Notes to The Moral Status of Animals

1. For one of many summaries of tool-use in animals, see Griffin 1992: ch. 5; see also Attenborough 1998: ch. 5. For primary research see, for example, S. Chevalier-Skolnikoff 1989; Weir, Chappell, & Kacelnik 2002, and Visalberghi 1997. For elaborate stories of family-ties, see Galdikas 1995 and Goodall 1986 & 2000. For an interesting discussion of Meerkats see “All For One: Meerkats”, National Geographic. For examples of non-human “culture” in chimpanzees, see Whiten, Goodall, et al. 1999; in whales and dolphins see Rendell & Whitehead 2001; and for a general discussion Griffin 1992: ch. 4. Two useful discussions of non-human “social knowledge” can be found in Cheney & Seyfarth 1990 and Tomasello & Call 1997: Part II. See Bekoff 2000, 2007 and King 2013 for an account of animal emotion. For a discussion of warlike behavior and alliance building see de Waal 1989. Bonobos have sex not just for reproduction, but to relax, to bond, or just for pleasure. They also don’t seem to have taboos about who they have sex with or how. For a discussion see de Waal & Lanting 1997. See Bekoff & Byers 1998 for discussion of play among many different species. Studies of language use among non-humans have a long and interesting history. See, for example, Pepperberg 1999 and Premack 1986. Critics have contended that while some animals can be taught to use words they do not use a language with syntax, defenders have argued that the non-human animals in the language studies, particularly the bonobos, not only have large vocabularies, but are capable of communicating novel information, of combining words in new ways, and of following simple syntactic rules. See Rumbaugh & Savage-Rumbaugh 1999. For a discussion of deception see, for example, Byrne & Whiten 1988 and Byrne & Whiten 1997. For a nice introductory discussion of other forms of cognition see Roberts 1998. See also Hauser & Carey 1997 and Bekoff, Allen, & Burghardt 2002.

2. Unfortunately, in our complex world, it does appear that the extraordinary is becoming more ordinary; that conflicts of crucial interests are occurring more regularly. Some have suggested that in order to cope with such conflicts additional factors be considered in the process of conflict resolution. Donald VanDeVeer has proposed that the level of psychological complexity be a determining factor such that if a being has a higher level of this complexity then his crucial interest would outweigh the crucial interests of a being with lesser complexity. There are clearly refinements needed with this proposal; see VanDeVeer 1979: 55–70.

Copyright © 2017 by
Lori Gruen <lgruen@wesleyan.edu>

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