Molyneux’s Problem

First published Thu Jun 30, 2005; substantive revision Thu Jan 8, 2026

Molyneux’s problem asks whether a person born blind, capable of distinguishing a sphere and a cube by touch, could, if their vision were restored, recognize these shapes by sight alone.

This problem, posed by the Irish scientist and politician William Molyneux (1656–1698) to John Locke, who published it in his An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (1694), has ngaged philosophers and scientists from the Enlightenment to the present day. Its study has deepened our understanding of how ideas are acquired, how they transfer between different senses, and how such processes ultimately contribute to the formation of knowledge.

1. Molyneux’s Formulation of the Problem

Molyneux’s Dioptrica Nova (1692), a work on optics and psychology of sight, reflected the general fascination with optics of his time. Molyneux’s interest was also personal as his wife lost her sight in the first year of their marriage (Simms 1982). The direct influence for formulating what would become “Molyneux’s problem” was a French “extract” of Locke’s An Essay Concerning Humane Understanding, published in 1688 in the Bibliothèque Universelle & Historique. In this extract, Locke distinguishes between ideas we acquire by one sense, such as colour and texture, and those we acquire by a combination of senses, such as space, figure, movement, and rest. Locke further claims that a person deprived of a particular sense will lack the ideas belonging to it: a blind person, for example, can have no idea of colour. Molyneux extended this reasoning by asking whether a person born blind would be deprived of a visual idea of shape if they already know shape by touch alone. A devoted admirer of Locke, Molyneux dedicated Dioptrica Nova to him before his problem’s inclusion in Locke’s Essay, securing its legacy in the empiricist tradition.

On Saturday 7 July 1688 William Molyneux sent a letter to Locke setting out for the first time his problem concerning the person born blind:

Dublin July. 7. 88

A Problem Proposed to the Author of the Essai Philosophique concernant L’Entendement

A Man, being born blind, and having a Globe and a Cube, nigh of the same bignes, Committed into his Hands, and being taught or Told, which is Called the Globe, and which the Cube, so as easily to distinguish them by his Touch or Feeling; Then both being taken from Him, and Laid on a Table, Let us Suppose his Sight Restored to Him; Whether he Could, by his Sight, and before he touch them, know which is the Globe and which the Cube? Or Whether he Could know by his Sight, before he stretch’d out his Hand, whether he Could not Reach them, tho they were Removed 20 or 1000 feet from Him?

If the Learned and Ingenious Author of the Forementiond Treatise think this Problem Worth his Consideration and Answer, He may at any time Direct it to One that Much Esteems him, and is,

His Humble Servant

William Molyneux

High Ormonds Gate in Dublin. Ireland

For reasons unknown Locke never replied to this letter. After a few years of amicable correspondence Molyneux presented Locke with a simplified version of his problem in a letter, dated 2 March 1693, asking Locke to perhaps find some place in his Essay to say something about it. This time Locke reacted with enthusiasm: “Your ingenious problem will deserve to be published to the world.” Locke quoted the letter almost verbatim in the second edition of his Essay (1694), in Book 2, Chapter 9, Section 8: “Sensations often changed by the judgment.” as follows:

Suppose a Man born blind, and now adult, and taught by his touch to distinguish between a Cube, and a Sphere of the same metal, and nighly of the same bigness, so as to tell, when he felt one and t’other; which is the Cube, which the Sphere. Suppose then the Cube and Sphere placed on a Table, and the Blind Man to be made to see. Quaere, Whether by his sight, before he touch’d them, he could now distinguish, and tell, which is the Globe, which the Cube.

Locke also quoted Molyneux’s own “no” answer:

“Not. For though he has obtain’d the experience of, how a Globe, how a Cube affects his touch; yet he has not yet attained the Experience, that what affects his touch so or so, must affect his sight so or so; Or that a protuberant angle in the Cube, that pressed his hand unequally, shall appear to his eye, as it does in the Cube.”

Locke also added his admiration and agreement with Molyneux, as well as an amendment:

I agree with this thinking Gent. whom I am proud to call my Friend, in his answer to this his problem; and am of opinion, that the Blind Man, at first sight, would not be able with certainty to say, which was the Globe, which the Cube, whilst he only saw them: though he could unerringly name them by his touch, and certainly distinguish them by the difference of their Figures felt. This I have set down, and leave with my reader, as an occasion for him to consider how much he may be beholden to experience, improvement, and acquired notions, where he thinks he had not the least use of, or help from them. (Essay II. ix. 8: 146)

Molyneux’s problem was the fundamental question of the 18th Century for epistemology and psychology (Cassirer 1955) and captured the attention of many philosophers and men of learning throughout history, including Berkeley, Leibniz, Voltaire, Diderot, La Mettrie, Helmholtz, and William James.

2. First Philosophical Discussions and Experimental Data

Philosophers initially regarded Molyneux’s problem as a kind of thought experiment to be dealt with by reflection and conceptual analysis. Berkeley (1709) offered a more radical “no” answer than his fellow empiricists, Molyneux and Locke, arguing that the ideas of sight and touch bore no similarity at all. By contrast, those of a more rationalist persuasion, such as Synge (1693), Lee (1702), Leibniz (1704), and Hutcheson (1727) answered “yes,” maintaining that similarities between sight and touch could either be reasoned out or were innately linked. Leibniz’s own yes answer resisted Locke’s “at first sight” amendment, contending that time should be allowed for full recovery of sight, a point that would later prove crucial in later experimental tests of Molyneux’s problem.

The English surgeon William Cheselden (1688–1752) was the first to publish an experimental account of “new sight” by a congenitally blind person after surgical displacement of cataracts (1728). The publication led philosophers like Berkeley to regard Molyneux’s problem as experimentally resolvable. In his somewhat anecdotal report, Cheselden observed his patient’s response “at first sight.” “When he first saw, he was so far from making any judgment of distances, that he thought all objects whatever touched his eyes (as he expressed it) as what he felt did his skin.” (Cheselden 1728, 448) For Berkeley (1733), this provided not only evidence for a “no” answer but also confirmation of his own conjecture that first sight would lack spatial extension, with objects seemingly “to be in his eye” (Berkeley 1709, Section 41).

By contrast, Voltaire (1738), Buffon (1749), Diderot (1749), La Mettrie (1750), Condillac (1754), and Reid (1764) thought that Cheselden’s observations were ambiguous. They argued that the newly sighted would require time to recover from surgery, or need tactile experience or geometrical knowledge to identify the shapes correctly. Rather than settling philosophical debate over Molyneux’s problem, Cheselden’s experiment intensified it, provoking renewed intrigue, speculation, and a proliferation of both conceptual analysis and experimental analogues.

3. Empirical Approaches in the Nineteenth Century

A second wave of somewhat novel, yet anecdotal, experimental data defines the era of study of Molyneux’s problem at the turn of the nineteenth century.

New accounts of different kinds of blind subjects, most of whom could distinguish light from dark but not shapes, in a variety of different experimental conditions, suggested that, after time, some newly sighted subjects could partially distinguish and identify visual properties by sight alone. (Abbott 1864) Sir Everard Home (1807) tested a young boy age 10, about the distances of candlelight and the sun, giving a report similar to Cheselden’s boy saying, “it appeared to touch his eyes.” (Abbott 1904, 546) Dr. Franz (1841) performed experiments on a teenage boy newly healed from strabismus, able to see light and some colour, but no shapes or distances. Using the prescribed globe and cube, and after several days, Franz reported that his patient called out related two-dimensional versions of the shapes, a disc and “quadrangular figure.” Dr. Ramsay (1903) performed experiments on a 30-year-old man after cataract surgery. Ramsay reported that upon sight, the man identified a face: “he knew from having felt his own face…that he must be looking at a face.” (Abbott 1904, 549) A day later, the man distinguished a ball from a brick, moving his fingers, “trying to feel them in imagination.” (Abbott 1904, 550) While some of these reports agreed with Cheselden’s observations, others stood in marked contrast. Meaningful comparison between these cases is difficult due to significant differences in pre- and post-operative conditions. As might be expected, this diversity of experimental data expanded the range of possible solutions to Molyneux’s problem and paradigms for its testing.

Some novel paradigms considered observations of the sight of newly born animals and babies when discussing Molyneux’s problem. Adam Smith (1795), known best as an Economist, was the first to report his observations of the behaviors of newly-hatched chicks, newborn foals and calves, and newborn human infants. This suggested to Smith that Berkeley’s “no” answer to Molyneux’s problem was incorrect: there is an immediate ability to visually identify objects previously known only to touch. Smith further speculated on innate connections between the senses in both newborn animals and human babies, a point subsequently mentioned by Thomas Brown (1838), Charles Bailey (1842), and T.K. Abbott (1904). Johannes Müller’s (1826) experiments in bird vision further supported these animal observations and their speculations of innate connections between sight and touch. John Stewart Mill (1842) agreed with these views about animal vision, but argued they could not reasonably be applied to human vision.

The invention of the stereoscope by Charles Wheatstone (1838), a device which instigated binocular vision of depth from flat photographs taken from slightly different angles, suggested immediate 3D spatial experience by sight alone. Samuel Bailey (1842), for instance, concluded from this and the report from Home’s (1807) once-blind patient a “yes” to Molyneux’s problem: the newly sighted upon seeing a shape through two retinal images, “the perception of an object of three dimensions would be doubtless produced in his mind.” (Bailey 1842, 100–1) While Bailey believed depth was an innate ability of the mind, Mill (1842) argued that it was learned, albeit quickly.

Anecdotal observations from cataract surgeries and behaviors of young animals and infants were used as evidence in the debate concerning the question of whether the perception of space is innate or acquired. Although Molyneux’s problem was frequently invoked in this debate, consensus on its proper solution remained elusive.

4. Modern Approaches

Throughout much of the twentieth century, interest in Molyneux’s problem was primarily historical. Molyneux’s problem is commonly presented as such in textbooks and general histories of psychology and other cognitive sciences. Historians of philosophy analyze answers to Molyneux for a better understanding of a philosopher’s thought. For instance, many scholars argue that Locke’s wider views, like shape being a common sensible, align better with a “yes” answer: J.L. Mackie (1976) argues that Locke must mean only 2D shape is a common sensible. Other scholars question whether even 2D shape is a common sensible for Locke (Levin 2020) or they defend 3D shape as a common sensible for Locke, mitigating his “no” answer via judgment (Bruno and Mandelbaum 2010; Berchielli 2003), simple and complex ideas (Ayers 1993), primary qualities (Vaughan 2018) or several of these simultaneously (Glenney 2024; Ott 2020). Other philosophical historians have written book-length focused histories of the problem (Glenney 2024; Riskin 2002; Morgan 1977), with others providing more comprehensive analyses (Degenaar 1996).

Developments in cataract surgeries since Cheselden show that only a few cases fit Molyneux’s profile (Valvo 1971), as the vast majority of cases are detected in infancy and treated as early as possible. One of the most discussed experiments is by Held et al. (2011), who tested five congenitally blind subjects whose vision had been restored through cataract surgery. Controls were added to show that the subjects could identify shapes by touch and sight independently, passing vision-to-vision and touch-to-touch shape matching tests. All subjects failed the touch-to-vision test, barely better than if the subjects had guessed, supporting a “no” answer to Molyneux’s problem. However, three were successful when tested after a few days of “natural real-world experience (Held et al. 552),” suggesting that such cross-modal mappings are rapidly made available, perhaps through brain plasticity or unmasking of innate pathways.

Held et al.’s experiment suggests a “no” answer to Molyneux’s problem if Locke’s “at first sight” amendment is included, though it is common to criticize the robustness of the visual experiences of these newly sighted subjects (Spence et al. 2024; Van Cleve 2014; Schwenkler 2013). It remains an open question whether Molyneux’s original question would have also been answered “no”, which allows time and adequate visual experience but without tactile experience. The timing of the visual test remains ambiguous: should we test the subject right after surgery or allow time for restoration of visual capacities (Levin 2008)? The conditions of both versions generate a paradox: robust visual shape recognition normally requires a physically healthy visual system trained by active bodily experience, including active touch, opening the door to contamination with touch on the path to cross-modal learning. In this respect, not only are once-blind post-operative newly sighted human subjects poor candidates for robust vision, but the active tactile experiences normally associated with vision risk the purity of Molyneux’s test through the acquisition of visual knowledge of shapes by way of perceptual learning from touch (for a review, see Ferretti and Glenney 2020; Ferretti 2018; Glenney 2013; Gallagher 2005; Jacomuzzi et al. 2003). As such, no control would provide certainty that subjects will be experientially and inferentially naïve to aspects of shape identification by sight alone. However, recent adaptations offer a potential resolution to this paradox.

Towards the end of the century, several new technologies and experimental paradigms more amenable to experimental control began to provide renewed interest in resolving Molyneux’s problem. Sensory Substitution Devices (SSDs) that present information normally handled by one modality, such as vision, to another sense, typically audition or touch, were developed in the context of mobility or reading (Morgan, 1977). SSD experiments show that subjects need some time to learn to distinguish and identify objects, with some interpreting this delay as suggestive of a “no” answer (Morgan 1977). Others argue that SSDs unmask innate connections between the senses as evidenced by how quickly their use is learned, suggesting a “yes” answer to Molyneux’s problem (Hillenbrand et al. 2018). Others argue that SSDs are not a substitution but an augmentation of a sense and that to learn to use such devices is only an approximation to Molyneux’s problem (Auvray et al. 2009).

Another variation of Molyneux’s problem was suggested by Evans (1985). He wondered whether the visual cortex of a patient with congenital blindness could be electrically stimulated in such a way that the patient experiences a pattern of light flashes (phosphenes) in the shape of a square or circle. This question has been investigated experimentally, but the results do not provide a final answer to Molyneux’s problem (Jacomuzzi et al. 2003) However, improved non-invasive visual prostheses as well as more invasive technologies, such as electrostimulation of visual pathways, gene therapy, stem cells, or optogenetics may one day provide full visual restoration to people born blind (Ptito et al. 2021). However, even such conditions may fail to provide a satisfactory answer to Molyneux’s problem based on recent progress in reconceptualizing blindness and visual studies.

Blindness today is often understood as less about a loss of sight and more as abnormal development of the visual system (Fine & Park 2018). Others have reconceptualized sight as more of a learned skill: training and experience with other senses, especially touch, are needed to know where to look at an object for its identification, to appreciate that smaller appearing objects may represent distant objects, and to infer hidden sides of an object made invisible under some perspectives (Toribio 2020). Others present Molyneux’s problem from the context of vision’s ocular, physiological, and cortical processing levels, including their normal cognitive development, where if the ocular processing is restored, cortical processing may still fail (Ferretti and Glenney 2020; Ferretti 2018; Glenney 2013; Gallagher 2005).

Visual processing is also understood in the context of the Two Visual Systems Model: vision-for-recognition and vision-for-action (Goodale et al. 1995). Molyneux’s problem may also include a new question on action: would a newly sighted subject be able to automatically grasp an object by sight alone (Gallagher 2005)? Ferretti (2018) argues that due to visual impairments at the cortical level of visual processing, Molyneux subjects would display problems in both recognition and visual guidance of action that make them unprepared for a grasping test. Molyneux’s problem thus involves multiple meanings of vision, blindness, and visual restoration (Brogaard et al. 2020). Under Molyneux’s original description, a Molyneux experiment may turn out to require a scientific miracle. Alternatively, subjects who are visually naïve yet primed for vision, such as human infants and non-human animals, may yield more reliable results.

Just-born infants are both visually naïve and primed for vision, making them excellent candidates for a Molyneux experiment. This may account for why they produce results opposite to Held’s (2011) surgically recovering once-blind subjects. Several hours-old infants look to familiar shapes known previously by their feel in their mouths (Meltzoff et al.1979) or look to novel shapes previously unknown but by their feel in their right hands (Streri 2012), looking being a behavioral basis for identifying visually novel shapes by sight alone. A variety of non-human animals are similarly successful at visually identifying shapes previously known only by another sense, including ants, birds, crabs, dolphins, fish, frogs, and a variety of mammals (Glenney 2024). Bees and bats fly to cube shapes known previously by touch or echolocation, respectively, though all these animal subjects have had natural, real-world experiences. By contrast, Versace et al. (2024) showed that newborn chicks dark-reared with either pointy- or smooth-featured shapes identified them immediately in lit conditions by sight alone. These chick behaviors, much like the human newborns’ looking behaviors, suggest a “yes” answer to a modified “action” version of Molyneux’s problem that is freed from verbal-based identification and one-off experimental conditions of past Molyneux experiments on humans.

Many recent developments to Molyneux’s problem have focused on the different aspects of this problem (Ferretti and Glenney 2024), and evaluated its use as a tool for understanding a variety of related concerns, from vision and cross-modal processing to new historical analyses of philosophers to the concept of disability (Ferretti and Glenney 2020). New philosophical theories gain insight from using Molyneux’s problem as a “test case”, provoking not just novel problems, but revisions that help these theories progress. In addition, new methodologies come to light that treat Molyneux’s problem as a generative muse (Matthen and Cohen, 2020) and a guide for enhancing pluralist methodologies (Glenney 2024).

5. Conclusion

The history surrounding Molyneux’s problem belies a complexity that Molyneux himself could not have anticipated. In fact, there is no problem in the history of the philosophy of perception that has provoked more reflection, refinement, and experimentation than the problem that Molyneux posed over three centuries ago. In this respect, Molyneux’s problem stands as one of the most fertile thought-experiments in the history of philosophy, all the more provocative and conceptually rich as related disciplines advance in their understanding of the mind, brain, and the senses.

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Copyright © 2026 by
Brian Glenney <bglenney@norwich.edu>
Gabriele Ferretti <gabriele.ferretti88@gmail.com>
Marjolein Degenaar <marjoleindegenaar@gmail.com>

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