The Nonidentity Problem

First published Tue Jul 21, 2009; substantive revision Fri Jul 19, 2024

The nonidentity problem raises questions regarding both the moral obligations agents have in respect of possible future people – people, that is, who do not yet but may exist at some future time – and how those obligations (to the extent we have them) are most credibly explained. It today remains among the most challenging problems in all of population ethics.

It is plausible to think that we are often obligated to make future people – at least some of them – better off rather than leaving them as they might otherwise be or making them worse off. But on reflection it seems that any change we contemplate in respect of any conduct we plan to engage in prior to a given person’s being conceived – even a change that would on its face seem to represent a clear improvement for that future person – will often fail to make that person better off and often instead serve only to bring another person, a better off person but still a nonidentical person, into existence in place of the one. Thus the phenomenon Gregory Kavka called the “precariousness” of existence (Kavka, 1982, 93): we all just barely missed never coming into existence at all. Had our parents, or any of our more remote forebears, done anything other than what they in fact did – had they, for example, with the aim of making things better for us, delayed their conception of a child for a few months or years until they were better prepared to take care of a child – the odds overwhelmingly seem to favor our never having existed at all. That is, after all, the way of gamete production: neither sperm nor egg cells survive for very long, and it is reasonable to suppose that a different egg and sperm combination would have produced a distinct person. Even delays not of months or years but of split seconds would seem very probably to switch out the sperm cell that is set to do the inseminating for one of its many, many cohorts and thus the identity of the person conceived. Analogous points hold for changes in the manner of conception and, even more obviously, for changes in the agent’s choice of whom to conceive a child with. Any of your forebears’ well-meaning changes in conduct may well have resulted in the coming into existence of a better off child. But for you the result of any such change very probably would have been your never having existed at all.

A similar phenomenon arises on a global scale. Suppose, for example, that we choose to take significant action today to mitigate the effects of climate change in the future – and that we do so with the aim of making future people better off. Will our choice make any particular future person or collection of future people better off? Probably not, according to the logic of the nonidentity problem. After all, any significant climate action undertaken today will surely affect the timing and manner of human conception on a very wide scale over a very long period of time. Thus, according to the logic of the nonidentity problem, our environmentally responsible choice very probably will not make any particular person or collection of future people better off than that collection would have been under the environmentally reckless choice. It very probably will serve only to bring an entirely distinct – better off but person-by-person nonidentical – collection of future people into existence instead.

It is when those graphic facts of life are combined with a highly intuitive constraint on just when a choice is morally wrong and when a given possible outcome, or possible world or future, is morally worse than another – that is, the person affecting intuition – that what is called the nonidentity problem arises.

The person affecting intuition itself was described by Derek Parfit as the idea that “what is bad must be bad for someone” (Parfit 1987, 363). Jan Narveson wittily articulated just how that intuition functions to constrain an otherwise compelling utilitarian sentiment that, taken too far, may seem highly implausible: moral agents are (of course) in favor of “making people happy” but (surely) “neutral” about “making happy people” (Narveson, 1976, 73).

How, exactly, does that simple intuition give rise to a problem? The person affecting intuition, when combined with the fact that the coming into existence of any particular person is highly precarious, seems to insist that, when it comes to the future-directed, identity-affecting choices that we make, we can “do no wrong.” Even imagined improvements in our original choice that we might contemplate making with the aim of making things better for some particular future person or another very often will have the effect not of making things better for that person but rather of leaving that person out of existence altogether. On the assumption that that person’s existence under the original choice is worth having and that no one else is affected, the person affecting intuition is generally understood to compel the conclusion that our original choice, not being “bad for” that person at all (if anything, it benefits that person; in bestowing on that person the gift of life, it increases what we can call that person’s wellbeing), isn’t “bad”: it isn’t, that is, morally wrong and doesn’t make the possible future it helps to bring about morally worse than any other.

Surely, however, it is not the case that we can “do no wrong” with respect to the future-directed, identity-affecting choices that we make. More plausibly, such choices are on many occasions morally wrong and the futures that include such choices morally worse: as when, for example, we fail to prepare ourselves properly to care for our own future children or fail to serve as environmentally responsible moral agents on behalf of future generations who, just like us, will be in need of a climate conducive to good health.

By the 1980s, the nonidentity problem had become widely recognized. Once recognized, it then seemed immediately obvious to many moral philosophers – including many consequentialists – how the inconsistency was to be avoided. It seemed obvious that a more credible moral theory would simply reject the person affecting intuition and instead adopt a structure that is impersonal rather than person affecting in nature. The paradigm example of such a theory is classic maximizing total utilitarianism (the “total theory”). On that theory, agents are to focus, not on making particular people better off, but rather on bringing it about that, regardless of just who does or will exist, the collection of all those people has as much wellbeing on an aggregate basis as any alternate collection of people who could have existed instead. That our choice isn’t “bad for” any particular future person becomes, under the total theory, morally irrelevant: a choice may be deemed morally wrong, and the future that choice gives rise to deemed morally worse, even if that choice makes things worse for no one who does or will exist in that future at all.

The move to impersonalism – to, for example, the total theory – doesn’t, however, end the discussion. For we then come face to face with still another challenging population problem, that is, the repugnant conclusion. Having dropped the person affecting intuition, the total theory would seem to obligate us (in Narveson’s words) to make people happy and to make happy people. But in balancing those two moral desiderata, we find that our obligation on occasion will be to make additional happy people even though our doing so comes at a grave cost to still other people, people who do or will exist and who would have been better off under the choice that creates fewer people rather than under the choice to create more. Thus consider the collection “A” consisting of a large number of future people whose lives will be well worth living, and compare it against a collection “Z” consisting of all the A-people together with a very large number of additional future people, with each A-person and each additional person now having a life only barely worth living. In a case where the future that contains the Z-people maximizes aggregate wellbeing, the total theory deems that future morally better than the future that contains the A-people alone, with the morally better future being the one that (given that there exists no still better future) we are morally obligated to aim to bring about. But can that conclusion really be correct? Parfit himself found it “repugnant” (Parfit, 1987, 380–390; see also repugnant conclusion). And it would seem to be, on its face, the sort of “moral” edict we would resist, indeed, defy – just as we would defy, in the more local, closer-to-home case the edict that we are in many cases obligated to produce ever more offspring even when our doing so would make things much worse for the (one or two or more) existing or future children we might ourselves otherwise have preferred to produce.

Notably, the repugnant conclusion has itself been challenged, on the grounds that either the conclusion itself is not truly repugnant or that almost all credible population theories give rise to some form of the repugnant conclusion or another (Zuber et al., 2021, Tannsjo 2002). Still, Parfit’s early assessment of the conclusion as “repugnant” continues to be the dominant view in moral philosophy writ large, and the repugnant conclusion, together with the nonidentity problem, continues to define the basic contours of the contemporary controversy surrounding the person affecting intuition.

It is thus generally thought that to solve the nonidentity problem is to produce a theory that accounts for the obligations we intuitively believe we have in respect of possible future people without enmeshing ourselves in any of the other serious problems that together constitute the area of population ethics. It’s – among other things – to identify a “Theory X” (Parfit 1987, 378) that manages to avoid the nonidentity problem and the repugnant conclusion. The path forward hasn’t, however, been easy or obvious. For that reason and others, the nonidentity problem opens the door to significant and still unsettled questions regarding the nature and structure of moral law.

1. Construction the Problem; Strategies for Solving the Problem

As noted earlier, the person affecting intuition is a central component in the construction of the nonidentity problem. Indeed, it was originally considered the target of the nonidentity problem.

Many different formulations of the person affecting intuition appear in the literature (see Roberts 2024, 4–5 n. 8). For purposes of this entry, formulations that are widely agreed to fail on grounds other than the nonidentity problem are set aside. John Broome, for example, considers a formulation he calls the neutrality intuition, according to which bringing an additional person into existence within a certain “neutral” range of wellbeing levels leaves the one future (other things equal) exactly as good as the other. As Broome argues, however, the neutrality intuition is clearly false (Broome 2004, 143–149).

An initial, more cautious formulation, and one that tracks Parfit’s original formulation (“what is bad must be bad for someone,” Parfit 1987, 363 (emphasis deleted); cf. Parfit 2017), is as follows: a choice made at a given outcome, or possible world or future, is morally wrong, and makes the one future worse than a second, only if that choice makes things worse for, or harms, or is otherwise “bad for,” at least one person who does or will exist in the one future.

This initial formulation is cautious in three respects. First, it avoids assigning any special moral status to people who do or will exist in the actual world over people who do or will exist in alternate merely possible worlds. Consistent with the initial formulation, we may freely assign moral status to merely possible people who inhabit futures that themselves never in point of fact – that never actually – obtain. (For arguments against moral actualism, see Hare 2007; Roberts 2024, 45–49; see also part 4 below.) Second, it provides only a necessary, and not a sufficient, condition on when a choice is wrong or makes things morally worse; relatedly, the condition it provides is a condition only on moral wrongness and moral worseness, not on moral betterness. (See Roberts 2024, 4–5n.8 and 60–61.) Third, it leaves open the question of just which future it is that makes the person who is worse off in the one future better off. Often, the reference is assumed to be to the second future (we would say one future is worse than a second only if the one future is worse for a person who does or will exist in that future than the second is for that same person). In fact, however, to avoid the risk of starting off with a formulation that cannot be made to work, the question of how that blank is to be filled in must be left open.

Though cautious, this initial formulation of the intuition, together with the phenomenon of the precariousness of existence and once combined with a handful of seemingly uncontroversial ancillary claims, is enough to trigger the nonidentity problem.

Some of those ancillary claims are moral in nature; others are more conceptual, metaphysical or even epistemological in nature. When it comes to identifying a credible way to avoid the inconsistency the nonidentity problem gives rise to, however, close scrutiny not just of the central claims but also of each seemingly uncontroversial ancillary claim is in order.

The discussion that follows begins with a proposed solution that boldly questions one of those ancillary (and already referenced) claims: that the future-directed, identity-affecting choices under scrutiny in the various nonidentity cases really are, in the main, morally wrong and really do make the futures that arise out of those choices morally worse than still other futures. As the nonidentity cases themselves suggest (for a list, see part 2 below), that claim comes with strong intuitive support. Nonetheless, a few theorists have aimed to solve the problem by rejecting that claim. And indeed a narrow class of nonidentity cases involving highly personal, procreative choices may well seem to throw that claim into question. Was it, for example, wrong for your parents to have a child with each other and, eventually, to produce you rather than to have a child with an alternate partner who (let’s suppose) would have brought to the table the sort of superior genetic contribution that would have increased wellbeing? We might think that it wasn’t. For discussion of this “bite the bullet” proposal, see part 3.1 below.

More commonly, theorists, including many consequentialists, have viewed the nonidentity problem as a counterexample against the person affecting intuition and have thus aimed to solve the problem by simply rejecting that intuition in favor of a purely impersonal, aggregative approach. Keeping the repugnant conclusion in mind, however, those same theorists have proposed novel versions of the total theory, versions designed to avoid the repugnant conclusion without the help of the person affecting intuition. Still other theorists, who also can be understood as working within a basic consequentialist framework, attempt to thread the needle between the nonidentity problem and the repugnant conclusion by adopting a pluralistic approach, one that recognizes both impersonal values (thus addressing the nonidentity problem) and person affecting values (thus going some way in addressing the repugnant conclusion). See part 3.2 below.

Still other theorists, seeking to retain the person affecting intuition without giving up the claim that the choices under scrutiny in the nonidentity cases really are wrong and really do make things worse, aim to solve the nonidentity problem by disconnecting the notions of when it is that a choice makes things worse for a person and when it is that a choice is bad for a person. Conceding that, given the precariousness of existence, the choice under scrutiny in any given nonidentity case does not make things worse for the future person it ushers into existence (assuming, of course, that that existence is itself worth having), they argue that that same choice nonetheless harms or wrongs or is otherwise bad for that person. See part 3.3 below,

A handful of theorists, also seeking to retain the person affecting intuition and the claim that the choices under scrutiny really are wrong and really do make things worse, have questioned some of the ancillary conceptual or metaphysical claims that ground seemingly compelling claims regarding the precariousness of existence. Thus in constructing the problem certain very definite claims regarding what it is for a person p to be the same person as a person q, when it is that a nonidentical person q exists instead of a person p and, ultimately, when it is that “a person” is made worse off are at work. The question has, however, emerged whether those claims – in effect, those assumptions – do not inappropriately block various natural descriptions of the cases that nicely avoid the nonidentity problem. See part 3.4 below.

Still other theorists have questioned whether facts regarding the precariousness of existence in fact support the position that a given person’s coming into existence is more probable under the choice that we agree is wrong than that same person’s existence is under an alternate choice that we agree is permissible. That more epistemic proposal, which applies just to some but not all types of nonidentity cases, argues that the “no harm done” result rests on a certain fallacy in reasoning regarding the relevant probabilities. By avoiding the fallacy, we can explain how the wrong choice after all harms – makes things worse for – the future person whose future plight has triggered our concern and thus explain, in person affecting terms, why that choice is wrong and the future that it gives rise to is worse than others. See part 3.5 below.

Taking another tack entirely, many theorists are happy to reject both the consequentialist framework itself and the person affecting intuition. Such theorists may aim to account for the wrongness of many future-directed, identity-affecting choices by reference to facts about the agent’s character, motives or intentions rather than by reference to the consequences the choice under scrutiny generates for anyone at all. See part 3.6 below.

Just as the repugnant conclusion (arguably) puts guardrails on proposed solutions to the nonidentity problem, so do certain other problems in population ethics, including what is called “the asymmetry.” This entry concludes with a note on that problem. See part 4 below.

2. Nonidentity Cases

As noted earlier, the identity of any person plausibly depends on just who the genetic parents of that person happen to be. As Parfit observes, the woman who wonders who she would have been had her “parents married other people” “ignores the answer,” which is “no one” (Parfit 1987, 351). But the timing and manner of conception are also critical. Had the timing of any one conception or the manner of that conception been changed, the result very probably would have been the conception of a distinct child altogether. (Parfit 1987, 351–55; 2011 vol. 2, 217–231). Moreover, the exact timing and manner of conception is itself highly susceptible to variations in whatever complex chain of acts and events it is that has come before. Much of what has been done in human history, had it been done differently, would surely have undone the conceptions of vast numbers of people. “[H]ow many of us could truly claim, ‘Even if railways and motor cars had never been invented, I would still have been born’?” (Parfit 1987, 361).

Consider, then, a choice c1 that is made at a possible world or future f1 and that eventually results in one or more people having positive but low wellbeing levels in f1. And suppose that, at the time of choice, those very same people have not yet been conceived. Suppose, too, that the reason wellbeing levels will be low is that c1 performed at f1 will cause those very same people to suffer in various ways (say, from disease, deprivation or limitation). And suppose that that suffering cannot be justified (on, say, the ground that it is necessary to save many other people from suffering still more). When agents, at the time of choice, had an alternate choice c2 at an alternate possible future f2 that would have avoided that suffering altogether, we may well be convinced that c1 at f1is wrong. The problem is that in many such cases – and it takes just one to generate a counterexample against the person affecting intuition – choosing c2 in place of c1 very probably would also have changed the timing and manner of the conceptions that take place at f1. Thus c2 would not have made things better for the people who will eventually exist at f1 but rather would have caused those particular people – each and every one of them – very probably to have been left out of existence at f2 altogether. To put the point another way, the suffering c1 imposes on the people who will eventually exist in f1 seems very probably unavoidable if those particular people are ever to exist at all. (They all “owe” their “very existence” to agents’ choosing c1 at f1 rather than c2 at f2.) That, in turn, makes it hard to see how c1 has made things worse for, or harmed, or otherwise been bad for, anyone who does or will exist in f1 in any “morally relevant way” (Parfit 1987, 361–63, 374).

2.1 Depletion

In Parfit’s depletion case, we are to suppose that agents as a community have chosen to deplete rather than conserve certain natural resources. The consequences of that choice for the people who exist now or will come into existence over the next two centuries will be “slightly” better than under a conservation alternative (Parfit 1987, 362; see also Parfit 2011 (vol. 2), 218). After that period, however, the quality of life would be much lower. Yet at the same time the depletion choice would seem very probably to make things worse for, or harm, or otherwise be bad for, no existing or future person at all. After all, while distant future people by hypothesis will suffer as a result of the depletion choice, it is also true that for each such person a conservation choice very probably would have changed the timing and manner of the relevant conception. That change, in turn, would have changed the identities of the people who eventually exist. Assuming that the existences those distant future people will have are worth having despite depletion, we seem forced to conclude that the depletion choice does not make things worse for, or harm, and is not otherwise bad for, any among those distant future people at all. The person affecting intuition then forces a further conclusion: that the depletion choice is not wrong and does not make the future in which the depletion choice is made worse than any alternate future. And thus the problem: for surely the “ great lowering of the quality of life must provide some moral reason not to choose Depletion” (Parfit 1987, 361–364). Surely agents ought to have chosen conservation instead.

The risky policy case, also from Parfit, has a similar structure (Parfit 1987, 371–72). So does the climate change case (Broome 1992; Parfit 2017, 122–123).

2.2 The slave child

The same type of nonidentity problem arises but at a more local level in Kavka’s slave child case. In exchange for $50,000, a couple enters into a binding contract according to which the couple will conceive and bear a child who will be transferred at birth to a wealthy man as a slave (Kavka 1982, 100). The child is conceived and born pursuant to the contract – and, as a slave, suffers but still has a life worth living. We think what the couple has done is “outrageous” (Kavka 1982, 101). And at first glance we may also think that that is so because of what the couple’s choice does to the slave child – specifically, that it makes things worse for, or harms, or is otherwise bad for, that child. But the logic of the nonidentity problem suggests otherwise. Had the couple declined to enter the contract but still taken steps to produce a child, the original child very probably would never have existed at all. For that alternate sequence of choices very probably would have produced a change in the timing and manner of conception. The resulting child, as a nonslave, may well have been better off. But it very probably would have been a child “nonidentical” to the original (Kavka 1982, 100 n. 15). On those facts, we seem forced to conclude that the couple’s choice makes things worse for, or harms, or is otherwise bad for, no existing or future person at all. According to the person affecting intuition, what the couple has done therefore isn’t wrong and doesn’t make things worse. But that result seems clearly false.

Kavka’s “pleasure pill” case parallels the slave child case (Kavka 1982, 98).

2.3 The fourteen year old girl

Another case from Parfit on its face avoids any reliance on probabilities and thus can be considered of a different type. His “fourteen year old girl” case focuses on the fact that the egg cell a young girl will produce soon after she becomes capable of conceiving a child will not be the same egg cell as the one she will produce a decade or more later. In Parfit’s case, “[t]his girl chooses to have a child” (Parfit 1987, 358). Yet we think that it would have been better for the girl to wait “for several years” to have a child and that, barring exceptional circumstances, the girl’s choice is wrong (Parfit 1987, 358). But it also seems that that particular child, even if burdened by having been born to a girl too young to be a good mother, practically could not (versus probably would not) have existed at all had the girl waited “for several years” to have a child. Given that the child’s life is worth living, it’s hard to see how the girl’s choice can plausibly be said to have made things worse for, or harmed, or otherwise have been “bad for,” the child or (on some versions of the case) any other existing or future person at all. On those facts, the person affecting intuition insists that the young girl’s choice was not wrong and does not make things morally worse.

2.4 Wrongful life

The same type of nonidentity problem appears in defenses against the cause of action in the law of negligence called wrongful life. An action for wrongful life, by definition made on behalf of the child rather than the parent, makes one or both of the following claims: (1) medical professionals have failed properly to advise couples of their risk of producing a child with a serious genetic or chromosomal disorder or of the availability of technologies that would have enabled them to reduce that risk; and (2) medical professionals have failed to implement those technologies effectively. The disorders at issue include Down syndrome and hereditary deafness, and the available technologies include preconception genetic testing and maternal blood screening. The proper use of the available technologies could not have cured the underlying impairment. But their proper use could have enabled the couple to produce a nonidentical, presumptively better off, child instead. At the same time, it seems clear that in most cases the impaired child’s life will be (or at least can be made to be) worth living. Can the child claim to have been harmed – in the comparative, worse off sense of that term that the law requires – by the very medical negligence to which the child owes its very existence? It seems not. The law of negligence itself being deeply steeped in the person affecting intuition, a majority of courts have felt themselves forced to deny the child’s claim altogether.

Parfit’s “two medical programs” case – specifically, the program that would encourage women who have a certain condition that “cannot be treated, but always disappears within two months,” to delay pregnancy – is structurally similar to the wrongful life case (Parfit 1987, 367–368; Parfit 2011 vol. 2, 221–222; Parfit 2017, 121).

2.5 Historic injustices; reparations

The precariousness of existence raises the question whether historical injustices – for example, U.S. slavery and the Holocaust – can properly be said to make things worse for, or harm, or otherwise be bad for, people who were not conceived until after the events constituting the injustice have themselves concluded (Sher 2005; Herstein 2008; Cohen 2009; Smilansky 2013). Here tracking the same probabilistic logic that appears in the cases of depletion and the slave child, the argument is that the choices under scrutiny very probably do not make things worse for, or harm, and are not otherwise bad for, any of the later-conceived progeny of the historical injustice. Though those future people (stripped of family and family resources) may be burdened in various ways as a result of the choices that create the injustice, it is also true that alternate, seemingly permissible choices very probably would have changed the timing and manner of the relevant conceptions and thus have changed the identities of the later-conceived people. We then seem forced to conclude that the choices under scrutiny do not make things worse for, or harm, and are not otherwise bad for, any of those future people at all. Here, the person affecting intuition does not block the finding that a wrong has been done or that the future that includes the historic injustice is not worse than still others – the fact that there existed many contemporaneous victims of the historic injustice can’t be undone. But if reparations (like compensation under the law of negligence) requires that the person claiming reparations have been harmed or made worse off – if it requires victims rather than apparent beneficiaries – then we seem forced to conclude that reparations to later-conceived progeny are not owed. While that result may seem plausible (“[H]ow can any person have a claim to compensation for a wrong that was a condition of her existence?” (Cohen 2009, 81)), many theorists resist it. (See also intergenerational justice.)

3. Proposed solutions to the nonidentity problem

3.1 Seemingly wrong choice is not wrong; “biting the bullet”

For some philosophers, the person affecting intuition itself is beyond question. Combining that intuition with the phenomenon of the precariousness of existence and a certain ancillary, conceptual claim, they reason to a conclusion that still other philosophers find deeply troubling: that many, perhaps all, of the future-directed, identity-affecting choices under scrutiny in the various nonidentity cases are not, after all, morally wrong and do not make things morally worse. They “bite the bullet.”

David Heyd accepts that conclusion even in the case in which the existence that is brought about is less than worth having. Notably, Heyd’s position is driven mainly by his conceptual, rather than his moral, intuitions. Heyd thus rejects what can be called nonexistence comparability and instead takes the position that comparisons between the wellbeing level a given person has in a future in which that person exists and the wellbeing level that same person has in a future in which that person never exists are not cogent. However dire the case, in other words, the choice to bring the child into existence cannot make things worse for or harm (in the comparative, worse off sense of that term that Heyd accepts) the child and thus cannot be wrong (Heyd 1992, 30–33; Heyd, 2009). But for Heyd the conclusion that the choice is not wrong doesn’t imply that the choice is morally permissible. (Here, Heyd rejects still another conceptual claim that others might find highly plausible: the claim that choices that are not morally wrong are morally permissible.) Rather, according to Heyd, the choice falls into the category of the genethical and not the straightforwardly ethical: it’s neither morally permissible nor morally wrong.

Philosophers who accept the person affecting intuition but also accept nonexistence comparability remain free to limit their “bite the bullet” conclusion to the case where the existence under scrutiny is at least worth having. Thus, David Boonin remains at least neutral on nonexistence comparability (Boonin 2008, 130 and 135; Boonin 2014; see also Bayne 2010; Risberg 2023). In that respect, Boonin’s position is more limited than Heyd’s: for Boonin, application of the person affecting intuition is restricted to those cases in which the life at issue isn’t “worse than no life at all” (Boonin 2014, 2, 14, 17).

In another respect as well, Boonin’s approach is more limited than Heyd’s. At least some of Heyd’s language suggests the position that the “no harm done” result is in order, not just in the case where the flawed existence is (very probably) unavoidable if the person is ever to exist at all and where, in that strong sense, the person’s coming into existence “depends on” agents making the choice under scrutiny, but also in the case where agents simply retain “control” over whether that person comes into existence or not (Heyd 1992, 105 and, generally, 99–106; Heyd 2009, 15–17). According to that principle, even if the couple has the alternative of bringing the same child into a better existence – even if the existence is not unavoidably flawed – if the couple also retains the option of not bringing the child into existence at all, the choice under scrutiny cannot make things worse for the child. The idea here would be that, until we actually produce them, “we might decide not to make them the subject of any kind of moral status whatsoever” – a situation that leaves them, even if they in point of fact will (if not unavoidably) exist, with “no moral status of any kind, not even a weak one,” relative to the choice under scrutiny (Heyd 1992, 99).

But the conclusions Boonin reaches in another respect seem to go beyond Heyd’s. Boonin typically describes the choices that give rise to worth-having existences as simply “not morally wrong” (Boonin 2014, 5, 27). But he, unlike Heyd, doesn’t explicitly resist the conceptual idea that choices that are not wrong are therefore permissible (Boonin 2008, 146–149; Boonin 2014).

Not surprisingly, the “bite the bullet” strategy has encountered substantial resistance. See, e.g., Parfit 2017, 126–129. If forced to choose between the person affecting intuition and the intuition that what the agents have done in the depletion case or the slave child case is wrong, we may well cling to the latter. Among other things, it seems highly implausible that our future-directed conduct should get a moral pass whenever it affects the timing and manner of conception.

Of course, as Heyd notes, in many cases a choice that creates a low wellbeing level for a person whose existence depends on that choice will also create low wellbeing levels for people whose existences are independent of that choice. If an agent buries glass in the wood prior to conceiving a child, then even if that choice affects the timing and manner of conception and thus (according to the logic of the nonidentity analysis) cannot make things worse for the agent’s own child, that choice might still make things worse for a neighbor’s child. On that ground, the choice can be declared wrong (Heyd 1992, 193–203). The choice of wrongful life, as well, can make things worse for people other than the impaired child – create burdens, in other words, for those other people that the impaired child itself may then be required to share (Roberts 2009a).

Boonin offers another suggestion for making the “bite the bullet” strategy more plausible. According to Boonin, our intuition that the choices under scrutiny – in, e.g., the depletion case and the slave child case – are wrong is itself rooted in the fact that we have a hard time keeping “present before our mind’s eye” what makes the nonidentity cases “atypical” and “idiosyncratic” – namely, that in the nonidentity cases low wellbeing levels do not correlate in the usual way or the way we have come to expect to a person’s having been made worse off (Boonin 2008, 146–149; Boonin 2014). We then confuse the atypical case with the ordinary case in which low wellbeing levels do signify a person’s having been made worse off. We then, mistakenly, see wrongdoing not just in the ordinary case but in the atypical case as well. Once we appreciate that confusion, we should find ourselves more comfortable abandoning the view that a wrong has been done in the atypical case.

Boonin’s deflationist suggestion seems to run counter, however, to our own lived experience, given that we – post-Parfit – feel strongly that we always have the relevant distinction clearly in mind but continue to consider the depletion choice wrong.

3.2 Purely impersonal views; pluralistic views

Philosophers who accept the various nonidentity cases as counterexamples against the person affecting intuition have the option of retaining the basic consequentialist framework but shifting from a person affecting to an approach that is either purely impersonal or impersonal at least in part. Having thus rejected the person affecting intuition, their challenge then becomes to explain how a choice can be wrong, or make the future in which that choice is made worse, without making things worse for any person who does or will exist in that future – without generating still other population problems that seem at least as challenging as the nonidentity problem itself.

3.2.1 Purely impersonal views: The total theory; the average theory; critical level consequentialism

Traditional forms of utilitarianism, including both the classic maximizing form introduced above as the “total theory” and what we can call the “average theory,” are purely impersonal in nature: they flatly reject the person affecting intuition and, in addition, have the resources easily to explain how a choice made at a future can be wrong while making things worse for no one who does or will exist in that future. If, by waiting a few years to have a child, the 14-year-girl could have produced a child who is better off but nonidentical to the child the girl in fact produced, both the total theory and the average theory, other things equal, imply that what the girl has done is wrong and makes the future worse (Singer 2011, 107–119). The key for both views is the position that a future’s value, and thus the permissibility of the choice that brings about that future, is to be determined on an aggregate basis: utilities correlating to the individual wellbeing levels for each person who does or will exist in a given future are added up to determine the value of that future, with, in the case of the average view, that sum itself being divided by the number of people who do or will exist in that future. On both approaches, it is immaterial whether we create additional (total or average) wellbeing (a) by creating additional wellbeing for a particular existing or future person or (b) by bringing a nonidentical but better off person into existence. (See consequentialism.)

The nonidentity problem, according to Parfit, seems clearly to demonstrate that the moral principle we seek – the “Theory X” – “will not take a person-affecting form” (Parfit 1987, 378). A theory that is impersonal – at least in part – may seem the obvious alternative. The difficulty is that both the total theory and the average theory give rise to their very own serious population problems. As noted earlier, the total theory quickly generates the repugnant conclusion (Parfit 1987, 381–90; see also repugnant conclusion). The average theory does a good job with the nonidentity problem and the repugnant conclusion. But the average theory implausibly prohibits bringing even the very happy child into existence if it so happens that the people who are already in existence happen to be even happier (Parfit 1987, 420; Feldman 1995, 192–93). It also generates highly implausible results when applied to the case Parfit called “Hell Three” (Parfit 1987, 422; see also Temkin 2012, 319–320). Surely, according to Parfit, a situation that makes life hellish for everyone who does or will exist is not improved by the addition of still more people whose lives aren’t quite so awful but are still far less than worth living. The total theory and the average theory both, in addition, face perennial objections based on considerations of justice, fairness and equality.

An attempt to modify the total theory with the aim of avoiding at least the most extreme forms of the repugnant conclusion comes in the form of critical level utilitarianism (Broome 2014). Critical level utilitarianism is impersonal in nature – it rejects the person affecting intuition and, as an aggregative, impersonal view, has the resources to provide a plausible account of the nonidentity problem. Then, to avoid certain versions of the repugnant conclusion, it further insists that the life worth living, if it happens to fall below a certain critical level, will reduce, rather than add to, the value of the relevant future.

Critical level utilitarianism struggles, however, in the face of what Arrhenius called the “sadistic conclusion.” Thus in certain cases the theory will instruct that the future that contains lives that are uniformly worth living and yet fall below the critical level is worse than the future that contains lives that are uniformly worse than lives worth living (Arrhenius 2000). That result seems highly implausible.

3.2.2 Purely impersonal pluralism; radical pluralism; substitutional consequentialism

In response to objections against the total theory and the average theory, theorists more recently have outlined approaches that are, in one way or another, pluralistic in nature.

Thus Larry Temkin proposes that what makes a future better or a choice permissible is determined by reference to the all things considered good, where the all things considered good is a matter both of how much aggregate wellbeing a future contains and the extent to which that future realizes still other ideals or values, including, for example, fairness, desert, equality, human flourishing and the prioritization of the needs of the least well-off (Temkin 1993, 221–27). In contrast, a second approach retains additivity for the purpose of determining a future’s overall value but takes the position that what is to be added up is indicated not by individual wellbeing levels but rather by those levels adjusted in some way to reflect values beyond how much wellbeing a person has in a given future. See Broome 2015; 1991; Feldman 1997.

Such forms of pluralism are consistent with the position that value itself remains purely impersonal in nature. As such, they seem to have the resources necessary to provide a plausible response to the nonidentity problem. Moreover, by recognizing values over and above the value of the maximization of aggregate wellbeing, they may also have the resources necessary to avoid certain versions of the repugnant conclusion – to explain, for example, by reference to the ideal of human flourishing (Temkin) or the concept of desert (Feldman) or the concept of the personal good (Broome), how it can be morally better to produce a somewhat smaller number of extremely well off people rather than a very large number of people whose lives are only barely worth living.

Still other theorists have proposed more radical forms of pluralism: theories that reflect both person affecting and impersonal values. Thus Jeff McMahan considers the question whether a couple ought to produce a third child who would be very happy if he or she were to exist but whose coming into existence would create significant burdens for that child’s two already-existing siblings. Then, we might say that the goal of maximizing wellbeing in the aggregate provides the couple with a reason to have the third child while the person affecting goal of avoiding burdens on behalf of the two siblings provides the couple with a reason not to have the third child. What the couple ought to do is then determined by how these opposing reasons balance against one another. See McMahan 2006; 2009; see also Temkin 1993, 321–47; Temkin 2012, 363–456 (combining an “internal aspects” approach and an “essentially comparative” approach); Buchanan et al. 2000, 226 and 249 (adopting both principle “M” and principle “N”).

Parfit himself proposed serious consideration of what he called the “wide” “dual” person affecting principle: “One of two outcomes would be in one way better if this outcome would together benefit people more, and in another way better if this outcome would benefit each person more.” Parfit 2017, 154. According to Parfit, “this Wide Principle would be only one of our beliefs.” Parfit 2017, 157. It is not, on its own, the “Theory X” Parfit urged us to seek decades ago. Parfit 1987, 378.

It is not clear, however, that any of the forms of pluralism (radical or not) outlined above, as they now stand, make any significant headway in solving our population problems. The fact is that we are not in a position to determine whether those theories have the advantages that may seem to accompany them or not since the theories themselves have not yet been sufficiently detailed to show how the (sometimes opposing) values that they recognize are to be balanced against each other. Without those implications at hand, we cannot test the theory; and without testing the theory, we cannot determine whether the theory generates plausible accounts of our problem cases or not.

Perhaps in part in search of principles that are more transparent and thus more easily tested, still other theorists have suggested principles that require agents to create additional wellbeing, including by way of bringing a better off person into existence in place of a nonidentical less well off person, while limiting that obligation to the case where agents can substitute in the better off person for the less well off person on a one-to-one basis. Holtug 2009; 2010, 160–162; see also Parfit 1987, 369–71 (discussion of what he calls “Principle Q”); Peters 2004, 27–39 (concept of injury by failure to substitute).

3.3 Choice wrongs, or harms, or is bad for, person without making person worse off

Still other theorists, seeking to retain the person affecting intuition without giving up the claim that the choices under scrutiny in the nonidentity cases really are wrong and really do make things worse and while accepting the phenomenon of the precariousness of existence, aim to solve the nonidentity problem by taking the position that the choice that is “bad for” a person is not necessarily one that makes things worse for that person or that harms that person, in the traditional, comparative sense of that term.

The positions noted in this part 3.3 are reminiscent of an idea that Kavka explores. Thus Kavka considers the position that, even if the choices under scrutiny do not make things worse for or harm that child, they may nonetheless constitute instances in which the agent has acted (by creating a less “intrinsically desirable,” or a “restricted,” life) “wrongly toward” the child (Kavka, 1982, 97 and 104–105) and thus whose choice itself is wrong.

3.3.1 Wronging without harming; rights-based accounts; exploitation account

Thus, one suggestion has been that what makes the choice under scrutiny wrong is that it violates the apparent victim’s right against being brought into a flawed existence (Woodward 1986; Elliot 1989; Elliot 1997; Smolkin 1999; Velleman 2008; Cohen 2009). Consider, for example, the slave child case. The nonidentity analysis has it that the couple’s choice to enter into the slave child contract does not make things worse for the child since that particular child very probably would never have existed at all in the absence of that choice. Yet we may agree that everyone has a right not to be born, or made, a slave. The couple’s entering into the slave child contract and then proceeding to have a child under that contract thus violates the child’s right. On that explicitly person affecting basis, we can then say that the couple’s choice is wrong.

Similarly, the ticket agent who refuses to sell an airline ticket to Smith on the basis of Smith’s race violates Smith’s right against racial discrimination even in the case where the plane subsequently “crashes, killing all aboard” (Woodward 1986, 810–11, citing Adams). “What makes racial discrimination wrong is that it is unfair and that it stigmatizes … and a choice may have that character – and be wrong for that reason – regardless of how it affects [a person’s] other interests” (Woodward 1986, 811).

Woodward goes so far as to say that the choice that brings a person into a flawed existence and thereby violates that person’s right “harms” that person under what he calls a “nonconsequentialist approach” to harm (Woodward 1986, 818). Once it is established that the right has been violated, however, any effort to establish harm as well would seem to be motivated not by moral but by legal requirements (wrongful life) or quasi-legal requirements (reparations). For those purposes, however, a non-comparative account of harm becomes especially controversial.

The rights-based account does not require that we compile a defined list of rights. We might take the more general view that each person has a right to be created with “due consideration for his or her humanity”; we can understand that life itself is a “predicament” for which one’s children need to be well-equipped (Velleman 2008, 266 and 276). A “child has a right to be born into good enough circumstances, and being born to [e.g.] a fourteen-year-old mother isn’t good enough” (Velleman 2008, 275). That a child was “glad to be born” doesn’t mean that that child has waived “his birthright” (Velleman 2008, 277). More concretely, one might propose that it is wrong to bring a child into existence when many of his or her rights as outlined in, e.g., the United Nations Convention, would be violated (Archard 2004, 403–20). Still another approach argues that future people come into existence with certain “claim rights,” or simply “claims” (Meyer 2016, 49) that can be defined in part in either sufficientarian (Meyer and Roser 2009) or egalitarian (Meyer 2016, 52–58) terms. Agents who fail to respect those claims fail to discharge a “duty” they owe “to the person who has the claim” (Meyer 2016, 49).

Rights-based and claims-based solutions to the nonidentity problem face certain challenges. The first, from Parfit, is that it is questionable whether the choice an individual would not “regret” and may even applaud can violate a right or constitute a failure to discharge a duty. If it can, it (arguably) does so only in some technical way but not in a way supports the claim that the choice is morally wrong. When respect for the right or claim can be seen in advance not to promote the interests of the rights-holder in any way, the better view might be that the right has been implicitly “waived” or the violation implicitly consented to (Parfit 1987, 364–65 and 373–74) on behalf of the future person. By analogy, the right or claim against bodily injury may be considered waived, or the violation consented to, when the already existing person arrives at the hospital unconscious and in immediate need of open heart surgery. We don’t think that whatever technical rights violation there may have been in such a case supports the inference that what the surgeon has done is morally – or indeed legally – wrong.

The second objection asks whether a rights-based or claims-based approach proves too much. Consider the case where a couple is enslaved and has no means of escaping that status and where any child that the couple will produce is sure to be born a slave. If producing a child in Kavka’s original slave child case described in part 2 above is wrong in virtue of the fact that it violates the child’s right or disregards a child’s claim, it seems that producing a child in the revised slave child case must be wrong as well. But that negative evaluation in the revised case seems implausible. While, in some sense, a right may have been violated or a claim disregarded, it remains unclear that the couple’s choice is morally wrong.

An alternate account that has features in common with the rights-based approach but that, by focusing more closely on the question of whether future people have been “unfair[ly]” treated as compared against existing people and thus “wrongfully exploited” (emphasis added), goes some distance in avoiding both objections. Liberto 2014, 76–81. See also Kavka 1981, 106–109. The idea is that, in cases where the exploitation is established as itself wrongful, the first objection, based on waiver or consent, fails. The same idea provides a defense against the second objection. When the enslaved couple produce a child who is sure to be born a slave, there seems to be no basis on which to claim that the couple has wrongfully exploited the child. (Still other agents, in addition to the broader community, of course, would remain morally liable.) A question for the exploitation view is whether it can be extended to address instances of the nonidentity problem in which it seems clear that a wrong has been done but future people aren’t treated unfairly as compared against existing people. Thus forms of depletion, e.g, may still be considered wrong and to make things worse even if existing people gain nothing and even if – due to technological developments – future people are made substantially better off than existing people.

A third objection seems invulnerable to the reply based on exploitation. Narrowly focusing on the rights-based approach, that objection simply notes that, if the child has the right not to be brought into an existence of a certain sort, it is plausible that the child’s parents have various rights as well. Thus, the couple who opts to produce a child with Huntington’s disease or hereditary deafness in place of a relatively unimpaired child may simply be exercising their rights of procreative liberty. They may, that is, be using their gametes and their labor, as a matter of right, in a way that suits them. We quickly see that the child’s rights and the couple’s rights cannot both be respected – a fact that raises the concern that accounts of the nonidentity cases based on rights may themselves be rooted in a theory that is inconsistent (Persson 2009).

3.3.2 Harming without making person worse off; non-comparative harm; list account of harm; threshold account of harm

Many articulations of the nonidentity problem take for granted that a correct account of harm understands harm as comparative in nature. On such an account, a choice harms a person only if that choice makes that person worse off than he or she would have been under still other choices; a person p is not harmed at a given future f1 if there exists no alternate f2 f2 such that p has more wellbeing at f2 than p has at f1; a choice that maximizes wellbeing for a person at a future f1 cannot harm that person at f1. At least: it cannot do so in any “morally relevant sense” (Parfit 1987, 374).

Some philosophers have suggested that we also have – or can construct – a second morally relevant concept of harm, one that is non-comparative in nature. Though narrower in some ways than the comparative concept, in other ways the non-comparative concept is broader. Specifically, it can count bringing a person into an existence that is in some way burdened as harming that person even in the case where that person’s wellbeing has been maximized. Having established that the choice under scrutiny harms the person it brings into existence and burdens in some way, we can then provide a person affecting account of why that choice is wrong and how it makes things worse.

Shiffrin uses examples to explain her concept of non-comparative harm and give credence to the claim that non-comparative harm has moral relevance. Thus she argues that, if you are hit on the head by a gold bar dropped from the sky as a gift to you, you have been harmed even if you have been more than compensated for that harm in virtue of the fact that you are now own a gold bar (Shiffrin 1999, 120–135).

In the wrongful life case, a child is born with a serious genetic or chromosomal impairment, an impairment that is unavoidable if the child is to exist at all. On a comparative account of harm, bringing that child into existence does not harm that child (provided the existence is not less than worth having). Elizabeth Harman points out, however, that it’s indisputable that bringing that child into existence does cause the child to experience “pain, mental or physical discomfort, disease, deformity, disability, or death”; more generally, it produces a state that is bad for the child to be in – a “bad state.” (Harman 2009, 139). On Harman’s view, that a choice imposes any of the listed conditions on the child is sufficient to establish that that choice harms the child whether or not the child has been made worse off (Harman 2004, 92–93 and 107; Harman 2009, 139). It would be hard to argue, moreover, that harm in that form has no moral relevance. Thus, even those who think that wrongful life doesn’t involve harm – harm, that is, in the comparative, worse off sense of that term – agree that any pain and suffering experienced by the child must be taken into account in order to determine that the child’s existence is not less than worth having. (In the rare case in which the child’s existence is less than worth having – in which, that is, the child would have been better off never existing at all – we would say that the child sustains both comparative and non-comparative harm.)

A related proposal that avoids the difficulties of tethering non-comparative harm to any particular list of burdensome conditions makes use of the concept of a threshold-dependent concept of harm (Rivera-Lopez 2009, 342; see also Meyer, 2004). On this view, bringing a child into existence when that child’s wellbeing level falls below “some normal threshold of quality of life” counts as harming that child even if that existence is itself worth having (Rivera-Lopez 2009, 337).

Objections to proposals that rely on non-comparative concepts of harm to solve the nonidentity problem focus on whether that concept itself can be clearly worked out. Thus, it may be hard to see how one whose wellbeing has been maximized can at the same time have been harmed in any sense of that term that remains clearly within our grasp. Moreover, as Parfit suggests, even if we think it correct on occasion to say that a person who has not been made worse off has been “harmed,” we may still be unclear whether that person has been harmed in a “morally relevant sense” (Parfit 1987, 374). Finally, there is the question of limits: what burdensome conditions are to appear on the non-comparative harm list? What is the threshold level below which existence counts as harm? What is “normal”? And are we really willing to eliminate or at least to mix up the distinction we think we now can so cleanly draw between, e.g., the case in which opening up one’s chest to expose the heart serves no purpose at all and the case in which opening up one’s chest to expose the heart is an essential part of an open-heart procedure that is itself both necessary and sufficient to restore life and health? For critical discussion of the non-comparative account of harm, see Gardner 2015.

A strategy that avoids disputes surrounding the concept of harm would be to argue that, even if the choice does not harm the child, the fact that it causes the child to suffer may mean that it nonetheless wrongs the child. Bonnie Steinbock thus recognizes how hard it is to establish that the child brought into the unavoidably flawed existence has been genuinely harmed (Steinbock 2009, 157–158). But she argues that we still have room to insist that such a child has been treated unfairly or has been wronged in cases in which the child’s existence fails to meet or exceed a certain “decent minimum,” which is itself achieved “only if life holds a reasonable promise of containing the things that make human lives good,” such as “an ability to experience pleasure, to learn, to have relationships with others” (Steinbock 2009, 163–165). Another approach would be to draw the line at average wellbeing (for discussion, see Rachels 1998; Tooley 1998). Still another approach would be to focus on whether the child will face unusual or severe hardships (Benatar 2000; Kamm 2002).

An underlying assumption of each of the approaches sketched in this part 3.3.2 is that the questionable choice is properly considered to cause the serious hardship that initially gives rise to our concern. Arguably, in some nonidentity cases the choice does stand in the appropriate causal relation to the relevant hardship, and in other nonidentity cases it does not (Hanser 2009). While Hanser puts the point in terms of harm, it could be extended to the notion of wronging without harming that Steinbock suggests. See also Gardner 2015, 2017.

3.4 Nonidentity problem rooted in conceptual or metaphysical mistakes regarding personal identity

3.4.1 Reexamining assumptions regarding the nature of personal identity and what it is to make “a person” worse off

The several proposals fall under this heading seek to retain the person affecting intuition and the claim that the choices under scrutiny really are wrong and really do make things worse. But they question some of the ancillary conceptual or metaphysical claims grounding the claim that the coming into existence of any given person is highly precarious. Proposal (a) below accepts that the future person p is nonidentical to the person q conceived from distinct gametes and then exploits the fact that p and q may fall under the same description; proposal (b) argues p and q may be identical despite a distinction in gametes (despite, that is, a distinction in the timing and manner of conception); proposal (c) argues, on metaphysical grounds, that the nonidentity problem rests on a certain equivocation in the use of the term “person”; proposal (d) exploits certain predictable mistakes many people will make in thinking about the identity between p and q; and proposal (e) explores a possible equivocation on what it is to make a person “worse off.”

(a) Though Parfit briefly discusses and sets aside the descriptive proposal (Parfit 1987, 359–60), interest in that proposal has been renewed in recent years (Hare 2007, 512–23, advocating a concept of “de dicto” harm; Reiman 2007, 78–90, describing a “veil of ignorance” with respect to the identity of the person harmed; Wolf 2009; Räsänen 2023). The proposal makes use of the fact that the same definite description can pick out distinct children in distinct scenarios. Consider the slave child case. Let p be the child who in fact exists and suffers as a result of the couple’s entering into the slave child contract. And let q be any one of the children who might have existed had the couple not entered into the slave child contract yet still produced a child. The nonidentity problem argues (among other things) that p and q are, at least very probably, numerically distinct, that is, nonidentical. At the same time, on one construction, p and q, even if nonidentical, fall under a common description: they are equally, for example, “the child produced by the couple.” Moreover, since one choice makes p worse off than the other choice makes q, the one choice, on a certain construction, makes “the child produced by the couple” worse off than the other choice makes “the child produced by the couple.” And on that basis we can then say that the one choice makes things (“de dicto”) worse for “the child produced by the couple” than the other choice does.

(b) A second proposal challenges the metaphysical claims about cross-world identity that are inherent in the nonidentity problem. On this proposal, the child p produced as a slave when the couple chooses to enter into the slave child contract and the child q produced as a non-slave when the couple refrains from entering into the contract but still produces a child should not necessarily be considered distinct. p and q may, in other words, be the very same child despite the fact that (due to variations in the timing and manner of their conceptions) they have ended up with distinct genomes.

(c) Still another proposal rejects theories of personal identity that reflect a rigid form of essentialism and instead posits that there exist “many entities in the vicinity of” the child who eventually comes into existence in the various nonidentity cases and is the subject of our person affecting concern. If we accept both the person affecting idea that a choice is wrong only if it is bad for a particular person – a person who does or will exist – and the idea that a choice is bad for a person only if that person “would have existed” had an alternate choice been made, we are, without realizing it, focusing on distinct entities, with one claim holding of one entity and the other claim holding of another. Dasgupta 2018, 541–542; 550–554. For a proposal that similarly rejects a strict form of the origins (genetic) account of personal identity in favor of a Lewisian “counterpart-theoretic” approach for the purpose of solving the nonidentity problem and specifically aims to retain the cogency of certain harm claims in that context, see Wrigley 2012. An account that also appeals to counterpart theory with the aim of resolving not just the nonidentity problem but the full range of population problems can be found in Meacham 2012. For a more general discussion, see Cooper 2015.

(d) A form of rule consequentialism, rather than struggling to avoid mistaken assumptions, simply exploits two naïve mistakes that many people may well make when they first begin to think about their obligations in respect of future people. The first is the mistake of thinking that the population produced when, for example, agents choose conservation will be identical to the population produced when agents instead choose depletion. The second is the person affecting intuition itself – the idea that a choice made at a future that makes things worse for no person who does or will exist in that future cannot be wrong. Tim Mulgan suggests that the “ideal code” – the code whose internalization by most of a given society will maximize wellbeing on an aggregate basis – will incorporate and in effect deem correct both those mistakes. They are both, after all, easily and efficiently “taught” since (Mulgan thinks) we are prone to make them in any case and they in effect cancel each other out. Because the ideal code is violated by the depletion choice and the 14-year-old girl’s choice to have a child, both are declared wrong (Mulgan 2006, 155–56 and 204; Mulgan 2009).

(e) Cases involving causal preemption seem to show that the simple counterfactual (“but for”) account of what it is to make things worse for a person – a choice is worse for a person only if it makes that person “worse off than [that person] would otherwise be” – fails (Bontly 2016, 1236). For the premises of the nonidentity problem themselves, then, to remain plausible, we must understand what it is for a choice to be “worse for” a person in another way. Bontly suggests the following principle: a choice is worse for someone if and only if it “affects that person for the worse,” where it is understood that a choice that has an “effect” on a person that is itself adverse in some way is sufficient to show that the choice “affects that person for the worse” (Bontly 2016, 1237–38). We then suspect an equivocation when we realize that we can’t both hold that understanding of what it is for a choice to be “worse for” a person constant and at the same time ensure that still other premises of the nonidentity argument remain plausible. Specifically: while the claim that a choice is not worse for a person if (sufficient condition) that person has a life worth living and “would never exist had [that] choice not been made” seems plausible, the claim that that choice does not “affect [that person] for the worse” given those same conditions “seems rather more dubious” (Bontly 2016, 1238–1241).

3.4.2 Is there an explanatory gap?

An ongoing controversy raised by the proposals described in part 3.4.1 above is whether they successfully explain the wrongness of the wrong choice in terms of the adverse consequences that choice has for the person whose plight has drawn our concern to begin with.

Parfit’s own concerns about proposal (a) – to take one example – are based on the apparent explanatory gap between the claim that the couple’s choice makes things worse for “the child produced by the couple” and the result we seek to explain – that the choice to enter into the contract is wrong. The question is whether there is anything we can grasp in what the couple has done to the child in fact produced that explains why the couple’s choice is wrong. No “familiar moral principle” takes us from the shorthand claim to the assessment we are aiming to explain (Parfit 1987, 359; Wasserman 2008, 529–35; for discussion, see Weinberg 2008.)

More generally, do the proposals in (a) – (e) either (i) trace the wrongness of the wrong choice to something other than what is bad for that particular person or (ii) ask us, without adequate justification, to abandon the handful of clear intuitions that we do seem to have regarding personal identity? (i) Do they retain the person affecting intuition in a sufficiently robust form? Or are they person affecting in name only and in fact root their explanation of wrongness not in what is bad for the person but rather in what is bad for the world? (ii) Do they ask us to concede that p and q are one and the same person in cases where we really can’t bring ourselves to believe that p and q are one and the same person? Could my father’s first-born child have been me had he never met my mother at all and instead produced a very different child with a very different genome born at a very different time? We should agree we can figure out a theory that generates such a claim of identity. What is unclear is the justification that compels us to accept that theory.

If we both confine our scrutiny to what has been done to the particular child and insist on retaining some of our clearest intuitions regarding personal identity, a second concern arises. As David Wasserman notes, if the child’s life is itself, though flawed, worth living and if that flaw is unavoidable if that particular child is ever to exist at all, it may seem that any difficulty the child then faces is a “perfectly acceptable price to pay for a life he [or she] could not have without it” (Wasserman 2006, 145). We again are left with the kind of explanatory gap that Parfit noted in connection with the descriptive view. Confining our scrutiny just to what has been done to the child and properly taking into account the good that has been done for the child as well as the bad, we cannot discern why what has been done is, by any stretch, bad for the child and hence cannot discern any person affecting ground for the claim that what has been done is wrong.

3.5 Nonidentity problem rooted in a mistake in reasoning about relevant probabilities

The nonidentity cases that seem most seriously to challenge the person affecting intuition rely on claims about probabilities. Thus in the slave child case, the depletion case, cases involving historical injustices and many others, it is claimed only that “very probably” particular people would not have existed had agents chosen differently. Closer scrutiny of the probabilities at stake in those cases suggests a solution to the problem that allows us to retain the person affecting intuition while recognizing the phenomenon of the precariousness of existence and accepting the conceptual and metaphysical assumptions other proposals seek to challenge. What that closer scrutiny shows is that the conclusion that the future person who is the subject of our concern has not been made worse off, or harmed (in the traditional, comparative sense of that term), by the choice under scrutiny is not one that we can validly reach. Once we recognize the fallacy in the argument, we can identify a basis for an account that recognizes that the choice under scrutiny, after all, makes things worse for, and harms, that person (Roberts 2024, 196–204; see also Roberts 1998; 2003; 2006; 2009; Roberts and Wasserman 2017).

The probability-based proposal is based on the following formulation of the person affecting intuition: a choice made at a given future f1 is morally wrong, and makes f1 worse than a second future f2, only if there exists an alternate practically accessible future f3 such that f1 is worse for at least one person who does or will exist in f1 than f3, where f3 may, but need not, be identical to f2. To this basic formulation is then added a further necessary condition, a probability-based condition, on when a choice is wrong (Roberts 2024, chap. 6).

That formulation of the intuition, like the initial formulations set forth in the preamble and part 1, is cautious. It provides only a necessary condition for when one future is worse than another and when a choice at that one future is wrong; and the necessary condition it provides is a condition only on when one future is worse (not better) than another. Also like those initial formulations, it is consistent with the position that all people, including the merely possible, have the same moral status. In contrast to those initial formulations, however, the formulation is explicit in nailing down a critical point: in determining whether a person has been made worse off in a given future, the formulation requires an inquiry not just into how well off the future person “would have been,” but also into how well off that person practically (not logically) “could have been,” had an alternate choice been made. (In addition to giving support to the probability-based proposal, specifically to the first point noted below, such an expansive test also helps to avoid Broome’s argument against the neutrality intuition (see part 1 above) as well as issues that arise from simple, counterfactual “but for” accounts of when a person is made worse off or has been harmed. (The “but for” account of harm has been – it seems correctly – widely rejected, including in the 1930s by the First Restatement of Torts. See Bontly 2016; Carlson 2018; Roberts 2024, 4–5 n.8, 19, 57–58, 196–97 n.20, 223; see also Roberts 2007; 2009; 2011. For a defense of versions of the counterfactual approach, see Klocksiem 2012; Bavli 2018.)

The probability-based proposal then makes two points. First, where it is stipulated as part of the case that the agents’ original, wrong choice has, at a particular future, triggered a chain of events that resulted in a particular child’s – say, Harry’s – coming into an existence at that future that is burdened by a particular condition, on close inspection we can see that agents in that same case also had an alternate choice at an alternate future that would have triggered an alternate chain of events that would have resulted in that same child Harry’s coming into existence at that alternate future but now unburdened by that condition. Agents, in other words, prior to choice had some way, if not a way they themselves were in a position to identify, to make things better for Harry. (Thus nothing, for example, in the laws of physics bars the agents in the slave child case from declining to enter into the slave child contract and still adhering to the same timing and manner for conception that they in fact adhered to. Had they done so, Harry would have existed – but as a non-slave.)

That point leaves unanswered a critical question: even if Harry practically could have existed under an alternate, permissible choice, how likely is it that he would have existed under such a choice?

It is in fashioning an answer to that critical question that the second point becomes relevant. Many theorists accept that the role that probabilities play in evaluating choice can be best explained by reference to a standard form of expected value theory. (It should be recognized that standard expected value theory has become increasingly controversial. For purposes here, however, whether reference is made to standard expected value theory or instead to an improved successor view is immaterial.) So that agents can evaluate their available alternatives prior to choice, the expected value calculation must itself be completed as of the moment just prior to choice based on information available to the agents at that moment. We agree that under any alternate, permissible choice (e.g., the couple’s choice not to enter the slave child contract and yet still produce a child) Harry’s chances of existence would have been very, very small. What has been missed is that, under the agents’ original, wrong choice, Harry’s chances of existence, calculated as of the moment just prior to choice and limited just to information available to the agents at that moment, were also very, very small. (How could agents have guessed, prior to choice, precisely when and how would conceive a child? To the extent they had any rough idea at all when and how they might accomplish that feat, they could have allowed themselves to be guided by that rough idea under an alternate, permissible choice as well.)

The probabilities under the original, wrong choice and under various alternate, permissible choices are, in other words, a “wash.” But the wellbeing that would have been created for Harry under any alternate, permissible choice made within the context of any future that includes Harry and that (against all odds) happens to unfold is clearly greater than the wellbeing created for Harry under the original, wrong choice within the context of the future that (against all odds) happened to unfold. The upshot under standard expected value theory is that the expected value for Harry under various alternate, permissible choices is greater than the expected value for Harry under the original, wrong choice. Thus the door is open to an account that both accepts the person affecting intuition but can at the same time explain just why the couple’s choice to enter into the slave child contract and produce a child under the terms of that contract makes things morally worse and is morally wrong: the wrong choice made things worse for a child, Harry, who does or will exist at the future in which he exists under that wrong choice. See Roberts 2022a, 2022b; and 2024, 196–204. For criticism of the proposal outlined here, see Greene 2016; Smilansky 2017; Harney 2019.

One might object that in fact there is no probability Harry would exist in the absence of the couple’s choosing to enter into the contract and produce a child since, “but for” their entering into the contract, the probability that the couple would together have produced any child at all is zero. That may be an accurate prediction of what the couple would have done, but it doesn’t bear on whether Harry has been made worse off or harmed by what they in fact have done. (As noted above, the simple, counterfactual, “but for,” account of when a person has been made worse off, or harmed, has been widely rejected.)

As to those nonidentity cases that seem not to rely on assessments of the relevant probabilities – including cases in which the existence is worth having but unavoidably flawed due, e.g., to a genetic or chromosomal disorder – consistent with the probability-based proposal we may take the position that those cases are less worrisome in the sense that it may seem less clear to us that the choices under scrutiny are wrong or make things morally worse (Roberts and Wasserman, 2017).

3.6 Choice is wrong in virtue of agent’s reasons, attitudes and intentions

3.6.1 Choice violates principle of mutual respect

A contractualist approach to the nonidentity problem will focus on the legitimate expectations future people have in respect of the agents whose choices cause those future people both to exist and suffer. Such expectations can be violated – and future people wronged – even in cases where those people have not been made worse off, or harmed, by what the agent has done. What is important is not the outcome for the person but rather the “culpable failure” on the part of the agent, including the failure to respect a future person’s “value as capable of rational self-governance” by way of failing to take “risk-managing” measures (including, e.g, pre-conception genetic testing) on behalf of that future person (Kumar 2003, 104–114; Kumar 2018). An issue that immediately arises is whether a measure that makes it the case that the person who will suffer can never exist at all is genuinely risk-managing in respect of that person. Drawing from Scanlon 1998, Kumar describes an alternative position that focuses, not on particular people, but rather on types of persons, or standpoints, and, specifically, “the reasons that persons in certain circumstances … typically have for caring about or wanting certain things.” Principles reflected in such reasons – principles “no one can reasonably reject” – include preferences against the risk of living a life that is seriously compromised. Failing to take such reasons into account (depending on other facts) is counted as a wrong against (though not a harm to) any particular person who eventually exists and, as a result of the choice under scrutiny, suffers. Kumar 2018. Left unclear is how to reconcile the standpoint against the personal risk. A future standpoint may include the “generic” preference not to suffer the side effects of a particular infertility treatment. But if that treatment is necessary for the person ever to exist at all, it is arguable whether that the treatment wrongs that person or not.

Finneron-Burns offers an alternative account of how Scanlon’s contractualism can be applied to solve the nonidentity problem. In contrast to Kumar’s account, Finneron-Burns’ account avoids phrasing the debate in terms of types or standpoints that need not be tied to any particular individual. It instead asserts that we can think about future people – people who will in fact one day exist – in the same terms we think about existing people while also taking the position that merely “possible people are not included in the scope of those to whom we owe justification” (Finneron-Burns 2016, 1163; 2024). The upshot is that Finneron-Burns’ account would seem to face the same hurdles as will any other view that claims that people who do or will in fact exist have a special moral status that the merely possible lack. See part 1 above; part 4 below.

3.6.2 Agent fails to have appropriate concern for future person’s plight

A second approach that shifts the analysis of wrongdoing away from what has been done to the future person and toward facts about the agent focuses on the agent’s reasons for making one choice rather than another. On this approach, attitudes themselves can be “morally defective” (Kahane 2008, 203; see also Noggle 2019 (wrongdoing based on defective attitude toward morality; Bramble 2021 (wrongdoing based on morally dubious character trait)). Whether the agent’s choice wrongs the future person will depend on whether the agent is motivated by an appropriate level of concern for the needs and interests of (among others) the future person. Is the agent appropriately sensitive both to the degree of suffering that person can be expected to endure and to the various aspects of that person’s life that can be expected to render that life (on balance) worth living (Wasserman 2006, 146)? The parent may have a principled objection against pre-implantation genetic diagnosis but also have an appropriate level of concern for the child’s plight. In that case, the parent’s producing the impaired child in place of the better-off but nonidentical child does not wrong the impaired child. On the other hand, if a parent never considers the challenges that the child might face as a result of being born impaired, then what the parent has done is wrong. Thus, on this view, the choice’s permissibility is a function not of the expected good for the child in fact being counterbalanced by the expected bad but rather of the parent’s careful determination of how the one balances against the other (Wasserman 2006, 146–151). An implication of this view is that there need be nothing wrong in choosing to have a less happy rather than a happier child.

Choices by policymakers (in, e.g., the context of the depletion example) can be similarly evaluated. The parent’s and the policymaker’s roles may differ in respect of the future people their choices will cause to exist but agents in both roles can plausibly be held to a role-appropriate standard of concern (Wasserman 2009).

4. Related challenge to the person affecting intuition: the asymmetry

Part of the reason the person affecting intuition has been so attractive is the support that it provides to one half of a pair of highly intuitive claims that McMahan calls the asymmetry (McMahan 1981; 2009). According to the asymmetry, it is wrong, and makes a future morally worse, to bring a miserable child – a child whose life is less than worth living – into existence but it is perfectly permissible, and does not make a future worse, to leave the happy child out of existence. That latter of those two claims is simply an implication of the person affecting intuition.

Narveson was an early advocate of both the person affecting intuition and the asymmetry. The asymmetry, however, has recently put forward not as an adjunct to the person affecting intuition but as still another way to undermine the intuition (Singer 2011, 88–89); MacAskill 2022, 172; see also McMahan 1981, 2009). The objection is just this: the asymmetry is itself internally inconsistent. Since it is generally agreed that the choice to bring the miserable child into existence is, other things equal, surely wrong and makes the future morally worse, any internal inconsistency within the asymmetry must be laid at the feet of the person affecting intuition itself.

Consistency concerns regarding the asymmetry arise when attempts are made to explain how it can be that the existence of the miserable child makes things worse but the existence of the happy child does not make things better. Other objections arise when attempts are made to avoid inconsistency by situating the asymmetry within the context of moral actualism or indeed any theory that assigns a special moral status to actual people (or to people who will exist if agents make the choice under scrutiny; or to people who will exist independently of whether agents make that choice) that it does not also assign to merely possible people (or to never existing people; or to people whose existence depends on whether that choice is made). See McMahan 1981; 2009; Persson 2009; Singer 2011, 114; Parfit 2011 vol. 2, 224–225; see also cases involving cycling, e.g., Parfit’s Tom, Dick and Harry case; Parfit 2017, 140–146; see also Hare 2007, 503–507.

Claims of an internal inconsistency, however, have been challenged. We can recognize the importance of avoiding the claim that any person’s moral status is a function of that person’s existential status, concede that leaving the happy child out of existence makes that child worse off than that child might have been and still insist that a child’s being made worse off by way of being left out of existence altogether lacks any moral significance even though the child’s being made worse off by way of being brought into a miserable existence has full moral significance. The distinction that is at work in making that claim would just be this: the happy child’s loss of wellbeing obtains within a future in which that child never exists at all, while the miserable child’s loss of wellbeing obtains within a future in which that child does or will exist. See Roberts 2010; 2011a; 2011b; 2024, 53–65.

5.Conclusion

Perhaps the most practically important contribution the nonidentity problem has made to our moral theorizing (whether as philosophers, economists, lawyers or otherwise) is that it focuses our close attention on the precise nature of the obligations we have in respect of possible future people, including future generations. If the person affecting intuition means that – given the precariousness of existence – our obligations are satisfied with implausible ease, then the nonidentity problem provides us with a compelling objection against that intuition. If rejecting that intuition means that we are obligated, not just to make people happy, but also to make happy people and to do so even at a grave cost to still other people, then we seem to have a compelling argument in favor of that intuition. The reason the nonidentity problem is of such intense and continuing interest is that neither of those options seems even remotely plausible. The solution perhaps will involve a closer look at the intuition itself alongside the various ancillary claims that we must accept in order validly to argue for either one of those disturbing results.

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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

I am grateful to Jacob Iacullo and Kevin Janas for their research assistance in connection with the 2024 revision of this entry.

Copyright © 2024 by
M. A. Roberts <robertsm@tcnj.edu>

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