despite the fact that they were written on behalf of either the papal or the royal contenders (Briguglia 2010). Two especially noteworthy contributors to this literature were James of Viterbo (c. 1255–1308) and John (Quidort) of Paris (c. 1245/55–1306)—the first a proponent of the papacy, the other an advocate for the French monarchy.

The first of these figures, James of Viterbo, argued for the earthly primacy of papal power in his treatise On Christian Rulership (De regimine christiano), most likely written in 1302 (Dyson 2018). (Details about his life are presented in the entry on James of Viterbo.) He was evidently inspired to write On Christian Rulership by a pro-papal tract entitled On Ecclesiastical Power (De potestate ecclesiastica) authored by his fellow Augustinian Giles of Rome. Whereas Giles relied heavily on neo-Platonic ideas of metaphysical hierarchy, James drew upon overtly political resources such as Aristotle and other classical philosophers. On Christian Rulership is divided into two main sections. The first posits a careful analogy between the ordering of the Christian church and that of a kingdom. The second part, of far greater length, focuses of the character of power within the church as well as the relationship between spiritual and secular spheres.

The initial section of James’s text owes a substantial debt to Aristotle directly as well as to the Philosopher’s most eminent medieval interpreter, Thomas Aquinas (Guenée 1971 [1985: 40]; Black 1992: 51; Canning 1996: 40, 42). At the beginning of Part 1, James appeals to the classification of the basic forms of human association as families, cities, and kingdoms, extrapolating from the first book of the Politics (On Christian Government: 6–9). Interestingly, he resists the conclusion that follows from Aristotle, namely, that man is a political animal. Rather, he posits that mankind is essentially social in nature, stemming both from the cooperation entailed by natural necessity and the capacity of speech, which facilitates advantageous communication, views that are more typical of Cicero’s philosophy than Aristotle’s (On Christian Government: 8–9, 32–33). As occurred often after the recovery of Aristotle’s Ethics and Politics, mention of those works did not preclude authors from imposing a Ciceronian interpretation upon Aristotelian doctrines (Nederman 2020).

In order to grasp why James found Aristotelian as well as Ciceronian philosophy congenial to his own purposes in On Christian Rulership, we must comprehend the background to his overarching approach to the defense of papalism. On the one hand, James recurrently proposes parallels between the proper organization of earthly and spiritual forms of government. In particular, he maintains that both kings and popes rule over multitudes of persons that nevertheless collectively constitute communities, whether designated by the word “kingdom” or “church” (On Christian Government: 12–13–16–17). On the other hand, James wishes to make it unambiguously clear that an important disanalogy between the two exists inasmuch as royal authority rests purely upon nature, whereas papal power derives from grace. “The church”, he says, “is not a community of nature, however, but of grace, … having been called and brought together by God through grace” (On Christian Government: 12–13). One consequence of this bifurcation is that some aspects of temporal social and political life are entirely unique to it, while other dimensions resonate with the Church and its system of government.

Nature is, as medieval thinkers commonly recognized, ultimately God’s creation. But James consistently treats the human, natural world according to two standards: one by the direct divine authorization instantiated by the church, the other by the efforts of man, reflecting his sociable nature, the maintenance of which constitutes the reason that government is instituted. He concludes that

among men, therefore, to whom it is more natural to live in society than any animal, is there a natural inclination toward the institution of government; and government of this kind is said to exist by human law, which arises from nature.

Government for James thus “perfects the inclination of nature; and so it is called a human and natural power” (On Christian Government: 130–131). Several elements of this view need to be highlighted. Consistent with the point discussed above, organized political life is not natural per se. Rather, earthly government is authorized in order to preserve the social disposition embedded within human beings (On Christian Government: 314–315). It depends upon the conscious “co-operation of natural inclination and institution; for it was introduced among men by human law, which arises from nature” (On Christian Government: 304–305). So James envisions the foundation of government to be human in origination, yet consonant with the natural orientation inherent in mankind to live socially.

If men are at their core social beings, however, why would political rule be needed at all? The answer to this question offered by James is that every human being possesses reason and intellect, by means of which he is capable of accessing natural law and acting in accordance with it: “That which is natural is common to all who have a share in nature”, gentiles and Jews no less than Christians (On Christian Government: 130–131). However, men’s application of their rational capacities does not occur evenly. Rather, many (perhaps most) men are frail; they refrain from employing their reason and are instead overwhelmed by their passions. James’s argument may be broken down as follows: (1) human beings possess the power of reason, which in principle permits them to live socially in the absence of government; (2) men are, however, impeded in the full utilization of their latent rational powers because they succumb to their self-love and desire for personal (material) advantage; (3) political authority is brought into existence in order to support and reinforce the sociability that is intrinsic to mankind but threatened by the failure to apply reason. On the one hand, politics is not natural in and of itself. Yet, on the other hand, the emergence of government is wholly consistent with aspects of human nature.

Since James’s version of naturalism upholds the principle that temporal political authority is instituted by men, rather than conferred directly by God, he arrives at the conclusion that a ruler’s position must be assigned by means of the active assent of those over whom he exercises power. In his view, “Someone achieves rulership rightly when he is appointed by the agreement and common consent of the multitude” (On Christian Government: 316–317). This position runs throughout On Christian Rulership. When temporal political authority is conferred upon some person in a “natural” manner, this occurs solely as the result of the voluntary determination made by the human beings who will obey him (On Christian Government: 134–135, 144–145). James expressly condemns as illegitimate the government of anyone “who, out of a desire for mastery, or by force or deceit or by some other unworthy means, usurps ruling power to himself” (On Christian Government: 316–317). When speaking of royal power in a purely naturalistic sense, consequently, it is irrelevant to James whether the king is Christian or pagan (although, of course, the former is preferable to him).

The primary role of the king in the promotion of moral virtue and/or spiritual salvation—a claim that was a hallmark of many medieval adherents of Aristotle—is unequivocally dismissed by James. At best, he admits that inasmuch as

external goods serve the virtuous life as instruments, it pertains to the king to procure and provide for the people a sufficiency of such goods as are necessary to this life. (On Christian Government: 150–151)

As a consequence, On Christian Rulership posits a strict division between the goals of temporal government and those of the Church, in such a manner that the most the former can contribute to the latter is the prevention of physical and material injury and the preservation of peace as an aide to the clergy’s performance of its holy duties (On Christian Government: 152–153). For this very reason, the authorization of the rulership of the “natural” social order may and should be left to the multitude who willingly submits to it.

In turn, religion forms the bridge between the natural and supernatural realms, in the sense that belief in God is both inbred in men and completed by means of grace. Prior to the emergence of the faiths of the Law and then of the Gospel, James says, practices associated with religious belief nonetheless were formulated by man and flourished as a result of indirect divine inspiration, beginning “at the very foundation of the human race” (On Christian Government: 124–125). Consequently, a priesthood existed to oversee its rites. James links recognition of divinity to “the virtues that exist according to nature as aptitudes” and in particular to “a certain virtue called religion, to which it pertains to exhibit due worship to God, and which is called a species of justice” (On Christian Government: 126–127). Because it was derived from the God-given human disposition to pay tribute to a deity, the pagan form of devotion is not utterly illegitimate, but merely a partial expression of the ultimate realization of which is found in Christianity. James concludes that

the priesthood of nature is therefore not destroyed by that of the gospel, but perfected and formed, because grace does not abolish nature, but forms and perfects it. (On Christian Government: 128–129)

As the apex of religion, Christianity is the fulfillment of the orientation of mankind toward religion, although not now purely by nature, but by revelation. Yet nature still plays a significant role in the realization of the Christian faith. For God’s direct disclosure of Himself by means of scripture is granted not to all of creation, but only to rational beings. Since men alone are endowed with reason, they and they uniquely enjoy access to divine grace and the consequent potential for salvation. According to James, the occurrence of divine forgiveness inheres solely in “the kind of government that belongs to rational creatures, and especially men, who are properly called rational creatures”, namely, “the governing power that has been communicated to the church by Christ or through Christ” (On Christian Government: 114–115). On these naturalistic philosophical foundations James thereafter builds his defense of papal primacy, which takes up the second part of On Christian Rulership.

10. John of Paris

The other author of note to contribute a treatise of philosophical interest to the Franco-papal conflict was John of Paris in his On Royal and Papal Power (De potestate regia et papali), evidently written in late 1302 or 1303 in direct response to James’s On Christian Rulership (Ubl 2003). As a member of the Dominican Order, John probably studied with Thomas Aquinas; he certainly wrote a defense of Thomistic thought in about 1285, in response to Franciscan critics. Similar to James of Viterbo, John’s name has been assigned to a wide range of other writings (approaching two dozen in number) on philosophical and theological topics. The Dominicans studying and teaching at the University of Paris had sided overwhelmingly with the royal position in the struggle between Phillip and Boniface. Indeed, John of Paris’s name may be found among very many other members of his order on a petition dating to 1303 that urged Philip to bring Boniface to trial before a general council of the church (Jones 2015: 3–4).

On Royal and Papal Power attempts to sort out the complex differences between distinct types of legal rights attributable to various institutions and offices depending upon their nature and condition. The key to John’s unraveling of the complexities of overlapping and competing systems of legal rights is the careful and strict distinction he draws between jurisdiction (jurisdictio) and dominion or lordship (dominium). Jurisdiction refers to “the right (ius) of determining what is just and unjust with respect to … property rights and dominion over external goods” (RPP: 30). By contrast, dominion denotes the primary power or capacity to “order, dispose, keep or transfer” possessions “without injury to anyone else”, what we might call the legal right of ownership (RPP: 28). On Royal and Papal Power addresses three central questions arising from this distinction. First, who is lord of the goods of the church? Second, who enjoys lordship over the property of laypeople? And third, what is the proper relationship between the church and the possessions of the laity? In a series of chapters that comprise the main body of the text, John first offers his own answers to these questions, then proposes a set of potential objections to his positions, and finally provides detailed response to supposed counterarguments.

According to John, various rights can and must be classified analytically depending on the types of persons and offices exercising them. In the case of the goods possessed by the church, he asserts that “no individual person has property rights and dominion over them”; rather, since “ecclesiastical goods, as ecclesiastical, are used for communities and not for individual persons”, ownership of them can only be said to reside in the community itself (RPP: 22). What, then, is the rightful role of the pope (or for that matter other spiritual leaders)? In John’s view, the head of any ecclesiastical unit, including the pope, is a “dispenser” and “administrator” of the property shared by his community, in accordance with the principles of justice and for the sake of the common good. If the pope were indeed lord of the goods of the church, he could use them however he wishes without any reference to the needs of his fellow clerics; but this would violate the very purpose for which property is donated to religious organizations. Thus, it must be that

the pope alone is not lord. Rather, he is the general dispenser; and the bishop or abbot is a special or immediate dispenser, while the community has true dominion over goods. (RPP: 25)

John goes so far as to declare that the head of an ecclesiastical community (even the pope), if he appears to be “disposing of goods unfaithfully and for the private and not for the common good”, may rightfully be deposed from office (RPP: 26).

Neither does the pope enjoy legal rights over the temporal property of the laity. The earthly goods of non-clerics are rightfully apportioned by a means other than assignment by clergy. Specifically, John explains that the external goods of the laity are not granted to the community, as is ecclesiastical property, but

are acquired by individual people through their own art, labor, or industry, and individual persons, insofar as they are individuals, have right (ius) and power and true lordship over them. (RPP: 28; translation modified)

John holds that lay lordship over temporalities owes nothing whatsoever to an interlocking system of property relations created artificially by a “just” division of the common. Private goods enter into some social setting only by an act of volition on the part of their proprietors, as through acts of exchange or concession. Consequently, the pope’s spiritual rights as head of the church and ultimate dispenser of its goods do not entitle him to any jurisdiction over the property of laymen. Christ’s “kingship” did not extend to temporal affairs and thus jurisdiction has not been conceded to the pope or any other priest (RPP: 30–33).

Yet what happens in instances when injury to others occurs or when public needs arise that transcend the capacity of individuals or groups thereof to redress them? John invokes the concept of the jurisdiction, which he specifically ascribes to secular rulers to determine the just and unjust uses of temporal goods. John is very precise in his construction of his explanation of the connection between individual property and the authority possessed by earthly governors. Jurisdiction, he says, is rendered necessary by the entry of private proprietors into voluntary mutual relations with one another (RPP: 28–29). According to John, the temptation on the part of some to override the rights of others, in conjunction with the need for individuals to attend the common interest, comprise the only justifications for the jurisdiction of rulers. Hence, those who antecedently exercise private property rights must and do authorize the appointment of a judge and executor over themselves and their goods. Yet note that

a ruler has the power of judging and ascertaining with respect to the goods of those under his authority without, however, having dominion over them …. (RPP: 30)

The distinction posited between lordship and jurisdiction is clear-cut and firm. However, in cases of “extreme necessity”, when Christians—lay and clerical alike—are imperiled by threats such as “an invasion of pagans”, John contends that “all the goods of the faithful, even the chalices, belonging to churches are common and to be shared…” Hence, the ruler “has the power to dispense and determine what is to be turned over for the common needs of the faith” (RPP: 29). In other words, the imposition of emergency taxes on the church pertains to the authority of secular government and the pope is duty-bound to provide aid from the community property under his dispensation.

11. Dante Alighieri

Dante Alighieri (1265–1321 CE) is best known as the author of the three volumes that comprise the Divine Comedy, a work that made him one of the most acclaimed writers of Italian literature. This monumental literary accomplishment—which does contain some political content—ought not to overshadow entirely, however, the political activism that characterized Dante’s life. Especially toward the end of the thirteenth century (until his exile from Florence in 1301), he directly participated in Florentine politics and rose in the political ranks of Florence, even holding the city’s most prestigious magistracy, the priorate. (For more on his career, see the entry on Dante Alighieri.) Dante also wrote philosophical and political works, such as De vulgari eloquentia (On Vernacular Eloquence), the Convivio (the Banquet) and Monarchia (Monarchy). Attention to Dante as a philosopher dates back to the studies of Etienne Gilson and Bruno Nardi in the twentieth century (Gilson 1948; Nardi 1960), but has once again become an object considerable of scholarly interest (Aleksander 2011; Brenet 2019; Marenbon 2001; Tabarroni 2019).

Despite having received no formal university education, Dante drew on his philosophical culture to deal with ethical and political problems. For example, in the Banquet, he provides a classification of the different branches of human knowledge in which the heavenly spheres are allegorically identified with the liberal arts. The practical sciences occupy a privileged position in his scheme. In Book II.13.8, Dante says that, while in physics and metaphysics can be found in the eighth heaven, in the ninth sphere (Aristotle’s primum mobile), above these disciplines, we should list moral science (or moral philosophy), just under the divine science, theology, which is situated in the Empyrean (Convivio: 104–105 and 116–118). To clarify this view, in Book II.14, he claims that moral philosophy “sets us in order for the other sciences” (Convivio: 117). Starting with Gilson in the 1930s, scholars have emphasized how this position overturns the traditional medieval belief that metaphysics is the most important science within the system of human knowledge (Gilson 1948). Dante’s original vision of the status of moral philosophy may in turn derive from al-Fārābī’s classification in his Enumeration of the Sciences, which by means of its Latin translation may also be traced to Christian authors such as Roger Bacon (1220–1292).

Dante’s most important text of political philosophy is Monarchy. The discussion over the dates of composition of this work is ongoing, although scholars generally agree that Dante must have worked on this treatise after 1312, that is, after the arrival of German emperor Henry VII in Italy, which ended tragically with the sudden death of the emperor. The treatise is divided into three books and aims to provide various philosophical and historical arguments in support of the autonomy of the temporal power of the empire. Towards the beginning of Monarchy, Dante presents the three main questions that guide his analysis over the course of the three respective books of his treatise. In the first book, Dante inquires into whether the empire “is necessary to the well-being of the world” (Monarchia: 4). The second and third books are respectively dedicated to the questions “Did the Roman people take on the office of the monarch by right?” and “Does the monarch’s authority derive directly from God or someone else (his minister or vicar)?” (Monarchia: 4).

Scholars have debated over whether Monarchy should be considered as a utopian tract or a realist text that relates to the specific circumstances in which it was composed (Stocchi Perucchio 2017). While a philosophical work, Monarchy also expressed a politically militancy that aimed to contribute to a lively debate raging at the beginning of the fourteenth century, which arose from the challenge posed to the ideal of universal empire by the papal claim to a plenitude of power. In the first book, Dante explains that the primary subject of the treatise is political. In his words, “It is clear that the present subject is not directed primarily towards theoretical understanding but towards action” (Monarchia: 5). Some features of Dante’s reasoning are worth emphasizing. First, Dante’s idea of human society (civilitas) provides a universalist perspective that, as noted by some scholars (Fioravanti 2019), does not follow the typical medieval identification between humankind and Christianitas. When Dante claims that papal power in political affairs is not based on the “consent of all men”, he mentions the examples of Asians and Africans who are not Christian and subject to the power of the church (Monarchia: 89). Second, his universal ideal of the empire is different from that of his contemporary, Marsilius of Padua, who believed that the Holy Roman Empire should only be one among many different political regimes.

Even if Dante’s position on the topic of the empire had important practical ramifications, it remains fundamentally philosophical. Grounding a practical and political problem on philosophical and theoretical assumptions led him to search for the “guiding principle” of his inquiry. This first principle is concerned with the answer to the question, “What is the purpose of human society [societas] as a whole?”, and lies in the idea that the “full intellectual potential of humanity” should be continuously actualized (Monarchia: 8). For Dante, a universal temporal monarch and empire alone can guarantee the full realization of the intellectual potential of humanity. In Monarchy, Dante combines different sources, among them Cicero and Aristotle, but also Latin poets such as Virgil and Lucan. However, Dante finds the roots of his reasoning in support of the empire in Aristotelian metaphysical principles and Aristotle’s ethical and political thought (for example, he often stresses the idea that nature does nothing in vain, which also forms an important premise of his analysis in the Banquet). Moreover, to defend the key first principle of his reasoning, the idea that an empire is needed to actualize the potential of humankind fully, he also directly quotes the philosophy of Ibn Rushd (Averroes), albeit appropriating it in a very selective and idiosyncratic way. Dante’s mention of Ibn Rushd has sparked a strong debate about whether he qualifies as an Averroist thinker. In Purgatory XXV, he explicitly rejected the Averroist idea of the unicity of the possible intellect. Yet, despite occasional skepticism (Bianchi 2015), scholars generally concede that in Monarchy, Dante draws freely on the Averroist idea of the fulfillment of the potential of human knowledge and places it center-stage (Brenet 2006; Marenbon 2001).

The bulk of Dante’s partisan political theory is contained in the second and third books of Monarchy, wherein he shows that (1) the Roman Empire, which is the model par excellence of the universal empire, deserves to rule the world because it guaranteed peace and stability; and (2) the legitimacy of that Empire does not depend on papal power. Dante employs philosophical, scriptural and historical arguments to support these positions. He also uses two powerful historical facts to defend his thesis, namely, that the Roman Empire preceded the church, so that its origins were not historically dependent on the church, and that the “Donation of Constantine” (an eighth-century forgery commonly taken as authentic at the time) could not validly have assigned the territories of the empire and authority of the emperor to the papacy. Finally, behind his rejection of any papal claims to temporal power and his view that imperial power comes directly from God without any intermediary at the end of the third book of Monarchy, we find an important philosophical precept based on the distinction between earthly and heavenly happiness. Dante argues that, while happiness in this life is achieved through the “teaching of philosophy”, happiness in the afterlife can be achieved through the study of theology and attaining the vision of God. The two offices of emperor and pope are entrusted with helping achieve these two different forms of happiness respectively in the earthly life (by the emperor) and in the heavenly life (by the pope). Empire is the necessary condition to render earthly and heavenly happiness possible because, as a universal authority, it guarantees the peace and quiet necessary to facilitate felicity. Moreover, God Himself “preordained” this relationship between the different authorities (Monarchia: 93).

12. Marsilius of Padua

Few political philosophers have generated more controversy than Marsilius (Marsiglio Mainardini) of Padua (c. 1275/80–c. 1342/43). Reviled by defenders of Christian religious and institutional orthodoxy during the later Middle Ages, Marsilius’s teachings were nonetheless disseminated even by those who besmirched his name. In his major work, the Defender of Peace (Defensor pacis), completed in 1324, Marsilius upheld a strict separation between the temporal and the spiritual ends of human existence, and constructed conceptions of the secular community as well as the church accordingly. (Recent general overviews of his thought include Merlo 2003; Briguglia 2013; and Ottaviani 2018.) Trained as a physician, probably at Padua’s university, Marsilius eventually moved on to study and teach in Paris, where he evidently composed the Defender of Peace (Godthardt 2012). Soon after its completion, Marsilius and his colleague John of Jandun departed Paris for the court of the German king Ludwig of Bavaria, who was in the midst of a struggle with Pope John XXII over the former’s claim to the office of emperor. Marsiglio seems to have orchestrated Ludwig’s procession into Italy in 1327 to press his imperial pretensions—an exercise that ultimately failed to achieve its goal (Godthardt 2006).

At the center of Marsilius’s political project is his stalwart opposition to the earthly pretensions of the priesthood and especially the papacy. He constructs this argument along several distinct lines, leading to the organization of the Defender of Peace into three discourses (dictiones). Discourse I discusses the origins and nature of earthly political authority; the second discourse severely criticizes claims made on behalf of the rights of the church and, particularly, the papacy, to exercise temporal power and defends an alternate conciliar ecclesiology; a brief third section summarizes further conclusions that may be derived from the preceding discourses that Marsilius regards to be especially useful. The structural division between the substance of Discourse I and of Discourse II was unusual for its time, inasmuch as it implies a distinction between the treatment of temporal government and of ecclesiastical affairs (Koch 2012).

Yet the Defender of Peace is by no means formed of two separate, self-subsistent, and internally coherent treatises. Rather, a single central theme binds together the tract as a whole: the danger posed to human happiness (as experienced in the peaceful and self-sufficient community) by the interference of papal government in secular life. The entire force of the argument in the Defender of Peace is directed toward demonstrating the disruptive effects of the papacy’s attempts to meddle in temporal affairs (Condren 1980; Nederman 1995: 9–27). Approached from this perspective, Discourse I stipulates the arrangements necessary to bolster the stability and unity of secular communities so as to repulse papal interference, while Discourse II substitutes the principles of papal monarchy with those of conciliar ecclesiology.

Marsilius’s pursuit of his anti-papal line of political reasoning depends heavily upon his postulation of a sharp distinction between temporal and spiritual realms in the Defender of Peace. In typical Christian Aristotelian fashion, Marsilius acknowledges that human ends “fall into two kinds, of which one is temporal or earthly, while the other is usually called eternal or heavenly” (Defender of Peace: I.4.3). But the resemblance between his view and more conventional medieval Aristotelianism is largely superficial. According to the Defender of Peace, temporal ends are for the most part indifferent to spiritual goals. The term “spiritual”, Marsilius says, “refers to every immanent action or passion of human cognitive or appetitive power” (Defender of Peace: II.2.5), where “immanent” acts are understood as wholly internal and self-regarding. Immanent acts are spiritual in the sense that they do not transgress the boundaries of the soul, hence are invisible to human observation and are known only to God.

By contrast, the temporal activities of a human being, Marsilius believes, are of concern to other people to the extent that they are “transient”, that is, have an impact on someone else. Consequently, “transient” acts are the proper object of regulation by the laws and rulers of the political community (Defender of Peace: I.5.7). When transient behavior is performed in due proportion, it results in benefits to others as well as to oneself. When transient action is excessive, however, it disadvantages other people. Marsilius therefore enshrines temporal advantage as a fundamental and entirely legitimate goal of human conduct. Indeed, he establishes

as the starting-point of everything to be demonstrated… that all human beings not deformed or otherwise impeded naturally desire a sufficient life, and avoid or flee what is harmful thereto…. (Defender of Peace: I.4.2)

The advantage of human beings is achieved by gaining those conditions of existence which confer upon them a physically adequate life. Although Marsilius makes passing mention of the Aristotelian conception of living well, constituted by the exercise of the practical and theoretical virtues, the material sufficiency of human life receives the overwhelming measure of his attention (Moreno-Riaño & Nederman 2012b).

Drawing on various sources ranging from Aristotle to Cicero and Ibn Rushd, Marsilius formulates a philosophical reconstruction of the origins of human association and of government that serves as an explanation of both the purpose of civil life and its relation to human nature. The preservation of individuals is achieved most fully and naturally under conditions of human cooperation in the context of an ordered community organized along functional lines, including farmers, merchants, craftsmen, and warriors among those who count as citizens. Marsilius holds that “human beings came together in the civil community in order to pursue advantage and a sufficient life and to avoid the opposite” (Defender of Peace: I.12.7). The pursuit of mutual advantage grounds the account of the origins of communal life in the Defender of Peace. The “perfected” community for Marsilius emerges along with the differentiation of the functions necessary for a materially sufficient existence, these tasks being defined by the various arts created by humankind in order to redress their physical infirmities (Defender of Peace: I.3.2–5). Marsilius thus posits that the commission of “transient” acts is absolutely necessary for human beings to attain a sufficient life.

Marsilius intends the people within the community to take an active role in their own governance, locating popular consent at the center of his theoretical framework but also grounding it on an epistemic theory of popular prudence (Mulieri 2023a; Nederman 1995). Such consent arises directly from the functional character of the community. First, in Chapter 11 of the first part of Defender of Peace, Marsilius presents a theory of collective prudence which forms the basis of his notion of human law. Second, as he explains in Chapters 12 and 13, all whose interests are served or effected by a community must agree to the conditions of association (that is, human law and rulership). Second, having so consented, all citizens must individually as well as collectively submit to the terms of their cooperation, after which they can be held strictly accountable for excessive “transient” actions that are detrimental to the advantage of fellow citizens. In consequence, the Defender of Peace holds that the legitimacy of both human laws and rulers depends wholly upon an epistemic defense of the prudence of the people as well as upon their “voluntary” character, that is, the extent to which those subject to their jurisdiction have publicly and overtly consented to their authority (Defender of Peace: I.9.5, I.12.3). Peace is best upheld when government expresses the will of the citizen body.

The second and larger discourse of the Defender of Peace consists of an examination and critique of papalist theories of ecclesiastical government, along with the defense of conciliar ecclesiology. The foundation for much of this theory of the church was laid already in the first discourse, however. Marsilius stipulated there that the priesthood must be counted as simply one of the functions necessary for a perfected community (Defender of Peace: I.5.10–14). Therefore, priests are exempt neither from the secular laws nor from the public burdens required for the maintenance of civil order. Furthermore, the activities of priests, just as of other offices within the social body, must be strictly regulated according to the principles of temporal welfare. In short, Marsilius denies to the clergy any autonomy in the exercise of their appointed tasks when these touch upon the realm of “transient” action.

Marsilius’s refusal to permit to the priesthood any earthly independence from the community derives primarily from his conception of law. Legal prescriptions that have a coercive force, and hence can be physically imposed upon individuals, are by definition temporal. The proper function of the priesthood is the education and preparation of souls for eternal life, a task that is of a wholly spiritual character. Consequently, the clergy (including the papacy) lacks the authority to require or prohibit any action of a temporal sort. For priests to have such legislative power would amount to one part of the civil body dictating its will to the remaining segments, a situation the validity of which Marsilius had already discounted in Discourse I. Marsilius’s argument amounts to a denial of the status of “law”, which is coercive, to the canons of the Christian church. Canon law provides at best “counsels” to the faithful about deeds they may wish to perform or refrain from for the sake of their souls.

The ecclesiology of the Defender of Peace likewise draws upon the first discourse. Marsilius defines the church as “the whole body of the faithful who believe in and invoke the body of Christ” (Defender of Peace: II.2.3). In his view, the “whole body of the faithful” is equivalent to the “perfected community” when regarded in its spiritual, rather than temporal, aspect. Hence, the citizen body forms the supreme authority in the ecclesiastical realm as well as the secular sphere. The community alone enjoys the authority to appoint and remove priests, to legislate regarding spiritual affairs, to punish members of the faithful, and to impose interdiction and excommunication. Marsilius hence undermines not merely priestly power, but the entire edifice of the ecclesiastical hierarchy, with the papacy at its apex. Neither the pope nor any of the bishops may properly claim for their office a divine origin or basis; their powers are conferred entirely by the whole body of the faithful, who always retain the right to suspend, limit, or eliminate any position or its incumbent. There is quite literally nothing sacred about the structure of papal government.

In order to facilitate control by believers over the church, they select representatives to meet as a General Council in order to establish Christian doctrine. The Council appoints and removes ecclesiastical officials, proclaims and interprets canon law, and gives final authority to every action undertaken by the institutions of the church. The Council becomes the effective governing body of the church, while the pope and other clerical officials serve simply as executors of the conciliar will. The central goal of the Council is the canonical interpretation of the divine will as revealed in Holy Scripture. It is up to the Council, the Defender of Peace contends, to discover and articulate eternal truths when issues of doubtful understanding arise and to ensure that the body of the faithful is guided toward salvation according to holy writ.

13. William of Ockham

Although known primarily as one of the most accomplished philosophers and theologians of the fourteenth century, and in particular as the most influential early proponent of the metaphysical doctrine of “nominalism”, William of Ockham (c. 1285–1347) also composed a substantial body of political writings. (A full exposition of his life and philosophy may be found in the entry on William of Ockham.) From 1328 onward, Ockham devoted his career to the twin pursuits of defending the Franciscan ideal of apostolic poverty and advancing the imperial claims of German king Ludwig of Bavaria, composing a series of stinging attacks on the papacy’s heretical condemnation of the doctrines espoused by Franciscans, while also producing an impressive body of writings on secular government and ecclesiology, (see McGrade 1974; Shogimen 2007).

Like his contemporary Marsilius of Padua, Ockham places a premium on populism and consent in both temporal government and the church. But the resemblance stops there, since Ockham’s arguments are grounded on a set of principles wholly different from Marsilius’s. At the core of Ockham’s political philosophy is a commitment to a doctrine of so-called “subjective” interpretation of natural rights that gestures toward more modern versions of the doctrine, rather than to the traditional idea that rights are “objective”, in the sense that they entail duties to act or refrain from acting rooted in a universal law of nature that binds all people. There has been considerable dispute about whether Ockham was the inventor of natural rights theory or simply an expositor of a position the foundations of which existed earlier in the Middle Ages (Villey 1975; Tuck 1979; Tierney 1997; Robinson 2013). One point is clear, however. He drew conclusions from his conception of rights that were overtly political—pertaining to both temporal and ecclesiastical systems of government—rather than theological or moral in bearing.

Perhaps the clearest example of Ockham’s accomplishment may be found in A Short Treatise on Tyrannical Government (Breviloquium de principatu tyrannico) The tract has two main purposes: first, to undermine papal claims to a plenitude of power; second, to establish that secular rulers (especially, but not exclusively, the Roman emperor) possess their offices independently of any authorization or appointment by the clergy, the pope most of all. Both of these positions can be traced to a conception of divinely ordained natural rights implicit in a phrase that Ockham employs time and again throughout the Short Treatise on Tyrannical Government: “The rights and liberties given by God and nature” (Breviloquium: 54, 62, 124, 133). That he has in mind a subjective conception of human rights is reinforced by his express condemnation of “those who, not content with their own rights, … reach out for others’ rights, divine as well as human” (Breviloquium: 3). Ockham’s repeated association of “rights” with “liberties” is striking. Both unquestionably emanate from God but at the same time are sanctioned by nature. The unmistakable implication is that ius naturale is characterized (at least some of the time) by a realm of personal autonomy protected from interference by others, especially the pope, short of valid cause. In other words, while rights are not unlimited—one is not at liberty, for example, to usurp the legitimately held position of a king or emperor—they are in the first instance one’s own possession.

Ockham’s position informs the terms of his political philosophy reflected in A Short Treatise on Tyrannical Government. Who governs depends upon the “rights and liberties conferred by God and nature”. Ockham contends that rightful authority, even before the birth of Christ, might be founded on human endorsement alone, with the permission of God, of course (Breviloquium: 113–114). An instance of the latter, Ockham says, is when imperial potestas is assigned “through men voluntarily subjecting themselves to an emperor and giving him jurisdiction and power over themselves”, that is, “established by human ordinance” (Breviloquium: 117). He ascribes the capacity of human beings to achieve this result to the fact that “from God and nature all mortals born free and not subject to anyone else by human law have the power voluntarily to set a ruler over themselves” (Breviloquium: 117). In other words, the inherent volition stemming from the subjective rights natural to men permits (indeed, requires) their consent to the terms of their own governance. The free approval of subjects ensures that governments, whether in pagan times or after the advent of Christianity, accord with the natural rights bestowed by God. Ockham provides, then, a human rights justification of consent to government.

In the Dialogue (Dialogus), a lengthy exchange between a Master and a Student, Ockham once again addresses how imperial jurisdiction originated. He begins the argument by drawing a firm distinction between the foundation of the universal jurisdiction of the papal office and that ascribed to the emperor. The Master renounces the position that the authority of each derives from the same source, asserting instead that they are disanalogous in this respect. The pope (“the president in spiritual matters”) is ordained directly by God. The emperor of the world (“the president of temporalia”), on the other hand, is granted power by neither divine nor natural law, but rather by human assent. Ockham explains that, as a consequence, those matters that pertain purely to the determinations of mankind, rather than God or nature, “can licitly be changed by men, because everything is dissolved by the same causes that gave it birth” (Ockham Dialogus-III: 256). He supports this claim by remarking that

before one secular ruler presided over all mortals, those who wished, for a just and reasonable cause, could licitly consent that someone should not be appointed to empire over the whole world; for when there is a loss to the liberty or power or right of some, the consent of all must be sought and had. (Dialogus-III: 256)

Prior to the authorization of the emperor, human beings enjoy complete freedom that is their personal attribute as natural possession.

Elsewhere in the Dialogue, Ockham discusses the issue of who enjoys the right to select the pope. In his view, since the bishop of Rome (who happens to be the pope) should be chosen by the people over whom he exercises his clerical authority, the determination of the papal incumbent must properly be in the hands of the Romans. “The Romans have the right to elect the highest pontiff”, Ockham says,

Those whom he is to be set over have the right to elect the one to be set over them, so that no one should be given to them against their will. (Ockham Dialogus-III: 290)

On principle, “no one should be set over the whole body of mortals”—by which he means the Roman people in their special role as the representatives of humanity—“except by their election and consent” (Dialogus-III: 290–291). In their original condition, the Roman people determined their own bishop (who happens to be the pope). Yet, in turn, the Romans “transferred their power to the emperor” such that “the Romans themselves can resign their right and also transfer to another the right to elect the highest pontiff” (Dialogus-III: 291). On this account, the conferral of papal authority belongs originally to the Roman people. But the same principle allows the Romans to assign this right to the emperor, who makes the decision on their behalf. Broadly speaking, the emperor represents the people who have granted power to him, but he then decides on the identity of the pope without direct reference to the Romans, standing in for them.

Yet when it comes to examining and punishing a pope who has fallen into heresy, the emperor enjoys no special authority. Ockham refers the matter to a General Council of the church as the ultimate source of authority within Christendom. Ockham poses the question of who may legitimately convoke such a Council. He proclaims the somewhat startling proposition that not only “kings and princes”, but “even the laity can, if they will it, convene a General Council, and participate in the deliberations of this council” (Ockham Dialogus-I: 7). After adducing several authoritative sources to support this assertion, he asserts that, since “the deliberations of a general council touch all, because the deliberations ought to be about the faith, and everything that pertains to all Christians”, it “is understood that all can deliberate” (Dialogus-I: 9). Not only the clergy, but also the laity, possess the competence to engage in the activity of the Council, since it refers to matters shared by all—lay people as well as religious (Dialogus-I: 11). Thus, any faithful Christian is qualified to assemble a council, rather than just secular magnates. Indeed, Ockham takes this claim to a seeming extreme: lay women just as much as lay men may convoke a General Council, inasmuch as matters of the faith also touch them. Thus, “of necessity, women are not to be excluded from a General Council”, in either its calling or its deliberations (Dialogus-I: 12). One may again detect echoes of the emphasis on consent that runs throughout Ockham’s political writings.

14. Nicole Oresme

During the Middle Ages, many philosophers were also deeply engaged with public affairs, especially in the service of royal courts. Thus, the career of Nicole Oresme (c. 1320–1382) was hardly unusual. While he possessed excellent academic credentials, studying and teaching in the Arts faculty at the University of Paris, Oresme was also closely associated with the court of French king Charles V, who had achieved notoriety as a patron of literary and philosophical pursuits. Oresme moved seamlessly between the university, the secular court, and the church (at his death he was Bishop of Lisieux). Oresme’s own contributions to philosophy included a wide range of investigations, typical of scholastic philosophers, into metaphysics, cosmology, and mathematics, as well as ethics, economics and politics. Especially worthy of attention is his tract on the nature and importance of money and his French vernacular translations of and commentaries on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics and Politics (and also the pseudo-Aristotle Economics), all of which fused philosophy with the world of the court. (For a more complete account of his life and teachings, see the entry on Nicole Oresme.)

Oresme’s Treatise on the Origin, Nature, Law and Mutation of Money (Tractatus de origine et natura, jure et mutationibus monetarum), better known as On Money (De moneta), counts among the earliest medieval tracts to concentrate explicitly on a specific economic topic (see Kaye 1998; Nederman 2009: 235–247; Woodhouse 2017; Giglio 2022). He probably wrote this treatise in the context of an ongoing debate concerning the debasement of the French coinage, a procedure from which the crown had profited for many years. On Money makes a powerful case favoring the stabilization of the value of money over the royal temptation to raise revenue through reminting or coin clipping. Oresme says that the work has two purposes: to identify the underlying political nature of the problem of currency manipulation, and to advise his countrymen in a pragmatic fashion about a matter of public policy. His specialized economic analysis is prefatory to his effort to bring economic concerns to bear on the duties of rulers and the needs of their subjects.

Central to this project is Oresme’s contention that money “is well-suited for intercourse among a large number of human beings and the use of it is good in itself” (Oresme De moneta: 5). Economic enterprise makes key contributions to the public welfare, which is the intended purpose of exchange relations. Since trade and commerce directly impact the common good, he insists that the enabling medium of money must be the property of the community. Although the ruler is assigned responsibility for the actual minting and regulating of the money supply, he does so as an executive agent of the community, deputized to realize the public good of sound currency and equitable exchange. The dominant theme of Oresme’s treatise is the communal ownership, and thus ultimate control, of money. From this precept follows the advice of On Money about the debasement of coinage as a political phenomenon. Since the community requires money in order to engage in a full range of economic activities, and hence to promote the good of its members, the very idea that a ruler exerts private control over coinage is excluded.

Implicit in the ascription of money’s ownership to the community is an economic conception of the common good itself. Oresme employs the traditional distinction between “true kingship” and “tyranny” in explicating the difference between well-ordered and evil government (Oresme De moneta: 42). Unlike his predecessors, however, Oresme’s examples of just and unjust rule are invariably couched in terms of the economic impact of a government’s actions. In explaining why manipulation of the value of currency by a ruler is unjust, he draws an analogy to political interference in agricultural markets (De moneta: 16). The value of the goods within a community can only be established in the first instance by voluntary exchanges among individuals. Tyranny occurs when legitimate economic choices are countermanded for the self-interest of those who hold political power. By contrast, good government or kingship has a decidedly economic overtone. Consequently, royal judgments about public policy ought to rest on determinations about the economic welfare of the community.

Oresme’s other major contribution to political philosophy, his French-language translation of and commentary on Aristotle’s Politics, advances many of the themes articulated in On Money. Commissioned by Charles V sometime in the 1370s, this commentary (and its companions on the Ethics and Economics) represented an early effort to make available to a non-Latinate readership ideas otherwise accessible only in the lecture rooms of the universities (Babbit 1985; Sherman 1995). Unlike other commentators, however, Oresme often moved well beyond the text of the Politics and developed Aristotelian themes creatively and in a manner more directly germane to his courtly audience. He also showed no reluctance to criticize Aristotle when it seemed appropriate to him. Oresme thus demonstrated an eclectic spirit that liberates his commentary from many of the constraints imposed by the scholastic pedagogical origins of his predecessors.

One example of this independent cast of mind is Oresme’s dissatisfaction with Aristotle’s classification of constitutions. He mentions the basic Aristotelian six-fold division and, given the context of his audience, upholds kingship as the best system of government (Oresme Politiques: 87c). But Oresme then proposes a different way of categorizing constitutions, inasmuch as he speaks of kingship, tyranny, and faction—the latter, as Oresme understands it, being identical to oligarchy. Oresme additionally proffers the claim, not to be found in the Politics, that democracy is form of a tyranny. Oresme postulates that the distinction between good and defective regimes depends upon the absence in the latter of a chose publique, that is, “public affairs” necessary for a well-ordered community. Oresme stresses that “the chose publique” in such bad regimes “is not vicious … but is simply and entirely non-existent” (Politiques: 88b). Thus, imperfect regimes lack a core or a unity—an agreement among their members about the common good, to express the matter in Aristotelian terms. Yet Oresme also acknowledges that, bad though they may be, “nevertheless these polities do exist” (Politiques: 88b). Democracies and oligarchies—like tyrannies—are not merely theoretical systems but have real-world corollaries.

Oresme extends the understanding of imperfect regimes when he takes up the question of their operative principles of distributive justice, especially in the case of oligarchic and democratic systems. Aristotle maintained that citizens in both of these constitutions profoundly misconceive the nature of political justice, and thus that neither of their governmental structures qualified as just. Oresme adopts a more conciliatory line. “In all constitutions, whether they be good or bad”, he says,

they must agree that there is a certain right (droit) and ordinances or positive laws that approximate justice in some degree, for otherwise there could not be legal actions or entry into interrelations. (Oresme Politiques: 89b)

According to Oresme, justice so predominates in human nature that even the iniquitous partake of some small portion of it (Politiques: 89b-c). Oresme concludes that “there are many just laws that are common to both [perfect and imperfect] sorts of constitution”, such as “commutative justice in contracts and in punishment and in other like matters” (Politiques: 90b). Once again, he seems prepared to accommodate defective systems to a far greater extent than Aristotle. Justice is not an all-or-nothing proposition in political communities. Hence, the line between perfect and imperfect regimes begins to blur.

Likewise, in an excursus about the relationship between contemplative and active eudaimonia, Oresme recasts Aristotle’s well-known predilection for philosophical contemplation over action (as expressed in Book 10 of the Nicomachean Ethics and elsewhere). After extensive discussion of which form of existence is most fulfilling, he concludes that contemplation must be set aside when action is required for the maintenance of social and political bonds (Politiques: 243a). Oresme asserts that “a mixture of contemplative work and active work is more desirable and better than one that is entirely taken up with contemplation” (Politiques: 243d), which in turn permits him to praise the life of the prince (presumably someone like Charles V) as the best possible one on earth (Politiques: 244c).

15. Ibn Khaldūn

Some scholars consider Ibn Khaldūn (1332–1406) to be the first and greatest political philosopher of the medieval Islamic world because he separates the study of history and politics from purely moral considerations (Abbès 2022; Gutas 2004). Ibn Khaldūn was born in Tunis and enjoyed a very adventurous life. This led him to work as an advisor to several important Muslim rulers of his time, and he also interacted with the famed conqueror and king Timur (Tamerlane), to whom he gave advice and who may have inspired some of his political ideas (Black 2011: 170). However, he underwent periods of self-imposed exile which he used to study history and politics, as well as to write his works. In this sense, Khaldūn is the perfect example of a theorist who constantly drew on practice to define his political philosophy. Above all, he is the author of a Universal History (Kitab al-‘lbar), which includes an initial section known as the Prolegomena (Muqaddimah), on which he worked throughout his life.

Ibn Khaldūn was trained in classical Islamic philosophy (reading Al-Fārābī, Ibn Sina, and Ibn Rushd) and, at an early age, defined metaphysics as the noblest science (Mahdi 1957). However, in a later phase, the relationship between his political philosophy and metaphysics (which, like other Islamic philosophers, he also sees embodied in Aristotle’s thought) became more complex. On the one hand, Ibn Khaldūn still drew inspiration from some important aspects of Aristotelian political philosophy, such as the idea that human beings are political animals. (However, it is uncertain whether he ever read or had access to Aristotle’s Politics and he might have derived these ideas from other sources). On the other hand, he became increasingly critical of philosophy’s traditional methods for studying the domain of politics. For example, in assessing the relevance of Aristotle’s ideas for the treatment of royal power, he claimed that they are not “exhaustive” (Muqaddimah: 96–97) and increasingly shifted his attention from pure philosophy and metaphysics to history. This is only one dimension of a more general criticism that Khaldūn addresses to the Islamic falasifa (whom he still admired very much) when he speaks about the “ideal virtuous state” of the philosophers as something that hardly exists and that they tend to discuss hypothetically because it is “rare” and “remote” (Black 2011: 175; Namazi 2022: 163). In the Muqaddimah, Khaldūn defines history as a discipline that “involves speculation”, “a subtle explanation of the causes and origins of existing things” as well as the “deep knowledge of the how and why of the events”. For this reason, he argues that history “is firmly rooted in philosophy” and “deserves to be accounted a branch of it” (Muqaddimah: 50). According to Khaldūn, the function of history is also to distinguish the true from the false, by providing detailed and reasoned accounts of the unfolding of historical events.

Aristotle’s political philosophy focused on the city-state (polis), while Ibn Khaldūn places the concept of civilization (umran) at the center of his political thought (Black 2011). In a certain sense, Ibn Khaldūn came to base his specific definition of history on precisely this notion of civilization. In fact, he says that “history, in matter of fact, is information about human social organization, which itself is identical with world civilization” (Muqaddimah: 89). Therefore, the study of the notion of civilization and the complex relationships between different human groups (and how they achieve “superiority over another”), their rise and decline lay at the heart of his thinking (Muqaddimah: 89). This attention to the notion of civilization is also essential because it helps to achieve what Khaldūn defines as the main aim of a historical-political investigation, that is, to analyze critically the facts in order to distinguish “truth from falsehood” (Muqaddimah: 92–93, 147).

Ibn Khaldūn’s description of civilization takes into account the material components which are necessary to sustain material life (e.g., climate and the modes of production) and is based on two main different concepts that are also “two driving forces in human history in every civilization” (Black 2011: 173): asabiyya (a term that could be translated as “group feeling”) and mulk (often translated as “state power”). For Khaldūn, asabiyya refers to the “ability to defend oneself, to offer opposition, to protect oneself and to press one’s claims. Whoever loses it is too weak to do any of these things” (Muqaddimah: 190). However, this same principle establishes the superiority of some groups of people over others and is therefore essential to having good governance and a stable, peaceful community.

At the same time, Khaldūn states that once mankind has achieved a form of social organization that establishes civilization, a natural need arises to exert a “restraining influence to keep people apart because of their natural aggressiveness and injustice” (Muqaddimah: 104–105). This leads people to appoint a person to exercise “restraining influence” in the form of royal authority to keep people’s aggressiveness in check. This characterization of Khaldūn’s theory of kingly power suggests that such authority does not depend on blood or dynastic power but on the dynamics of feeling and group membership. However, it is also important to note that the very development of mulk creates the conditions for the decline of civilization, because one man’s power is more likely to degenerate into its selfish and self-centered use which harms society as a whole. The relationship between these two driving forces of human civilization has led some scholars to debate the actual credentials of Khaldūn’s political commitment, with some seeing a form of republicanism in elements of his ideas (Black 2011: 175).

Within these general considerations on the rise and decline of civilization, Khaldūn also leaves room for specific concerns based on the material and economic conditions that contribute to the stability of a society. In the Muqaddimah, Khaldūn explains that the creation and development of property is a crucial factor in explaining the rise, health, and decline of civilization. In his view, civilization falls into disrepair when royal power is no longer able to protect property (Muqaddimah: 201). Given the central role that Khaldūn ascribes to cultural activity in maintaining civilization, creating incentives for this type of activity is critical. This is also achieved by lowering taxes on people who engage in cultural enterprises in order to stimulate creativity and to increase the possibility of the ruler receiving revenue from these activities (Muqaddimah: 357). In other words, anticipating some themes of modern political economy, Khaldūn maintains that low taxation is key to promoting the public wealth.

16. Christine de Pizan

Considered to be the earliest woman of letters of France, Christine de Pizan (c. 1365–c.1430) was born in Venice, daughter of a physician and astrologer, whose training led him to an appointment to the court of King Charles V of France. Christine’s love of learning and familiarity with court life brought their reward after her husband succumbed when she was only twenty-five years of age, leaving her with three young children, a widowed mother, and an orphaned niece to support (Willard 1984). Christine turned to a life of letters both for consolation and for income, writing a series of remarkable works that included poetry, biography, politics, chivalry, warfare, religion, and philosophy. She is probably best known today for two books written to defend and instruct women: The Book of the City of Ladies (Le Livre de la Cité des Dames) and The Book of the Three Virtues (Le Livre des Trois Vertus). In addition, Christine composed a work addressed to the fourteen-year-old heir to the French throne, Louis of Guyenne. This treatise, The Book of the Body Politic (Le Livre de Corps de Policie), is in many ways an example of the “mirror for princes [specula principum]” genre, whose purpose was to edify as well as entertain rulers, with the goal of transforming them into model kings (Forhan 2002: 27–44). Writing from the self-identified perspective of a non-noble émigré widow who had become learned in French-language as well as (probably) Latin texts, she demonstrates considerable acquaintance with ancient and medieval philosophical sources and traditions.

Her writings display, in particular, both sensitivity to the financial pressures facing Europe’s monarchic governments and deep concern for the needs of the larger populace, including women, city-dwellers, and the poor. The fulcrum on which she balanced these potentially competing interests is her insistence on an inescapably reciprocal relationship between the French people and the royal regime. Her main contribution to political philosophy, the Book of the Body Politic, takes its organizing theme from Books 5 and 6 of John of Salisbury’s Policraticus. It is arranged in three parts. Part I considers in detail the education of the prince, including how he should eat and dress as well as the ideas and writings to which he should be exposed. The second section treats the conduct expected of knights and nobles. Finally, Part III examines the lives of commoners, specifically, merchants, clergy, and students as well as artisans and peasants. As is appropriate for a work directed to a royal audience, The Book of the Body Politic conveys a message of princely responsibility. But it also contains an implicit warning: if a ruler—in this case, the future King Louis—does not act in a manner consonant with his duties, his subjects may cease to obey him and perhaps even revolt.

As the title of the book suggests, Christine approached the social complexity that characterized the late medieval landscape by appropriating and adapting the organic metaphor. Like some of her predecessors, Christine’s body politic incorporated an inclusive, reciprocal, and interdependent conception of community. She observes that

just as the human body is not whole, but defective and deformed, when it lacks any of its members, so the body politic cannot be perfect, whole, or healthy if all the estates of which we speak are not well joined and united together. (Corps de Policie: 90)

For Christine, communal order ensues when the health of the entire public unit is preserved through the mutual coordination of the tasks necessary for its existence (Corps de Policie: 91). To despise any of the members, or to reduce any to a state of servitude, constitutes an attack on the well-being of the whole. Christine also extends medieval precedents by imputing to the body politic a noticeably secular orientation. Unlike her source, John of Salisbury’s Policraticus, the clergy in Christine’s model are not the body’s “soul”, but simply one of the three branches of the common people (Corps de Policie: 19, 95–99). Consequently, Christine expects the king, when necessary, to correct an errant “prelate, priest, or cleric” (Corps de Policie: 14). Because Christine conceives of the king as ordainer and regulator of all estates within the realm, the church does not exercise supremacy over the temporal sphere.

The overtly secular bearing of Christine’s body politic informs her discussion of how the king ought to rule. Christine’s insistence on the importance of the moral well-being as well as material improvement of all members motivates her mandate that the ruler must orient his policies in order to “increase and multiply the virtue, strength, power, and wealth of his country” (Corps de Policie: 39). The promotion of public piety is not primary among his duties, although she certainly maintains that “the good prince ought to forbid” those forms of conduct “opposed to and disapproved by the Christian religion and could be the cause of the wrath of God and the subversion of kingdoms and countries where they take place” (Corps de Policie: 14). Note here Christine’s overtly practical advice for why rulers should adhere to the tenets of Christianity: impiety endangers the security of their position. Moreover, her explicit inclusion of an economic dimension among a government’s central aims deserves special attention. Certainly, it helps to explain her detailed analysis of the lives of merchants, artisans, and laborers, as well as their relations with the king. Not only does Christine argue that men of commerce are not to be disdained; she insists that without

the merchant class … neither the estate of kings and princes nor even the polities of cities and countries could exist. … By the[ir] industry … all kinds of people are provided for without having to make everything themselves. (Corps de Policie: 103, 104)

A nation can only reap the rewards of increased labor efficiencies when there is “trade and an abundance of merchants” (Corps de Policie: 104). In an archetypical example of organic reciprocity, Christine holds that all classes benefit when commercial society is encouraged to flourish.

Christine likewise praises craftsmen and peasants, without whose labor “the republic … could not sustain itself” (Corps de Policie: 105). Because the goods produced and activities performed by such workers are necessary to meet quotidian human needs, their contribution must be accorded value. While judgments may be made about how well individuals perform in their diverse offices, no office which contributes to the community’s material welfare may be demeaned or disdained. The prince, therefore, must maintain and enhance the economic condition of the realm, oversee the efficient coordination of all necessary tasks, and protect against financial force and fraud. These central duties entail that the ruler first be familiar with the myriad activities necessary to the realm and “ought to hear sometimes about the common people, laborers, and merchants, how they make their profit …” (Corps de Policie: 10). Thus will the prince, fully appreciating the contributions of the lower orders, govern knowledgeably and competently.

Most importantly, the king must understand how his own policies impact the conditions of his realm. Poorly compensated soldiers, Christine explains, “pillage and despoil the country”, exacerbating the economic hardships of the rural poor, whereas well-paid troops bolster the rural economy by purchasing “everything that they needed economically and plentifully” (Corps de Policie: 17). Similarly, royal taxation policies ought to be “reasonable”, to affect rich and poor equitably, and to not “gnaw … poor commoners … to the bone” (Corps de Policie: 10). Christine’s conclusion that wise “princes would rather be poor in a rich country, than to be rich and have plenty in a poor country” is a piece of practical advice that naturally follows from an organic conception of communal interdependence (Corps de Policie: 22).

Supplementing Christine’s reflections on the unity of socio-political order are her books about women’s contributions, the City of Ladies and the Three Virtues. Her distinctive conception of society provides the justification for women’s visibility in Christine’s vision of the body politic. In her telling, Ceres and Isis “taught [the people] to build cities and towns”, within which women developed most of the arts and civilized forms of labor, including weaving, olive oil extraction, cart construction, metal working, cultivation, toolmaking, and gardening (Cité des Dames: 73–76). Without women’s innovations and contributions, Christine asserts, humanity would have remained in a “bestial” state. Those who believe that mankind would be better off in this primitive condition blaspheme against the divinely conferred skills and abilities that Ceres and Isis first discovered.

Moreover, women of all estates, Christine maintains, have the capabilities necessary (perhaps even uniquely) to contribute to the tasks associated with the maintenance of earthly well-being. While Christine surely knew Aristotle’s argument, a mainstay of medieval political literature, for the exclusion of women from public life, she challenged this claim directly, envisioning, for example, the princess as a sort of ombudsperson (Trois Vertus: 84–87). Construed in organic terms, the princess furthers bodily intercommunication by serving as a mediating force between king and populace (Trois Vertus: 85). Toward this end, she must occasionally meet with burghers, merchants, and artisans in order to facilitate “love and good will”, thereby strengthening public order and unity. Christine also recognizes that women of the commercial and laboring classes face special burdens. She warns merchants’ wives, for example, to “avoid ostentation” in dress, as such conspicuous display “can cause new taxes for their husbands” (Trois Vertus: 6). Christine’s close attention to the complex intersections of gender and social class manifests in pragmatic counsel to women of various stations, aimed at sustaining a harmonious and cooperative body politic. Just as merchants, artisans, and laborers each have a legitimate and important role within Christine’s organic system, so, too, are women integral at all levels.

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Page numbers in the citations are to the translation unless otherwise stated.

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Kilcullen, John, and Jon Robinson, “Medieval Political Philosophy”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Winter 2024 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/win2024/entries/medieval-political/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]
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- Thomas Aquinas. His writings are available at the Corpus Thomisticum, the fundamental website for the study of Aquinas.
- Peter of Auvergne, archive of Petrus de Alvernia site at the University of Freiburg, devoted to the life and works of Peter of Auvergne (archived on the Internet Archive).
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- Ibn Rushd/Averroes, Digital Averroes Research Environment (DARE) A digital collection of editions, manuscripts, prints (by the Thomas Institute of the University of Cologne).
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- Moses Maimonides, The Guide for the Perplexed, translated by M. Friedländer (1903).
Texts and Translations of Significant Historical Texts from the Internet Medieval Sourcebook, Paul Halsall (ed.):
- The Sunnah, Traditions of the Prophet Muhammad (tr. unattributed).
- Ali ibn Abi Talib, the 4th Caliph, Last Will and Testament (tr. Mohammed Ballan).
- Moses Maimonides, The 13 Principles of Judaism, (tr. unattributed).
- Boniface VIII, Unam sanctam (tr. unattributed).
- The Donation of Constantine (tr. Ernest F. Henderson).
Jonathan Robinson maintains some translations of medieval texts which pertain to medieval political thought and the Franciscan poverty controversy on Robinson’s website.
Resources relating to Islamic and Jewish jurisprudence:
- Islamic Hadith, short excerpts.
- Arthur Jeffry (ed.), A Reader on Islam: Passages from Standard Arabic Writings Illustrative of the Beliefs and Practices of Muslims. (archived on the Internet Archive)
- Joseph Schact: “Law and Justice”, in Cambridge Encyclopaedia of Islam, vol. II, pt. VIII/chap. 4.
- Moses Maimonides, The Law and Basic Principles of the Torah (tr. Immanuel M. O’ Levy).
- A translation of the Shulchan Aruch and Mishna Berurah. Code of Jewish Law and a commentary by Rabbi Yisrael Meir Kagan of Orach Chayim, the first part of the Shulchan Aruch.

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