Olympiodorus

First published Tue Jun 12, 2007; substantive revision Fri Aug 9, 2024

Olympiodorus of Alexandria, presumably a late pupil of Ammonius Hermeiou, the commentator on Aristotle and teacher of Simplicius and Philoponus, was one of the last pagans to teach philosophy at the school of Alexandria in the 6th century. He interpreted classical philosophical works in his lectures, mainly texts by Plato and Aristotle; we still possess three of his commentaries on Plato and two on Aristotle. At times, these lectures read like carefully crafted pieces of pedagogy, but at other times, they read more like more or less successful transcripts drawn up by a student. Although Olympiodorus comes across as a learned man and guardian of traditional paideia, both literary and philosophical, his œuvre compares unfavorably, from a philosophical standpoint, with commentaries written by either Ammonius or Olympiodorus’ contemporaries, such as Simplicius and John Philoponus. Still, his work is valuable in that it affords us vivid insights into how pagan philosophy was taught to the youth of Christian elites who, for the most part, would move on to careers in the clergy or at the Byzantine court. The 6th-century Alexandrian Olympiodorus must be distinguished from another Olympiodorus who supposedly lived in the first half of the 5th century C.E. and was said by Marinus in his Life of Proclus to have been a teacher of Proclus at Athens. No other evidence of this earlier figure survives. The relationship of the younger philosopher Olympiodorus to an alchemist, supposedly of the same name and provenance, remains disputed.

1. Life

There are precisely three more or less solid facts based on which one can reconstruct a general framework of Olympiodorus’ life. First, he held the chair of philosophy in Alexandria (the majority of manuscripts of his work refer to him as “the Alexandrian philosopher”). Second, he saw himself as the intellectual heir to Ammonius (see in Meteor. 153,7; 175,14; 188,36; 238,19; 255,23; 256,27). Olympiodorus refers to Ammonius frequently as “the great philosopher,” in one case as “our philosopher” (in Gorg. §40.5; cf. §39.2), suggesting that he may have been Ammonius’ pupil. Third, some of his lectures were delivered not long after 565 (cf. in Meteor. 52,31); how Olympiodorus recalls a comet in March/April 565 suggests that the event occurred a few years earlier. It is generally assumed that Ammonius passed away (or at least stopped teaching) sometime between 517 and 526. If these dates are correct, we can infer that Olympiodorus was a young man when he came to be one of the last pupils of Ammonius and that he led an active intellectual life into the late sixties or early seventies of that century. Accordingly, the dates of Olympiodorus’ life should be approximately 500–570, making him a slightly younger contemporary of emperor Justinian the Great, who ruled from 527 to 565. Since John Philoponus was actively teaching philosophy till the mid-30s (without ever holding the chair of philosophy), it seems likely that Olympiodorus began his teaching career around that time to become the official successor to Ammonius.

The best way to understand the circumstances of his life is to get a sense of the final period of pagan philosophy in the age of Justinian (for a more detailed account, see Wildberg 2005, with further references). For our purposes, the most crucial factor is that in the age of Justinian, philosophy, as a discipline taught in schools of higher education, had acquired a highly ambiguous status. On the one hand, almost anyone in the empire was perfectly aware that Justinian had, right from the beginning of his reign, taken severe measures to eradicate philosophy as a way of pagan life and learning, both private and public. The closing of the Athenian School around 529 (with an apparent expropriation of its assets) was only the most notorious instance. On the other hand, members of the elite were also acutely aware that it was impossible to sustain the culture of the empire, both secular and clerical, without a classical education, part of which was and always has been philosophy. Training in philosophy was all the more necessary since only a firm grounding in logic and ontology could prepare one in a meaningful way for participation in the subtle theological debates that dominated the best minds at the time, notably the intractable problem of the nature of Christ: Does Christ have two natures, one human, one divine, or one compound nature? How can one possibly understand the simultaneity of divinity and humanity in a single substance? One could not hope to become an expert in theology (then regarded as the highest form of philosophy) without a decent grasp of the works of Aristotle and Plato. And so, under the emperor who did perhaps more than anyone to dismantle philosophy as a profession, philosophy flourished — in Alexandria especially and elsewhere — in a manner unparalleled in late antiquity.

This is the world to which Olympiodorus belonged, a highly trained pagan philosopher rendering his services to an (at least officially) entirely Christian audience. Undoubtedly, the religious presuppositions of his students, their needs, interests, and expectations determined to a large extent the parameters and content of his classes and, as we shall see, foregrounded the need for a considerable amount of pedagogy on the part of the lecturer. It is clear that even if he had wanted to, Olympiodorus could not have expounded the views of Plato and Aristotle with the same zeal and conviction as, for example, Simplicius, who had no audience to lecture to (once Justinian had closed the school in Athens). Indeed, philosophy was alive and well in the imperial institutions, but the latter were confined on all sides by the walls of orthodoxy and heresy. This must be considered before one joins the chorus of detractors who bewail the philosophical paucity of Olympiodorus’ commentaries. (For a list of his works, see below, sect. 6.)

2. Commentaries on Plato

Olympiodorus begins his commentary on Plato’s Alcibiades with a grand gesture: “Aristotle began his Theology with the words: ‘All men by nature desire to know, and evidence for this is our love of perception.’ But as I begin to speak about Plato’s philosophy, I would say this, which is better, that all men have a desire for Plato’s philosophy because all men want to draw something useful from it; they hurry to be spell-bound by its fountain and stand still only when they are full of Platonic enthusiasm.” Olympiodorus is working hard to galvanize his audience with a passion for Plato. It is characteristic of his entire work that he holds out for them the prospect that something worthwhile can be gained from the study of Plato and not only his writings but also his life (Motta 2021).

Worthwhile in what sense? Olympiodorus hands his students the shards and tesserae that could amount to classical paideia in the appropriate number and arrangement as if piecing together a Byzantine mosaic. His commentaries on Plato abound with references to Homer, Demosthenes, the 2nd-century C.E. orator Aelius Aristides, Plutarch, Epictetus, and Aristotle, as well as works of Plato other than the one being commented on, notably the Republic, which his students had not read yet. One sees that Olympiodorus gently but firmly directs his pupils’ attention to an intellectual world waiting for them to discover — if they want to. We are entering a period in late antiquity in which Plato and Aristotle cease to be gateways to the ‘truth’ and turn into icons of cultural heritage worth keeping alive for practical purposes. Olympiodorus has rightly been called “the first classicist” (Tarrant 1997).

This effort to stem the tide of cultural pauperization was carefully packaged and structured without depriving the lecturer of the necessary flexibility: each class (praxis) was divided into three sections. The reading of the original Platonic (or Aristotelian) text was followed by an ‘overview’ of the passage (theôria), which in turn segued into a closer reading (lexis). The overview allowed the professor to make all kinds of general remarks on the significance and meaning of the passage under discussion; the close reading presented more detailed and often simply philological, linguistic, logical, or rhetorical observations not unlike those found in modern annotated editions. Dividing one’s comments into these two sections seems to be a formalized development of Proclus’ method (see Beutler 1949, 226).

Olympiodorus refrains from discussing falsehood or truth in philosophical matters (the latter somewhat abstractly enshrined for him in ‘common notions’ [koinai ennoiai]; see Tarrant 1997, esp. 188–192). The reason may not have been that he harbored no such convictions but that it would have been inappropriate or unwanted to propound them in the classroom. Very often, what has proved most interesting to modern scholars for historical reasons are remarks made entirely in passing, for example, the intriguing statement that some of the endowment of the Academy in Athens was still intact in his time (in Alc. §141.1f.); that the Alexandrian rhetorician Anatolius adapted a line of Homer to great effect in the year 546 (in Alc. §2.79–82); or that suicide is forbidden because, according to the Orphic tradition, “human bodies belong to Dionysus” (in Phaed. §1.3).

Occasionally, we encounter an anecdote about Ammonius, whom Olympiodorus revered and whom he invokes frequently to inflate his own authority. One such story suggests a tension between imperial rule and the political views of the philosophers. Near the end of the Gorgias commentary (§42), Olympiodorus endorses the idea that aristocracy is the best form of government and far superior to democracy, and he justifies this by claiming that the city, just like the human being, is a microcosm that should resemble the macrocosm ‘universe.’ But this argument seems to favor monarchy, for just as the universe is ruled by one, i.e., God, there “should not be some ordinary people who rule, but one prudent and true statesman.” Olympiodorus continues: “Now if somebody says, ‘But this is a monarchy, not aristocracy, and that is not the same thing,’ reply as the philosopher Ammonius replied: ‘Give him the knuckles and praise him. For it is the same, … even if there are many exceedingly good people, they form a living unit, for they have everything in common.’” (§42.2)

One question is how the opposition of teacher and student, paganism, and Christianity, ancient and ‘modern,’ played out in Olympiodorus’s classroom. Here are some illustrative examples. The Delphic oracle still seemed to enjoy an awe-inspiring reputation, but the names of Greek gods in Plato’s text, especially Zeus, are often omitted and/or replaced by the word ‘God.’ Olympiodorus has trouble showing his students ways in which to make sense of pagan divinities in their effort to adapt pagan philosophy to the Christian context: “Do not be disturbed by names when you hear talk of a ‘Power of Cronus’ or a ‘Power of Zeus’ or suchlike but concentrate on the objects themselves, for we signify something different when we use these names. If you wish, think that these powers do not have individual essences and are not distinct from one another, but place them within the first cause and say that they are both intellectual and vital powers” (in Gorg. §47.2).

At times, the underlying tensions rise to the surface, but Olympiodorus was expertly evasive of trouble from the audience. In his 44th lecture on the Gorgias, for instance, he reassures his students that pagan myths ought not to be taken literally; one ought to understand that names such as Zeus and Hera and Hades were merely part of the language in which ‘they’ (i.e., the ancient Greeks) talked. Puzzled by the dizzying and conflicting possibilities of allegorical interpretations of myth if they are not taken literally, one obstinate student must have intervened, for Olympiodorus makes the following evasive remark (§44.7): “If someone says ‘Then neither ought we put trust in philosophers, since they are in disagreement, some saying the soul is water, others that it is air, some that it is mortal, others that it is immortal,’ we reply that in this case, we put our trust in those who stay closer to the common notions. But [in myths], no common notions guide our education. Hence, we should first explain the myths — for indeed, Plato explicates them. So he said earlier … .”

Even if the general worldview of paganism may have alienated some students, it is clear that many of them were fascinated by its more sinister aspects. At one point in the Gorgias (513a), Socrates mentions in passing certain Thessalian witches who pulled down the moon and caused an eclipse. In Lecture 39 on the Gorgias, Olympiodorus explains the story behind these witches in a few broad strokes, apparently to his own satisfaction. But witchcraft was just the thing students wanted to hear a bit more about from the pagan philosopher, so Lecture 40 begins like this: “Since last time I referred to the Thessalian women, it is worth explaining the practice, why people think wizards draw down the moon [at an eclipse], and why ordinary people beat on bronze. Note that an eclipse is nothing other than the privation of light. During this privation in particular, while it is dark, certain infernal demons wander around since the world is without light. Then unholy and God-hating wizards cast spells to attract these demons. Hence, the multitude believes that they have drawn down the moon. And since at such time demons are among us, ordinary people beat on bronze, thereby casting off and driving the demonic interference away. I have dealt with these things because you are not without ideas about these customs. Now, let me come to the present topic.” Philosophically, all this is of no interest at all. Still, looking at it from a cultural point of view, one gets a fascinating whiff of the bewildering concerns of students reading Plato in the sixth century.

Being a pagan philosopher on the municipal payroll of the City of Alexandria—or worse, being dependent on voluntary student fees—must have been no enviable position. One can imagine that the act of playing the token philosopher in Alexandria and lecturing for decades on matters that no one in the audience anymore really cared about took its toll. The Greek Anthology attributes to Olympiodorus an at once artful and depressing epigram (Anth. Gr., Appendix 177):

Had the writing of Plato not checked my impulse,
I would have loosened by now the grievous, baneful bond of life.

3. Commentaries on Aristotle

The Prolegomena to Aristotle’s logic, or in a sense to his whole philosophical work, begins again with a carefully worded statement that is reminiscent of the first words of the Alcibiades commentary: “Since we want to enjoy the fountain of good things, there is an eagerness in us to cling to Aristotle’s philosophy, which provides life with the principle of good things, and not the least because it leads the bright mind towards precision as to what is being sought.” (Proleg. 1,3–6). The Prolegomena consists of five lectures in which he gives his students a brief overview of the various schools of Greek philosophy and the division of the works of Aristotle. He explains, among other things, the aim of Aristotle’s philosophy (recognition of the Good — apparently the prime mover of the Metaphysics — as the principle of everything, 9,14–30) and the moral and intellectual requirements of a student and a teacher of philosophy (10,3–33). The various philosophical thinkers and schools are being introduced without evaluations of their philosophical merits, and there is no talk about the harmony of the philosophers in general or between Plato and Aristotle.

Olympiodorus adopts the view of Iamblichus that the subject matter (skopos) of the Categories is speech signifying things by the mediation of thoughts (Proleg. 21,101–3; in Cat. 28,25ff), which conforms with the basic interpretation of the Categories in the school of Alexandria. Formally, too, the commentary resembles, more than his other commentaries on Aristotle do, the standard format familiar to us from other Neoplatonic commentators on Aristotle. Unlike the commentary on Meteorology, which displays the typically Olympiodorean structure of being divided into praxeis which are then subdivided into longer expositions of the meaning of the passage under discussion (theôriai) and more detailed analyses of the text (lexeis), the commentary on the Categories is more simply divided into theôriai (which don’t seem to be further subdivided).

The Meteorology commentary begins, without any significant introduction, directly with Aristotle’s text. It is impossible to tell whether his students, at that point, had worked their way through prior physical treatises (in the order of the curriculum), notably the Physics, de Caelo, and de Generatione et Corruptione. In any case, Olympiodorus does not refer to lectures he had previously delivered on these texts; he only places the present work into the context of the other physical treatises. So he says, for example, that Aristotle wrote three treatises about the elementary bodies: the de Caelo, which concerns itself with them insofar as they are eternal; the de Generatione, which deals with their coming to be; and the Meteorology, which treats them as things that are “subject to influences” (pathainomena), a very unusual term the precise meaning of which Olympiodorus nowhere defines. The word occurs in Proclus but in different contexts.

This commentary (written after 565) is precious because it is the only complete commentary on Meteorology from antiquity. There is another commentary, written by the Christian John Philoponus some 30 years earlier, but it is incomplete (comments break off in the 12th chapter of Book I). It was Philoponus’ last commentary, written after the highly controversial contra Aristotelem and probably just when he stopped teaching philosophy. Olympiodorus must have been familiar with the gist, if not the details, of Philoponus’ searing criticism of Aristotle, yet he appears to be entirely unaffected by it. He announces early on the Aristotelian orthodoxy that there are five elements, not merely four, and that the celestial element (aithêr) is creative (poiêtikos), the other elements material (hulikos) (in Meteor. 2,15f). Strikingly, he happily reproduces Aristotle’s argument for the existence of a fifth element from the de Caelo (the circularity of the celestial motion can only be explained on the assumption of a unique celestial element, cf. in Meteor. 16,25–17,9). He polemicizes against the view that the heavens consist of fire (in Meteor. 17,1–18,30) and in no way qualifies, hides, or denies the fact (scandalous to Christians) that Aristotle thought the universe and time to be eternal (in Meteor. 8,8f;123,24f).

Olympiodorus’ main influences in this commentary stem from Alexander of Aphrodisias, whom he cites frequently, and the views of Ammonius, with which he was intimately familiar. But Olympiodorus never refers to Philoponus. There are occasional references to certain unnamed people who proffered views Olympiodorus disagrees with (see, e.g., 4,16; 7,22; 23,5.11.18.20), but it isn’t easy to trace these views back to Philoponus. The latter seems to have been of no concern to him. This suggests, shockingly, that Olympiodorus ignored relevant and important intellectual work carried out in his lifetime, in the same ‘university’ and even the same ‘department’ by a man he must have known personally. To Olympiodorus and his disciples, as with Simplicius in Athens, John Philoponus was persona non grata.

4. Olympiodorus the Alchemist

Discussion of the commentary on Aristotle’s Meteorology with the so-called ‘chemical treatise’ as its fourth book prompts the question of the identity of the Neoplatonist Olympiodorus with another figure carrying precisely the same name who appears in the alchemist tradition. Four extant manuscripts of an alchemical work that purports to be a commentary on Zosimus’ Kat’ energeian (On Activity) state that the piece was written by “Olympiodorus, the Alexandrian philosopher” (see §6 below). The alchemical treatise starts as a commentary on Zosimus (of Panopolis, not the 5th c. C.E. historian), explaining a small passage in some detail, but then continues in the vein of a didactic letter written to an unnamed fellow alchemist (called ‘friend of the Muses’ at one point). It ‘explains’ how to join scattered parts of gold and purify metals, emphasizes the significance of ‘divine water’ (whatever that is), and so on. The author knows a smidgen about the Presocratics (whom he regards as alchemists) but next to nothing about Plato and Aristotle; instead, he can quote at length from Zosimus, Hermes, Petasius, Pelagius, and a “divine Mary” — not the mother of Jesus but a Jewish sage elsewhere attested in the alchemist tradition.

A closer survey of the text suggested to scholars like H.D. Saffrey 2005 that the Neoplatonist philosopher could not have produced the alchemical treatise. For one thing, unlike the philosopher, the alchemist seems to be a Christian, attributing a saying by Paul (“The letter kills, but the spirit gives life.” 2 Cor. 3.6) to “the Lord” (94, 13–15). In addition, the contents, style, diction, and rhetorical ambiance created by the two authors are strikingly different (see also Opsomer 2011, Griffin 2017). However, C. Viano, who once defended the identity of the two figures, draws attention to striking similarities in structure and language between the alchemical treatise and the commentary on Book IV of Aristotle’s Meteorology (see Viano 2006 and 2021). She proposes that Olympiodorus indeed wrote a commentary on Zosmimus, but this, or part of it, was later altered and expanded by a compiler who added excerpts and digressions from elsewhere.

In any case, it seems clear that the extant commentary on Zosimus’ On Activity is not simply another work by the Neoplatonist Olympiodorus; he most likely did not write this piece of alchemy. Nevertheless, the manuscripts refer to him as the work’s author. If Viano is right, what we have is not a straightforward case of pseudepigraphy (otherwise not an uncommon characteristic of the genre of alchemist literature) but, more interestingly, a mixture of genuine attribution, intellectual appropriation, and literary expansion. It would also follow that there was never another Alexandrian named Olympiodorus steeped in the arcane science of alchemy instead of Platonic philosophy. Above all, the alchemist manuscript would be a testimony to the influence of Olympiodorus in Late Antiquity.

5. Influence

The teaching of philosophy did not cease with the death of Olympiodorus. He had intelligent pupils who devoted themselves to philosophy in a professional way. Whether they were pagans or Christians is unclear, but their commentaries were passed around under such names as David and Elias (see Wildberg 1990). We can tell that Olympiodorus influenced them because they referred to him and adopted his pedagogical method of dividing their lectures into theôriai and lexeis. The same goes for Stephanus of Alexandria, who taught philosophy in Constantinople at the beginning of the 7th century.

Olympiodorus’s wider influence is somewhat less tangible than that of the other great Alexandrians. The Syrians and the Arabs certainly knew and read him, but not extensively. Neither did the Latin West. The commentary on the Categories has come down to us in only one manuscript (Codex Mutinensis 69), and there are only a handful of manuscripts of the Meteorology commentary. Manuscripts of his commentaries on Plato are equally rare, except those containing the commentary on Plato’s Phaedo.

6. List of extant works

  1. Prolegomena to Aristotle’s Logic and Commentary on Aristotle’s Categories: A. Busse, ed. (1902) Olympiodori Prolegomena et in Categorias Commentarium, Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca XII 1. Berlin: Reimer.
  2. Commentary on Aristotle’s Meteorology: W. Stüve, ed. (1900) Olympiodori in Aristotelis Meteora Commentaria, Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca XII 2. Berlin: Reimer.
  3. Commentary on Plato’s Alcibiades I: L. G. Westerink, ed. (1956) Olympiodorus, Commentary on the first Alcibiades of Plato, Amsterdam: North-Holland Publishing Company. English Translation by M.J. Griffin 2015 and 2016.
  4. Commentary on Plato’s Gorgias: W. Norvin, ed. (1936) Olympiodori Philosophi in Platonis Gorgiam Commentaria, Leipzig: Teubner; L.G. Westerink, ed. (1970) Olympiodorus. In Platonis Gorgiam Commentaria. Leipzig: Teubner. See also Jackson/Lycos/Tarrant 1998.
  5. Commentary on Plato’s Phaedo: W. Norvin, ed. (1913) Olympiodori Philosophi in Platonis Phaedonem Commentaria, Leipzig: Teubner; L.G. Westerink, ed. (1976) The Greek Commentaries on Plato’s Phaedo, vol. I: Olympiodorus, Amsterdam: North-Holland Publishing Company.
  6. Life of Plato (= Introduction to the lectures on Plato’s Alcibiades): A. Westermann, ed. (1862) Olympiodori Vita Platonis in A. Westermann, Olympiodori, Ammonii, Iamblichi, Porphyrii et aliorum Vitae Platonis, Aristotelis, Pythagorae, Platoni et Isidori, Paris: Didot, pp. 1–4. See also the Alcibiades commentary, No. 3 above, pp. 1–9.

Apart from these works, we possess scholia from Olympiodorus’ commentary on Aristotle’s de Interpretatione in the Codex Vaticanus Urbinas Graecus 35. The mutilated anonymous commentary on the de Interpretatione extant in Codex Parisinus Graecus 2064 and edited by L. Tarán 1978 has been wrongly ascribed to Olympiodorus. The same holds for the commentary on Plato’s Philebus, which, although attributed to Olympiodorus, was shown by L. G. Westerink in 1959 as the work of Damascius.

Olympiodorus must have written a great deal more over his long career. He refers to a commentary on Porphyry’s Introduction (see in Cat. 16,26; 60,10; 68,15.17); David and Elias used it. There must have been commentaries on Aristotle’s Analytics (a late hand in the Jerusalem manuscript Taphos 150 attributes the commentary on the Prior Analytics contained therein to Olympiodorus) and on Aristotle’s physical treatises (commentaries on de Generatione et Corruptione and de Anima are mentioned in Arabic sources, and the Ambrosianus Q 74 possibly contains a fragment of the latter, see Rashed). In the Alcibiades commentary (§110,8f.), Olympiodorus announces lectures on the Sophist.

The work On the ‘On Activity’ by Zosimus. All That Has Been Said by Hermes and the Philosophers is commonly regarded as a spurious work (but see the nuanced interpretation of Viano 2021). For an edition see: Bertholet, M. and Ruelle, C.-M. (1888) Collection des anciens alchemistes grecs, vol. III, Paris: Steinheil, pp. 69–104. French translation in vol. II, pp. 75–113.

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