Paradox of Tragedy

First published Mon Jan 13, 2025

David Hume famously remarked on a curious response we have to certain works of art that cause us to feel unhappiness or distress:

It seems an unaccountable pleasure, which the spectators of a well-written tragedy receive from sorrow, terror, anxiety, and other passions, that are in themselves disagreeable and uneasy. The more they are touched and affected, the more are they delighted with the spectacle; and as soon as the uneasy passions cease to operate, the piece is at an end. (1757 [1987: 216])

This odd connection between the simultaneous pleasure and distress caused by tragic drama is remarked upon in Aristotle’s Poetics, the earliest philosophical attempt in the West to construct an aesthetic theory. The problem also features in later thinkers such as Burke (1757), Kant (1798; 7:241 [1996: 232]), Batteux (1746 [2015: 48]), Schopenhauer (1818; 1844: ch. 37), and Nietzsche (1886: 229; Price, 1998), but the framing of the contemporary focus on the problem is mainly inherited from Hume. After a preliminary attempt in Section 1 to precisely state the paradox, we will turn to various kinds of solutions in Sections 2 to 6.

1. Statement of the Paradox

At first glance, it shouldn’t be puzzling that works of art can elicit both pleasure and pain, for that conjunction arises in a wide range of ordinary non-aesthetic contexts. Frozen fingers, e.g., often come with playing in the snow. Hume’s enigma is that in certain artistic engagements our pleasure seems to be internally related to our distress. Pain is not merely a regrettable feature of the experience, the elimination of which, insofar as the pleasure remained, would be favored (Neill 1992: 153). Rather, for Hume, one would not derive certain characteristic pleasures from tragic dramas if they did not provoke their characteristic kinds of negative emotions qua negative emotions. It is the experience of negative emotions, not something that happens to cause or be caused by their elicitation, that matters for our pleasure. As he notes, audiences are “pleased in proportion as they are afflicted” (1757 [1987: 217]). Although we will refer to this conundrum as the paradox of tragedy, the condition it describes is instantiated in many different modes of artistic experience beyond the theater.

Thus, on the one hand, we often pursue and take pleasure in works of art in ways that are ostensibly explained by their elicitation of disagreeable feelings: fear of a movie’s monster, disgust over the simulated viscera in a painting, shock in playing a video game, cringing embarrassment for a television comedy’s heedless characters, alienation through punk rock, grief in listening to a threnody, disorientation entering into an installation, trauma in witnessing certain modes of performance art, and even boredom or acedia that, for example, are intentionally elicited in Andy Warhol’s eight-hour continuous footage of the Empire State Building filmed from a static point of view (Gilmore 2020: 157–158). On the other hand, such engagements do not conform to the prima facie plausible assumption that we tend not to pursue experiences for the distress, pain, annoyance, or other aversive feelings they engender, and that when we must undergo such experiences we do not positively value or take pleasure in those disagreeable dimensions. Indeed, it might be proposed to be an analytic truth that we don’t take pleasure in something in virtue of what makes it displeasing to us.

Before we consider alternative construals of the paradox, it is important to register that at least in Hume’s version the pains and pleasures of these kinds of artistic experiences aren’t easily accommodated in a pro tanto fashion. It seems right to say that in an ordinary case such as playing in the snow, we take pleasure in the experience insofar as it is diverting, an opportunity to be with friends, etc. and we feel discomfort in the experience insofar as our fingers begin to freeze and we shiver. No paradox would arise in our experience of tragic drama from its eliciting painful and pleasurable emotions that, analogously, are directed at respectively different objects (Ridley 2003). Some descriptions of the phenomenon thus eliminate its paradoxical air by identifying the distinct objects of pain and pleasure that have been unwittingly treated as one. By contrast, in Hume’s version of the puzzle, we do not disvalue tragedy insofar as it causes us pain and value it insofar as it gives us pleasure. Rather, the pain or distress a tragedy elicits seems itself positively valued (“unaccountably” so [1757: first line]). Further, that pain and pleasure seem to directly covary: at least within a restricted range, an increase in the former brings an increase in the latter.

Of course, mere covariance of pain and pleasure in some experience doesn’t always pose a conundrum. Suppose that as it gets colder, the quality of the snow in which children play improves. There, the pleasure of throwing snowballs and the pain of frozen digits bear a direct relationship, but only because they share a common condition or cause. Here, if the pain could be diminished without a loss in pleasure, that would be something participants desire. By contrast, Hume’s enigma is that we seem to want to suffer: we undergo some sort of positive emotion that is explained by our distress, not just by the circumstances by which the distress is caused. It is that dynamic that would make it odd to agree with the “Positive Opera Company”, in an April Fools Day parody aired on National Public Radio, that audiences are better off when tragic operas such as Don Giovanni and La Bohème are rewritten to provide happy endings (broadcast 1 April 2006). Or, in a genuine example, it would be a dubious claim that audiences have reason to prefer Nahum Tate’s 1681 version of King Lear over Shakespeare’s insofar as the revision eliminates the destruction of Lear and Cordelia that makes the original so distressing.

As we will see, the cases we wish to understand are highly variable: they, and the responses they elicit, may not fall into any natural class (Neill 1999: 124). Furthermore, one may wish to abjure references to pain and other constitutively embodied responses in contexts in which the distress is primarily constituted by psychological not somatic states (for a common concept of pain, see Raja et al. 2020). And to say that we suffer from a voluntary diversion such as attending the theater or streaming a film on tv can sound rather grandiose, at least when compared to real suffering people undergo in relation to non-imagined states of affairs. Allowing for those cavils, we can offer at least a preliminary attempt at a general characterization of the paradox, by saying that an experience has a negative affective valence in part or whole if it is one in which we feel pain or some other disagreeable emotion or feeling. And an experience has a positive affective valence if it is one in part or whole in which we feel pleasure or some agreeable emotion or feeling. The paradox can thus be stated as the conjunction of three individually plausible but jointly inconsistent propositions.

For some instance or form of art A:

  1. Properly appreciating A involves forming a mental state with a negative valence (Appreciation Condition)
  2. We do not take pleasure in forming a mental state with a negative valence (Coordination Condition)
  3. We take pleasure in properly appreciating A (Response Condition)

Although conditions 1–3 capture the structure of the puzzle, we should note that in the gloss on the paradox earlier, it was natural to refer to different kinds of attitudes being implicated beyond that of taking pleasure, viz, desiring and valuing. This reflects that there may be different formulations of the paradox employing reference to different attitudes—affective, conative, evaluative—which are taken to be central and in need of explanation.

Thus, the Appreciation Condition may be that a proper appreciation of A elicits

  • a displeasing experience; or,
  • a negative appraisal of the experience; or,
  • a desire that the experience not occur.

And the Response Condition may be that a proper appreciation of A furnishes

  • a pleasurable experience; or,
  • a positive appraisal of the experience; or
  • a desire that the experience occur.

Different formulations of the paradox may mix and match those different kinds of attitudes (e.g., pairing the unpleasantness of the experience with the desire that it occur). Yet, not all such conjunctions necessarily evince a puzzling conflict. In other words, not all such pairings lend themselves to a plausible statement of the Coordination Condition. For example, as those with substance addictions would avow, to desire does not entail to positively appraise, and so a worrying over whether there is a consistency between those attitudes of those different kinds, when expressed about any particular thing, can sometimes be otiose.

Even when we restrict the operative attitude to one kind (whether emotions, desires, or appraisals) two such attitudes toward the same object can coherently disagree, as we saw above, in virtue of being pro tanto, or directed at the object from a different perspective. Taking pleasure in one’s child leaving for college isn’t inconsistent with feeling sadness over her departure from home. Mixed emotions and incompatible desires are a common feature of affective experience (Greenspan 1980; Larsen & McGraw 2014). Note, however, it would be too quick to assume any pairing of attitudes that belong to different kinds is thereby rationally benign; for that would prejudge the question of whether a given attitude-kind imposes rational or psychological constraints on another. Some philosophers argue, for example, that a desire for x presents x as valuable or “good” (e.g., Stampe 1987). Some psychological theories of the emotions construe at least some of them as expressions of desires (Green 1992; Gordon 1987). And, finally, emotions themselves have characteristic somatic, cognitive, expressive, behavioral, and phenomenological dimensions that can make particular emotional pairings psychologically and physically difficult to sustain (Cowen & Keltner 2017).

Furthermore, the statements of the paradox carry an implicit assumption that negative and positive valences exist on a single continuum, such that the more positively valenced an experience is, the less negatively valenced it must be. But there are empirical reasons to suspect that this relation does not hold, at least in the case of the valence of pleasure. Rather, some work in the psychology of affective experience suggests that the two measures are orthogonal to one another (Norris et al. 2010). If this is so, it would render the co-presence of the two responses less curious. But it would then raise the question of why, if Hume is right, the two independent responses seem to covary (assuming there is no common cause)—“The more they are touched and affected, the more are they delighted with the spectacle” (1757 [1987: 216]).

Finally, a distinction elided in the above pairings is that between construing the paradox in descriptive and normative terms. Descriptively, the problem rests on the assumption that as an empirical matter we usually do not take pleasure in pain, but with tragic art forms we do. Normatively, the problem rests on the assumption that we ought not to take pleasure in pain, but with some of the arts, a successful appreciation means we should. As we will see, the descriptive construal is threatened by the wide variety of contexts in which indeed we do seem to take pleasure in pain. Meanwhile, the normative construal is threatened by the difficulty in providing a convincing interpretation of that “ought”. Is pursuing painful experiences or garnering pleasure from pain practically irrational; a failure of fit or aptness of our emotions for their objects (i.e., where the formal object of pleasure isn’t something that causes pain); defective with respect to the evolved function of pain (as a signal of current or immanent injury and elicitor of avoidance behavior); a misconstrual of the objective value of the relevant artistic experiences; or perhaps in some other way unmerited or dysfunctional? Augustine calls that pleasure in grief that we experience while watching tragic drama a “wretched madness” (Confessions Book 3, chapter II) but why it is irrational or “mad” to have that experience is not explained.

In what follows, we will focus on the paradox of tragedy construed solely in descriptive terms, and, for economy’s sake, confine our attention to solutions that see the paradox in Hume’s terms, as, at least prima facie, involving a puzzling mixture of painful and pleasurable emotions. For a version of the paradox construed solely in terms of desires, see Currie (2010). The following draws partly from the typology of solutions outlined in Levinson (2014b: xii).

2. Compensatory Solutions

One major approach to the paradox introduces reasons for why, despite what appears to be our usual disposition to avoid pain and distress, we may be rationally motivated to pursue experiences of art that elicit disagreeable feelings. Such compensatory approaches thus acknowledge the negative valence and undesirability of the feelings we have while experiencing tragedies (and relevantly similar art forms), but contend that we choose to undergo those feelings for the sake of realizing some sufficiently valuable good. Here, the disagreeable dimension of an artistic experience is not positively estimated qua disagreeable dimension, but only for its contribution to some specifiable benefit. Compensatory solutions might initially seem to dissolve even the appearance of a paradox, as it is hardly surprising to note that pain is sometimes the price we pay for pleasure. Yet, we don’t speak of, e.g., the “paradox of dentistry”. How is tragedy, and other painful art, different? Compensatory solutions tend to answer through highlighting ways in which the benefits of such art forms are in principle not realizable independently of our undergoing their characteristic modes of causing distress.

2.1 Hedonic Compensation

One such benefit that could render the experience of disagreeable dimensions of an art form worthwhile is aesthetic pleasure. Thus a common approach, motivated by Hume’s essay, is that we suffer in response to the content of the tragic representation but feel pleasure in response to its formal features (Yanal 1991: 76; Eaton 1989). The thought behind such hedonic compensatory theories is that I feel pain in imaginatively representing the contents of a play, but pleasure in such things as the play’s plot, language, scenery, costuming, and the actors’ performances. That pleasure is provided in a sufficient quantity or degree to justify undergoing that pain. This solution thus treats the proper appreciation of a work of art as comprised of two distinct affective experiences, each with its own object: the represented content, and the medium or mode of representation. Our experience of that content—e.g., through imagining that the represented state of affairs is real—is posited to cause us pain. At the same time, our experience of the work’s medium or mode of representation—e.g., through seeing its beauty or evaluating its plot—is said to give us pleasure. Thus, noting the pleasure elicited by a painter’s achievement of verisimilitude, Aristotle remarks that “objects which in themselves we view with pain, we delight to contemplate when reproduced with minute fidelity” (Poetics IV). Although intuitively compelling, the problem with this approach is that it is exceedingly difficult to speak of our experience of form or content as separable from the other in a way that is consistent with artistic appreciation.

Let us take a literary fiction as an illustration. In principle we can refer solely to aspects of its content—what is fictionally true in the work, or how it represents the world as being. And, in principle, we can refer solely to aspects of its form—calling attention to its tone, verbal style, names of characters, plot structure, and so on. However, even a minimal experience of the work’s content will be inflected by the work’s form. This is so because the contents of a literary fiction are in part constituted by how they are represented. Thus, for example, Peter Lamarque (2007: 121; 2014) notes that the features of shallowness and ostentation that Dickens invokes in the name of the Veneerings in Our Mutual Friend, are intrinsic qualities of those characters themselves. Here, one’s experience of the work’s content (the fictional characters) is inflected by the work’s form (their names and the tone in which they are described). Of course, the text of, specifically, a tragic drama exists prior to the play being performed. However, even there we can speak of the represented content of the performance as inflected by its form, as we compare, e.g., one actor’s Hamlet to another, or the staging of the play in traditional dress versus contemporary clothes. The mistake is to assume that form and content refer to two distinct experiences of the object of our appreciation. But there is only one experience of the work of art: the experience of the content-given-form.

A proponent of the view in question might then respond that what causes our pleasure is not merely the form of tragedy but its content-as-represented. We don’t take pleasure in the mere content: e.g., that Lear holds the murdered Cordelia, we take pleasure in the particular way in which the play (actors, staging, etc.) represents that event. But if such content-given-form is supposed to explain our pleasure, then what explains our distress? It cannot be the content itself, because we have no access to content, except as it is inflected by a given form. Similar problems beset attempts to treat the different objects of our pain and pleasure as, respectively, the sad content of tragedy and its artistry, for any full description of the artistry of a work would require reference to what that content is—what events and states of affairs are represented by the work. At best, one could say that certain formal features of a tragedy offer pleasure in themselves, independent of their role in being constituents of the manner by which the tragedy’s content is represented. Aspects of lighting, costume, stage sets, music, movement, voice, etc., might be pleasurable in themselves, perhaps thereby compensating for displeasure caused by a plot. Yet, this approach leaves open the following question: why do audiences often prefer to attend tragic dramas over alternative theatrical productions with none of the tragedy’s distress-inducing contents? Comedies are not always chosen over tragedies even if they offer the same formal rewards. We’ll return to that question below, after considering some other versions of and objections to the compensatory pleasures account.

Note, it is an independent question whether the distinction between form and content as the respective targets of our feelings might explain the puzzle of why people seem to take pleasure in the non-fictional contents of a representation of awful events, for there the events are not constituted by how they are represented. Sometimes the distress caused by thinking of the events under one description can be counterposed against the pleasure caused by thinking of them under another description, where different framings impose different patterns of saliencies on the shared content. One might take pleasure in a historical account of a medieval method of torture that highlights its bizarre and outlandish brutality but be discomfited by an account that makes vivid the excruciating suffering of its victim. By contrast, tragic dramas typically don’t license alternative points of view from which, respectively, their contents elicit pleasure and distress.

Some critics of compensatory theories centered on pleasure dispute the phenomenology such theories impute to the experience of painful art. Specifically, they dispute the very claim that people feel pleasure in experiencing such works. Rather, they note, people often describe their engagements with tragic dramas and the like as, “on the whole, painful, distressing, gut-wrenching, and emotionally devastating, not as on balance pleasurable” (Smuts 2014: 124; see also Andrade & Cohen 2007).

In response, a defender of a hedonic compensatory view might propose that such reports should not be taken at face value. For a natural response to believing or perceiving a tragic event has occurred would be to feel sympathy for its victim; for their suffering to linger on in one’s mind; to recall the event with sadness. But such reactions do not typically accompany merely imagining that such an event occurred. If our putative expressions of pity for a fictional character don’t have the behavioral profile of feeling pity for actual people, perhaps we don’t suffer for them the way we think we do.

2.2 Hedonic Meta-Response

The hedonic meta-response theory offers a different critique of hedonic compensatory theories: that their defect is not in their appeal to pleasure per se, but where they locate it in our engagements with distressing works. The claim here is that we don’t feel pleasure in the first-order experience of a tragic or distressing work, but rather feel that pleasure as part of a second-order to that first-order response. Here, pain is necessary for pleasure because the pleasure is given in a meta-response to the pain. Thus, Rafael De Clercq (2014), for example, notes the pleasure we may take in recognizing that a work is such as to evoke, or has evoked, a negatively-valenced emotion, even if we don’t take pleasure in experiencing that emotion. For empirical studies supporting that relation between first-order experience of aversive experience, and pleasure in one’s meta-cognitive response to the experience, see Rozin and others (2013).

Why might audiences feel pleasure as part of such a meta-response? One proposal is that the experience makes salient one’s humanity; that one shares with all others a susceptibility to feelings of sadness, loneliness, fear, and the like (Levinson 1982; Feagin 1983). Another is that we may take pleasure in recognizing the work’s achievement in having elicited those emotions in us. A third is that our pleasure comes from having an opportunity to explore the nature of our suffering, without the motivation to alleviate it given that it isn’t a genuine indication of the bad things that typically accompany suffering in real life

it becomes possible for us to savor the feeling for its special character, since we are for once spared the additional distress that accompanies its occurrence in the context of life. (Levinson 1982: 325)

A fourth proposal, advanced by Susan Feagin is that our pleasurable meta-response consists in recognizing our virtue. Specifically, we have a first-order painful response arising from our sympathy with or pity for the victims of a tragic drama, and second-order response, in which we take pleasure in recognizing how we felt in that first-order response. Feagin writes,

We find ourselves to be the kind of people who respond negatively to villainy, treachery, and injustice. This discovery, or reminder, is something which, quite justly, yields satisfaction. (1983: 98)

One worry about such accounts of pleasure that locate it in a self-reflexive meta-response is that they seem to call into question the genuineness of our concern for others that is part of the first-order response. Because of its self-reflexivity, the pleasure we take in having that concern seems to stem not from being the kind of person who, e.g., feels pity and sympathy toward others, but from thinking of oneself as virtuous in that way. Indeed, choosing to attend a tragic drama for the sake of that pleasure casts doubt on the sincerity of one’s pity or sympathy for tragic characters—for pity and sympathy are not emotions one chooses to experience for the sake of some personal end. In his Lettre à d’Alembert, Rousseau proposes that, far from nurturing in us a genuine capacity for sympathy outside aesthetic contexts, the best tragedies only function to

reduce all the duties of man to some passing and sterile emotions that have no consequences, [except] to make us applaud … our humanity in pitying the ills that we could have cured. (1758 [1960: 25])

An alternative objection is that there are likely many people who lack moral goodness but who respond with pity and sympathy to the fates of tragic characters. Perhaps their experience shows that we would be wrong to infer from our feeling pleasure in recognizing our pity for characters in a drama, to how we would feel for those in comparable states of affairs in real life. In other words, while our meta-response to our feelings for fictions might give us pleasure, we would be unjustified in characterizing that meta-response as a recognition of a genuine capacity for pity. Augustine disputes a similar claim that our pleasure in tragedy derives from the feeling of compassion we have for its protagonists. Such mercy would imply a desire that the sorrows of characters be eliminated, yet, as he notes, spectators desire that they be continued—taking pleasure in one’s own sadness, one “sheds tears of joy” (Confessions Book 6).

Another challenge, which we’ll look at more closely below in the discussion of the distancing approach, arises from a general relation that theorists of fiction have proposed between the absorption one experiences in engaging with a fiction and the degree to which one experiences self-awareness or self-conscious attention to one’s experience. The proposal is that the relation is indirect: the more one is self-conscious, the less one is absorbed, or “transported” into a fiction, and the less one experiences typical effects of fictions such as emotional engagement. The problem this raises for the meta-response theory is that a meta-response calls for such self-consciousness—hence for a diminution in the absorption that is typically a precondition of fiction-directed emotions. So the solution would seem to propose that the very experience that gives us pleasure results in a weakening of that pleasure’s causal condition.

Some plausible responses would be that our meta-response and absorption are not constant but alternate, i.e., we flip back and forth from attention to the contents of the story as if they were real to our own response to the story in which it is explicitly acknowledged as fictional. An alternative suggestion is that absorption dominates the experience of the work but the pleasure in meta-response to that experience takes hold once our engagement with the story has concluded (e.g., when the play ends). The plausibility of these solutions can be addressed in part by how well they characterize the phenomenology of our experience of works such as tragedies. The verdict here is unclear.

In any case, it shouldn’t be disputed that sometimes we feel pleasure in virtue of a second order response to a first order response. One might laugh over the excessive fear one felt during a roller coaster ride, or one’s nervousness before a big date. Analogous relations can hold as one reflects on one’s weeping during a sad film, as one finds it curious how susceptible one is to having emotions triggered by what one knows to be fictional, or how automatic tendencies to feel and behave certain ways expose the faults in one’s dignified image of oneself as having top-down cognitive control over such reactions.

Other candidates for the hedonic return in enduring tragedy’s characteristic forms of distress include the pleasure of relief, once the unfolding of the story that sustains the distress has reached an end, and the pleasure of one’s sense of one’s comparative wellbeing in not being subject to the misfortunes of an aversive fiction’s protagonists (Lear 1988). Lucretius identifies the general dynamic:

’tis sweet
To mark what evils we ourselves be spared;
’Tis sweet, again, to view the mighty strife
Of armies battled yonder o’er the plains,
Ourselves no sharers in the peril. (De rerum natura Book II, 5– 9).

See Dadlez (2004: 222) for the potentially broad scope of Hume’s reference to pleasure, where it is associated with a wide variety of distinct kinds of passions, including relief and hope.

2.3 Non-Hedonic Compensation

Approaches that reject the exclusively hedonistic flavor of compensatory theories note that some of the goods afforded by aversive works of art can be sufficiently compensatory without being pleasurable. More precisely, such theories allow that tragedy can cause us to feel pleasure, but that is through offering us a distinct kind of good, the possession of which is itself valuable, and not just as a source of pleasure or satisfaction. Such theorists deny the assumption of the response condition. Thus, Aaron Ridley remarks,

There is … no reason at all to imagine that the value and importance of tragic drama must ultimately derive from its capacity to please. And that, surely, is just as well, since successful tragic drama—think of Lear, think of Oedipus—is simply not all that pleasing. (2003: 413; see also Budd 1995)

2.3.1 Heightened Experience

One candidate for a value distinct from pleasure is mere affective stimulation. The thought here is that is we sometimes value experiences that provoke us to strong feelings, extreme affective states that may be valuable just because they are unusual in ordinary humdrum life (which of course does not presume that any affective state that is unusual is for that reason valuable).

Hume (1757) considers L’Abbe Dubos’s argument for that proposal that it is the mere desire for heightened experience, whether positive or negative, that motivates us to be audiences for tragic drama:

No matter what the passion is: Let it be disagreeable, afflicting, melancholy, disordered; it is still better than that insipid languor, which arises from perfect tranquility and repose. (1757 [1987: 217])

His objection, however, is that, as we saw earlier, our positive affect in engaging with a tragic drama is a result of exposure to its events-as-represented, not to the events themselves:

It is certain, that the same object of distress, which pleases in a tragedy, were it really set before us, would give the most unfeigned uneasiness; though it be then the most effectual cure to languor and indolence. (1757 [1987: 218])

A related proposal is that what we take pleasure in is not the extreme state of fear, sadness, disgust, and so on, but an aspect of those states that is not intrinsically unpleasant (Morreal 1985). Thus some kinds of fear involve a feeling of excitement, and we may take pleasure in that aspect of, e.g., riding a rollercoaster, without being said to take pleasure in all aspects of the fear that event may cause, such as a feeling of tightness in one’s chest.

Smuts (2007) argues for what he calls the rich experience theory which holds that audiences desire such works in part for the intrinsic value of the experiences they offer. These are experiences one cannot typically undergo in ordinary life without paying serious psychic or physical costs. By “rich experience” Smuts means experiences that are “cognitively, sensorily, and affectively engaging” (2014: 132). Here, the painful experience is not, alone, valuable, so much as it is partly constitutive of experiences that are valuable.

2.3.2 Cognitive Value

Other goods relate to the cognitive benefits, broadly understood, of the experience of tragic drama. Thus, it has been proposed (most famously in association with the obscure notion of “catharsis”) that tragedies offer spectators an opportunity to clarify their emotions. On interpretations of Aristotle’s notion of catharsis, see Nehamas (1994); on the ambiguity of the concept, see K. Bennett (1981) and Lear (1988). The proper understanding and existence of catharsis is controversial (Shelley 2003). But a plausible construction of the idea is that we come to learn about some of our emotions when their expression is elicited by highly affecting works of art, in the case of tragedies specifically by the “release” of the negative emotions of fear and pity that comes with the narrative resolution of the plot. There, the expression of our emotions does not leave them unchanged; rather, they are exposed, fine-tuned, and given a salient form when arising in conformity to a work of tragedy’s prescriptions for how to feel. For the view that emotions can be brought into perspicuity through their expression, see Collingwood (1938: 109–11) and Gilmore (2011). Another cognitive benefit is an intrinsically valuable enlightenment about the nature of suffering. Flint Schier (1989) thus discusses how an artistic representation may allow us a more objective understanding of such things as distress and pain, and more broadly, the nature of our and other’s human predicament, than would our witnessing actual distress. For example, in the case of an actual event, our concern for our own safety might obscure our understanding of the depth and character of the suffering of others. Schier argues that we desire such knowledge because it is intrinsically valuable, and thus take pleasure in acquiring it (see also Shelley 2003). Relatedly, Kames proposes that tragedy helps to enhances our sympathy and (thereby) strengthens our virtues (1751: Essay i, 49–50). Hutcheson, by contrast, notes the satisfaction we take in morally approving the virtuous dispositions of characters in a tragedy in response to the struggles they face (1725: ii, 6.7, 240–241).

A third non-hedonic value is an opportunity afforded by tragic works of art to contemplate and better come to understand our own vulnerability to loss. Referring to the last point in his discussion of Shakespeare’s tragedies, Samuel Johnson writes that

the reflection that strikes the heart is not, that the evils before us are real evils, but that they are evils to which we ourselves may be exposed. (1765: 77–78)

Other cognitive approaches suggest that the benefits offered by painful emotions pertain to understanding the work of art itself. Thus, Goodman (1968 [1976: 248–52]), treats both negative and positive emotions as potential modes of sensitivity to a work—helping discern properties of it that a colder dispassionate appraisal would miss. Maybe there is a point conveyed by a work to which we remain uncomprehending unless sufficiently attuned to it via the focus on it engendered by being in a particular emotional state.

Relatedly, Korsmeyer (2011) endorses what she identifies as a “conversionary account” (see Section 5 below). In her view, the disgust and fear we feel for some representations are not transformed into different, pleasurable emotions, but rather serve (are “put to use”) in the attainment of aesthetically or otherwise valuable responses to that representation (2011: 132). For example, disgust and fear elicited by a representation can heighten attentive absorption (2011: 132) in that thing. And “death”, she writes, “is realized differently in the experience of disgust” (2011: 134), suggesting that there is epistemic value peculiar to an experience that is realized through its elicitation of disfavored feelings. Rather than demonstrating a conversion of negative feelings, this account is better characterized as identifying a compensation that they lead to, viz, the achievement of such things as attentive absorption for which we undergo fear and disgust; or the realization of an overall pleasurable whole, of which the negative emotions are parts. See a related proposal in Todd (2014) that our awareness of a fiction qua fiction shapes the negative emotions that its contents elicit, and those negative emotions in turn strengthen and focus our attention to those contents.

A final candidate for a quasi-cognitive good is the satisfaction of curiosity or achievement of understanding. The thought here is the understanding gained in satisfying our curiosity is itself valuable (cognitively so) and is pleasing to obtain. Indeed, just as the pleasure of slaking one’s thirst helps motivate the search for life-sustaining hydration, the pleasure of achieving understanding is part of what helps motivate our efforts to realize and garner its intrinsic value. Aristotle notes in the Poetics that “we enjoy looking at the most exact portrayals of things whose actual sight is painful to us” (Poetics IV; he refers to pictures of corpses as an example) and explains this pleasure as arising from the knowledge acquired in viewing such representations. See the more contemporary account by Carroll on the role of disgust in horror films (1990: 184–5) where our pleasure is not in the disgust itself but in the disclosure of the unknown—the monster—of which disgust is a predictable concomitant.

One concern with the cognitive account is whether the putative cognitive benefits are sufficiently strong to compensate for the displeasures of tragedy. If we learn something largely propositional from tragic or other disturbing works of art, it isn’t clear why we tend to see them again and again. If learning such and such explains why we endure the pain a tragedy causes, this wrongly suggests that seeing the tragedy a second time somehow deprives it of its compensatory value—since we already know what it teaches. Perhaps a response is that we learn something more completely or differently with subsequent viewings. Although this criticism is drawn from generally applicable anti-cognitive approaches to the arts, it takes on a special plausibility in the case of tragic drama which, unlike, e.g., novels, we often see in several iterations.

Another objection addresses an ambiguity faced by cognitive accounts over whether the compensation tragedy offers is the value of understanding, or merely the value of having the feeling of gaining understanding. If, as some of the cognitive compensatory approaches note, it isn’t for the sake of the cognitive benefit, but for the sake of the pleasures associated with those cognitive benefits, that we submit ourselves to the unpleasant emotions of tragedy, how important is it that those cognitive benefits be genuine?

Jonathan Lear (1988) identifies, for example, one of the goods of tragedy as being the consolation it offers in explaining that when bad things happen to good people, those occurrences are intelligible and explicable: they do not “occur in a world which is in itself ultimately chaotic and meaningless” (1988: 325). Yet, as Aristotle observes, what is important in a well-formed tragedy is that events appear plausible or credible, not that they actually are (Poetics XXIV). The appearance of explaining this consoling fact takes precedence over actually imparting knowledge of how the world works, at least in Aristotle’s estimation of what best generates artistic value. Perhaps what matters is not that we learn from tragedy, but that we have the satisfying feeling of having learned. If that is true of the supposed cognitive values found in tragedy then at least some versions of the cognitive theory collapse into the hedonistic theory. We value the feeling of learning something occasioned by the experience of fictions; that we actually learn something is not necessary for that feeling to arise. A natural counter to this reduction of cognitive to hedonistic accounts would be to note that while one may take as much pleasure in merely seeming to learn as in actually learning from a work of art, it is the pleasure of the latter experience that explains the possibility of the pleasure of the former. Just as we find pleasant the sweetness of artificial sweeteners only because we are disposed to find pleasant the taste of actual sugar, so any cases of delight we take in seeming to learn must be understood against a broader background in which we take pleasure because we actually learn.

2.3.3 Meaning and Function

A last kind of compensatory approach points to the ways in which certain experiences are meaningful to us in part in virtue of the pain or distress they involve, without any implication that such pain or distress is otherwise intrinsically or instrumentally valuable (Bloom 2021).

Why should the pain an experience causes accrue to its meaningfulness? Multiple explanations suggest themselves. From an evolutionary perspective, that a given achievement involves suffering may reveal it as a “costly signal” of the virtues or desires of the achiever. The distress an activity causes may serve to distinguish those who really value or need it (and thus are willing to endure its associated pain) from those for whom the activity is relatively unimportant, and thus something they’d pursue only at a low cost. For a discussion of how deliberate self-harm might serve as a “costly-signal” see Hagen, Watson, and Hammerstein (2008). For discussion, see Bloom (2021: 64). These explanations tend to focus on how the willingness to undergo pain redounds to the authenticity of an emotion or sincerity of an expressed desire for the experience in which the pain is elicited.

Related explanations posit certain functions, of which one is typically unaware, in the pursuit of negative emotions through art. Mar and Oatley (2008), for example, describes fiction as having the function of social simulation. It is perhaps true that horror fiction appears to rely on the same mental architecture as actual experiences in producing its effects on our emotions and body. And perhaps aversive fiction causes or enables an ability to learn from and deal with genuine threats, losses, and other setbacks to our interests via simulation, but that doesn’t explain why we take pleasure in it or pursue it. We would need to posit another explanatory factor here that says that we desire (unconsciously?) to do things that further our capacities, e.g., of responding to things that make us suffer. “Function” here is used only in an evolutionary sense—i.e., in the sense in which the psychological disposition to have such experiences (pleasure from pain or fear) was acquired in part because it helped to produce beings like us. Alternative accounts favor an explanation that appealed to exaptation. The appeal to evolution speaks only to the question of how our cognitive and emotional makeup makes such experiences possible, not why now, in the present day, we ought to desire these experiences.

An important point about most compensatory approaches is that, although drawing on Hume’s introduction of the problem, they construe the paradox in ways that depart from the Scottish philosopher’s terms. Hume posits an internal relation between the disagreeable and agreeable responses engendered by tragedy. The preceding compensatory approaches, by contrast, treat the negative aspects of a work of art as merely a necessary cost to be entered into an overall accounting of the net value of experiencing a work of art. In that approach, the negative dimension of a work is not valued as such; instead, it is valued only insofar as it plays a role in producing the positive dimensions. If one could do away with the sadness a tragedy causes us to feel while preserving the enlightenment the play affords, the value of the experience would be the same or increased. Some solutions that appeal to the pleasures of tragedy exemplify this. Delight in spectacle does not require the spectacle being produced through rebarbative events.

The exceptions are compensatory approaches (what Levinson [2014b: xii] calls “organicist”) in which the connection between the negative and positive dimensions of the experience is tighter and the latter is directly dependent on the former (presumably only within certain ranges). Earlier, we saw an objection to solutions to the paradox that say that, in a pro tanto manner, we take pleasure in the formal or aesthetic dimensions of a tragedy and feel pain about its content. The objection was that this implies that if we could experience the formal aspects of tragedy in a work that caused us no pain, we would prefer that to the tragedy. While this is of course sometimes the case, it is implausible to posit it as a general rule. We do often choose tragedies over comedies, without assuming the latter is deficient in its formal values. A rejoinder here is the proposal that the pain that tragic drama causes possesses a particular character, making the experience of that pain a precondition for realizing tragedy’s particular compensatory good. That good, in other words, cannot be furnished by a work without tragedy’s distressing dimension. In one such proposal, for example, it is only in and through the suffering elicited by tragedy that we contemplate our vulnerability to loss. In another proposal certain aesthetic or experiential values can be realized only in our encounters with such works (Budd 1995). The suffering we experience in watching a tragedy might, for example, have cognitive value both in the familiar sense in that it allows us to learn about the suffering of others, or to enhance our capacity for empathy, and the more interesting sense in which certain insights may be available to us only through our suffering. Sadness might, for example impose an otherwise inaccessible pattern of saliency on what we see and on our relation to it.

Of course, tragedy’s characteristic benefits may be multiple and the theories cited above are not always mutually-exclusive in characterizing the good that comes with the bad. However, a more elaborate mapping of the logical space of such solutions would ask to what extent a given theory excludes another, either by making the latter explanation otiose, or denying the description of the phenomena the latter assumes to be true.

3. Contextual Solutions

Some explanations don’t so much identify the reasons for which we desire to experience disagreeable art, as identify the conditions under which we are able to have those experiences. Two such conditions are distance and control.

3.1 Distance

It’s often claimed of the artistic medium in which tragic stories are told that it allows us to experience their content in a safely “distanced” form, one that prevents us from suffering as we would if we were witness to an analogous state of affairs outside of that artistic context. As Edmund Burke (1757) notes in his remarks on the sublime,

When danger or pain press too nearly, they are incapable of giving any delight, and are simply terrible; but at certain distances, and with certain modifications, they may be, and they are delightful, as we every day experience. (part 1 section VII)

In his essay on the Laocoon (1766), Gotthold Ephraim Lessing suggests that beauty can have such a distancing effect when he argues that because artists understood it would have been too painful for audiences to confront a fully realistic representation of the suffering involved in the story, they represented that story in a beautiful form.

Accounts of such distancing identify a condition, perhaps a necessary one, under which an experience of tragic drama can be pleasurable, but not why it is pleasurable. Answers to that latter question may appeal to a wide variety of considerations explaining why we enjoy a given art form, many of them listed in Section 2.1.

That there is a metaphorical distance between audiences and what they are prompted to imagine by a fictional representation makes intuitive sense. One can’t intervene in a play’s state of affairs to change its outcome; one can’t be physically harmed by the events that a novel prompts us to visualize. And, even highly vivid fiction-directed imaginings don’t typically cause us to believe that what we mentally represent is genuinely before us. In one kind of account, emotions that are too raw, too overwhelming, or too powerful to endure when experienced unmediated, are better contained when experienced via the psychological and practical “remove” audiences have toward fictional representations. See the discussion in Robinson (2005) on “Formal Devices as Coping Mechanisms” and the idea of a “protective frame” furnished by knowledge of a situation’s fictionality in Apter (1992). Without such distancing, powerful emotions can get in the way of the experience of pleasure that audiences can take in features of the artistic representation. Likewise, such powerful emotions can prevent us from achieving the various forms of insight and understanding for which we value and pursue the experience of such works. In a representative example of this approach, Menninghaus and his collaborators (2017) draw on substantial empirical literature in psychology to argue that only via the activation of certain distancing processes, such as one’s being made aware of a film’s fictional status, can there arise certain embracing processes via which audiences experience pleasures deriving from such things as “an interplay between positive and negative emotions”; one’s attention to a piece’s artistry; and the social dimensions of one’s sharing with others the experience of the work. Distancing processes

keep negative emotions at some psychological distance, thereby safeguarding the hedonic expectations of art reception against being inevitably compromised by the experience of negative emotions. (2017: 3)

In other words, distancing prevents the negative emotions from getting in the way of the positive emotions that would otherwise emerge in one’s experience of a work.

Yet, despite its familiarity, there are conceptual problems with employing the idea of distancing in a solution to the paradox of tragedy. These problems emerge when we try to unpack what is literally asserted when one says tragedies distance audiences from the horrible states of affairs they represent. Let us suppose that what is meant by distancing is a kind of moderation or subduing of an otherwise extreme emotional response. To say we are distanced by a factor such as fictionality is to say that we feel an emotion with less intensity than we otherwise would if such fictionality were not present. We are then able to avail ourselves of those pleasures and other benefits of tragedy whose emergence would be frustrated by emotions that are more extreme. One objection to such an account calls into question the very premise that audiences for tragic drama and the like are distanced in that emotion-subduing way that the explanation proposes. For, prima facie, audiences of tragic fictions do experience powerfully painful emotions, Having such affective experiences does not impede their pleasure, but, if Hume is right, enhances it. An inverse of that objection is that, as Hume notes, under certain conditions we can take pleasure in non-fictional representations of awful things, even though confronting them directly would cause us distress. There is no assumption of fictionality in Cicero’s oratory of terrible events, yet in his eloquence, Hume writes,

the uneasiness of the melancholy passions is not only overpowered and effaced by something stronger of an opposite kind; but the whole impulse of those passions is converted into pleasure, and swells the delight which the eloquence raises in us. (1757 [1987: 220])

A more significant problem may be found in the claim that we can speak of the same emotion, whether it is experienced unmediated or in a manner that involves putative distancing. For to adopt a distanced attitude toward someone for whom one feels anguished pity is not to continue to feel anguished pity, just “at a distance”. It is to feel something else altogether, or not to feel at all. The distancing approach does not explain how we can endure feeling an emotion of the same kind and quality toward a fictional state of affairs but not toward an analogous real state of affairs. It elides, instead, two categorically different emotions—one that is weak, short-lived, potentially dis-passionate, and one that is overwhelming or otherwise so powerful as to block any pleasures that the occasion might allow. Claiming that the affective or phenomenological character of the emotion we feel for a fiction is different from that which we feel for like affairs in real life can suggest a solution to the paradox. Specifically, it would be to reject the appreciation condition—the claim that properly appreciating an artwork of the relevant kind causes one to feel serious distress. However, that solution comes at the considerable cost of denying the presence of the aversive feelings we experience in watching painful art that makes the appreciation condition plausible in the first place.

An alternative objection to the distancing approach is that it improperly locates the source of the putative ameliorative effect that fictionality has on our emotions. For, as noted earlier, many non-fictional representations can elicit pleasure through, or along with, causing distress. Even as their contents cause feelings of distress, pity, and disgust, we sometimes enjoy reading of such things as historical narratives of violent battles, tabloid reports of gruesome deaths, and seeing beautiful or otherwise compelling photographs of abject and suffering individuals, natural disasters, cities in ruins, and other subjects we would not take pleasure in seeing face-to-face. Perhaps the distancing model must dispense with the distinction between fictions and nonfictions, and help itself instead to a different distinction, such as that between representational and confrontational contexts (Matravers 2014). Here, fictionality, as such, is not what explains our capacity to take pleasure in painful experiences, rather being fictional is only one of many ways in which a state of affairs can be something into which we cannot intervene and cannot be practically affected by.

Finally, the distancing approach attributes a mental state to audiences that is at odds with the mental state briefly referred to in Section 2.2 that at least prima facie appears to be a precondition of a fiction causing intense feelings: imaginative immersion. Sometimes called absorption or fictional transportation, imaginative immersion describes an engagement with the contents of a fictional representation typified by several dimensions: inter alia, selective and sustained attention; a fluency in access to and processing of information supplied by one’s attention; cognitive, affective, and behavioral responses that are experienced as endogenously elicited by the contents of the representation, rather than by the representational vehicle itself; and, a diminished self-consciousness or meta-reflective attention to those responses (Gerrig 1993; Green & Brock 2002; Mazzocco et al. 2010).

Plausibly, a fictional story can cause us to feel aversive emotions only when we are absorbed in its content (as opposed to, say, immersed in the second order experience of performing a literary analysis). But if this is true, it is hard to see how the distancing approach can claim both that we can experience such aversive emotions and be aware of ourselves as removed from the state of affairs represented by the fiction. The absorption condition says that only by audiences being imaginatively immersed in the state of affairs a tragedy represents can it have its characteristic effects, while the distancing condition says we experience the pain and pleasure of tragedy only when understanding ourselves as being at a good remove from that state of affairs. Hence, the distancing and immersion approaches represent competing pictures of our mental states during artistic engagements.

Although different explanations of the paradox of tragedy may offer distinct, yet complementary, causes for the phenomenon, we can see how the distancing approach stands as a direct competitor to compensatory solutions. Compensatory approaches like those in Section 2 take the strength of the negatively valenced emotion aroused by a disturbing work of art to require some positively-valenced emotion, or other valuable property for the whole experience of the work of art to be sought after and valued. But if distancing eliminates or reduces the awfulness of some fiction state of affairs, no such or less such compensation is required to understand why the fiction as a whole is desirable. To the extent that distancing has the effect its proponents say, the compensatory solutions become otiose.

3.2 Control

The second kind of condition under which it is proposed that tragedies can be pleasurable is control. Because I know that I can stop or modify my experience of painful art, the pain is less severe, or acquires a different valence than it has in ordinary contexts. Specifically, under such a condition one source of the badness of pain is eliminated: one’s not knowing that it can be controlled. Control in this sense is broader than and can include the dimension of distancing described earlier: specifically, according to the control theory, if one believes one cannot distance oneself from the phenomenon then one cannot take pleasure in it.

Theorists who propose that a control condition operates in our experience of tragic drama stress the greater degree of power we have over the pain caused by works of art than over the pain caused by ordinary experience (see Eaton 1982; Morreall 1985). Specifically, we can enjoy tragic and other sorts of aversive works of art when we are aware we can direct our thoughts and actions vis-à-vis the work in question. Theorists argue that such control limits or changes the character of the putative painfulness of some works of art, such that the pain at issue doesn’t generate the paradox that a desire for, or valuing of, ordinary pain would. One way such control is manifested is in our awareness, when experiencing negative affect vis-à-vis art, that the story belongs to a genre in which it is typical for all things to work out in the end. One may also simply infer a happy ending from what one knows about a work, as one’s sadness over the life-threatening illness of a television character is made tolerable by one’s knowledge that a series wouldn’t kill them off so soon. Feelings of anxiety or fear are therefore accommodated through modes of affective regulation that rely on our familiarity with the artform in question.

Solutions to the paradox based on control face two major objections. One is that already lodged against distance theories: the control theorist argues that the typical negative valence of a given emotion is ameliorated or eliminated when our experience of it is one over which we have some power. The problem here is assuming that thus separated from its displeasing or aversive dimension via a sense of control, the negative emotion is the same emotion it would otherwise be. Theories of emotions that hold that the valence of an emotion is an intrinsic quality of it would disagree. For them, a solution to the paradox based on the control condition doesn’t explain how we can take pleasure in a displeasing emotion, it just implicitly denies that we experience the displeasing emotion in question. The second objection is that the control condition seems false to experience: one can feel fully in control over whether or not one attends to a horrifying, disgusting, or tragic state of affairs in a fictional film without that sense of control making attending to those elements any less displeasing (Gaut 1993: 338). Attending to a fictional representation of such events might be less distressing than actually witnessing such events. However, it is not clear that whether control is given or withheld over attending to the fictional representation of awful circumstances makes a difference in the aversive feelings it causes.

4. Conversionary Accounts

Some explanations of the paradox suggest that in our experience of painful art, the content is rendered in such a way so as to “convert” its distressing elements, as a kind of raw material, into a pleasurable form. Hume’s account lends itself to this interpretation (Yanal 1991). It is not only, he writes, that the “melancholy passions” are overcome by “something stronger of the opposite kind” but that those passions are “converted into pleasure” (1757 [1987: 220]). Here, Hume stresses that the negative emotions aroused by the distressing events must be of a sufficiently high intensity for the accompanying or consequent pleasure furnished by the conversion of those passions to be as substantial as it is. So, for example, Cicero’s eloquence applied to ordinary events would not result in a pleasure with as great a magnitude as when it’s applied to awful ones.

One explanation of the phenomenon Hume describes appeals to a difference between an initial painful or distressing experience of a stimulus and the experience of that stimulus in light of one’s awareness that it poses no threat of injury or harm to one’s well-being. In this connection, Paul Rozin coined the term “benign masochism” to refer to the enjoyment of “initially negative experiences that the body (brain) falsely interprets as threatening”. This realization that the pain poses no real danger, Rozin and his colleagues write, “leads to pleasure derived from ‘mind over body.’” (2013: 439).[1] Even assuming that the psychological description is correct, the phenomenon described may not exemplify a “conversion” of an emotion, but rather a replacement of one emotion with another, the latter constituted by a different cognitive base, e.g., from a belief or perception to an imagining. On cognitive bases of emotions, see Deonna and Teroni (2008 [2012]) and Gilmore (2020: 45). Of course, distinguishing here between conversion and replacement may be construed as only a verbal dispute.

An alternative possibility for capturing the conversionary proposal would be to appeal to the familiar idea that the form, manner, or medium of a representation shapes our responses to its contents. To use Hume’s example, death and destruction, the representation of which would normally provoke horror and pity, give us pleasure when represented in Cicero’s eloquent description. And the greater the pity and horror those events would produce absent that eloquence, the greater the pleasure they can elicit when conveyed via a representation possessed of an eloquent form. That different modes of representing an event may elicit, respectively, different kinds and degrees of emotional responses is uncontroversial. But that explanation of varied responses to different framings of the same event doesn’t tell us how distressing emotions are “converted” into pleasurable ones. One reason is that, as we saw earlier in compensatory theories that appeal to form as compensation for content, our responses to distressing works of art are always to the content-as-represented, that is, the content in a given form, manner, style, etc. There are not, as it were, two stages in our exposure to such events: one in which we feel distress over what is described “independent” of their having been represented for us and a second in which that distress is changed into pleasure. There is just our response to those events-as-represented.

It is a truism of artistic production that a given event that would provoke pain or distress if it actually occurred can be rendered in a fictional form that will provoke other kinds of emotions, such as laughter, or no emotion at all. Picaresque novels often subject their protagonists to various forms of violent injury that would indeed be painful, if real, to behold, but are a source of humor when confined to a fiction. The animated series Southpark kills off the little boy Kenny in one episode after another, but to only comedic effect; and it should go without saying, the history of art is populated by paintings and sculptures of murder, rape, and torture rendered in stylized and beautiful forms that evoke wonder and delight, not the revulsion that the representation of actual such events would cause. However, such cases illustrate not the conversion of emotions, but merely their elicitation. Furthermore, when we confine our attention to fictional objects, there doesn’t even exist a contrasting case of the events framed in a different way. For, as noted in Section 2.1, there is no sense in which we have access to the contents of a fiction independent of their representation. The contents of a fiction are constituted by how they are represented. Those events may be distressing or pleasurable to behold, but it is not the case that the style, manner, form, etc. of how they are represented somehow transforms what they are “prior” to that representation.

Even if we had a plausible description of how our emotions elicited by tragedy are converted from distress to pleasure, conversionary accounts face the challenge of showing that the relevant emotions are transformed into forms in which they relinquish their negative valence, while remaining the same emotion. As we saw in the objection to distancing solutions to the paradox, it is highly controversial to assert that when a given emotion is shorn of its usual valence, it remains an instance of the same emotion-kind. There are many theories of emotions and no consensus over which has the best intensional, extensional, and explanatory account. However, it seems highly intuitive that if a given emotion kind has any essential features, how the emotion feels (its phenomenology) is one of them. If, as conversionary accounts suggest, aesthetic contexts can effect a transformation in a given emotion to one with a valence not at all resembling that which it has in its usual manifestations, we may have a case not of the conversion of a given emotion, but a replacement of one kind of emotion with another. When we turn to Revisionary Solutions in Section 6 we’ll see a solution to the paradox that explicitly tries to meet that challenge by rejecting the intuition that the valence we associate with a given instance of an emotion is one of its essential features.

5. A Broader Approach to the Phenomenon

When the experience at issue is construed without restriction to fictions, many kinds of engagements outside of the artistic sphere fall within its scope. We often find satisfaction in nonfictions, e.g., in historical narratives, even as they generate pity or anger. Many people are titillated by disturbing pictures or reports in the news. Enjoying Reality TV depends on its participants genuinely behaving in ways that viewers find deplorable. Others find violent sports repellent but enthralling. A long-distance runner might find satisfaction in exercising to the point of exhaustion, and not just for the training stimulus it offers. And, for a thrill, one might eat too-spicy chili peppers, risk one’s physical well-being, or imagine inordinately nauseating or frightful circumstances. See Bloom (2021) for a compendium of such contexts in which people seem to take pleasure in undergoing experiences that are prima facie unpleasant

When construed in a descriptive fashion, the puzzle arising from our engagement with tragic works of art assumes that they call for a response that contrasts with that which we tend to exhibit in a class of normal cases. However, the wider the range is of relevantly similar experiences such as those surveyed above, the more dubious is the premise that initially gives rise to the puzzle: viz., our finding value in some experiences in virtue of the negative feelings they evoke is so unlike our other sorts of attitudes and behavior that it requires some distinctive explanation. However, if it is true that we have that response in many contexts outside of our engagement with tragedy, then its paradoxical air is difficult to sustain. We might still want to know what gives us pleasure in tragedy but there would be no special paradox of tragedy calling for a solution (Gilmore 2020: 159–60). Indeed, we may contrast those sorts of socially acceptable pursuits in which one takes satisfaction in one’s distress with other sorts that do call for a special explanation, such as some practices of deliberate self-harm.

Resisting this denial that there is a paradox calls for some demonstration that the experience of pleasure through pain in art is sufficiently unlike that found in ordinary non-artistic contexts to demand its own explanation. Two such approaches can be found in Revisionary solutions.

6. Revisionary Solutions

Revisionary approaches to the paradox of tragedy attack the premise that seems most immune to being falsified, the appreciation condition. Applied to the cases at hand, that condition holds that properly appreciating tragic drama (or other relevantly similar works of art) involves forming a mental state with a negative valence. In other words, to respond appropriately to a tragic drama is, to undergo sadness, distress, anger, or some other emotion or feeling that is in itself unpleasant, undesirable, or disvalued.

Revisionary approaches reject that characterization of the state we are in as audiences for such painful art. They allow that a proper appreciation of the works in question elicits negative emotions, but deny that those negative emotions must carry their characteristically unpleasant feeling or phenomenology. Such theories argue that the typical valence of negative emotions is not present in the contexts in which we take pleasure in painful art, but the negative emotions remain.

Describing such a theory, De Clercq (2014) notes

According to one type of solution to the paradox, no emotion is in itself agreeable or disagreeable to experience. So-called negative emotions may be typically disagreeable, but they need not have a negative “hedonic charge” (Morreall 1985; Walton 1990; Gaut 1993; Neill 1992). (De Clercq 2014: 112)

If it is not a disagreeable feeling, what then explains the attribution of a “negative” aspect to those emotions elicited by tragic drama? Revisionist theories say the negative aspect belongs not to the phenomenology of undergoing the emotion, but to the evaluation of the situation that the emotion is about.

Walton thus remarks

Hume’s characterization of sorrow as a passion that is “in itself disagreeable” is very much open to question. What is clearly disagreeable are the things we are sorrowful about—the loss of an opportunity, the death of a friend—not the feeling or experience of sorrow itself. (1990: 258).

Thus, the sorrow one feels for a fictional character need not be in itself a disagreeable or negatively-valenced experience; it is undesirable by virtue of the undesirable situation that it registers an evaluation of (Neill 1992: 62). This approach treats the negativity of a negative emotion as, at least sometimes, a relational property of the event or state of affairs the emotion is a response to. Only secondarily, and only sometimes, does the disvalue of the state of affairs prompt an unpleasantness in the phenomenology of undergoing the emotion elicited by awareness of that state of affairs.

This distinction between the negativity of an emotion’s characteristic phenomenology and the negativity of the event or state of affairs the emotion is about may make sense only within an excessively cognitive characterization of emotions. Yes, our sorrow presents its object—the death of a friend—as disagreeable, as counting against one’s wellbeing, as a loss of value, etc. But it is at least prima facie true that sorrow itself is undesirable beyond its instantiation merely being an indication of an undesirable state of affairs. That is because the negative valence of such emotions is the means by which they express, qua emotions, the undesirability of their objects. This is how emotions contrast with beliefs—which lack a characteristic phenomenology—as distinct ways of representing the values of things. Consider how bad being anxious feels, when anxiety is essentially about something that has not yet happened and hence has not yet instantiated the harm or loss of value of what, if the event comes about, may be an additional factor counting against one’s wellbeing. The badness of the feeling of being anxious is a feature of the emotion because of the emotion’s function in putting us on guard against immanent harm. This is just as the badness of the feeling caused by disgust is a feature of the emotion in its capacity as a warning signal, or reminder, of the danger of being exposed to harmful substances.

Of course, different theories of emotions will differ in the extent to which they see the standard phenomenology of an emotion as an essential feature of it. If a theory, for example, includes within the scope of experiences of fear, those in which the typical unpleasantness of feeling fear is absent, then revisionist approaches are on firm ground in claiming that such negative emotions need not have a negative hedonic charge. But the prima facie challenge to such revisionism is to question why its opponents should admit into the extension of an emotion concept any putative cases of such responses shorn of their typical feelings.

If the revisionist view here was presented in the strongest terms, where the only negativity of a negative emotion belongs to the state of affairs the emotion is about, this would entail the implausible conclusion that there is no point in engaging in the common practice of trying to manage one’s sadness or distress about some sad or distressing state of affairs. Unless one’s goal is to convince oneself that the situation was misinterpreted as sad or distressing, trying to manage one’s feelings about it would be inconsistent with recognizing its truth. However, a significant challenge threatens even a more moderate version of the revisionist proposal—one that allows that the feeling of merely undergoing a negative emotion can be among the sources of its negativity. The challenge is to explain why the negative emotions elicited by tragic dramas are exceptions to emotions of their kind in not causing unpleasantness or distress, or in causing just pleasure. The revisionist theory cannot help itself to the various proposals that the context of fictions—e.g., our distance from the represented events—ameliorates the pain of witnessing distressing events. For then the revisionist theory collapses into one of those theories and its denial that the displeasing emotions we feel for tragedy possess a negative valence becomes unmotivated.

An alternative revisionary approach suggests that the emotions we feel in fictional contexts ought not to be assimilated to emotions we feel in real life contexts because the former are a particular kind of emotion associated with pretense and imagining: “quasi-emotions” in the nomenclature that Walton employs in his theory of fiction (1978 and 1990). The thought here is that imagining or pretending to have an experience of x does not require imagining or pretending to experience all of the properties constitutive of x. Imagining that I’m flying does not require me to imagine experiencing the feeling of flying (even though it might involve visually imagining my flying or imagining believing that I’m flying). So imagining feeling sad over the death of Cordelia need not require my response to exhibit all the properties it would if I were really sad, such as sadness’s valence and characteristic motivational dimensions. The solution here is to deny that our experience of such art is genuinely painful, a cause of suffering, a source of sadness, disgust, fear, and so on, in whole or part. Instead, what appear to be such negatively-valenced emotions are in fact only imagined or pretend affective responses. These responses share certain characteristics with those of emotions we feel in non-fictional contexts, just not their unpleasantness. If this is true, then there is no conflict between the coordination condition that says we don’t take pleasure in painful experiences and the response condition that affirms that we take pleasure in the experience of aversive art. For our experience of such art on this understanding does not involve pain, but involves rather an affective state that only resembles pain while not being an instance of the kind of emotion that we may feel for genuinely tragic states of affairs that we know to be actual.

Whether the emotions we feel for the contents of fictions are continuous with those we have for what is represented by our beliefs and other truth-apt attitudes is a substantial question addressed in discussions of the so-called paradox of fictions. Reasons to doubt that such emotions felt for the objects of imaginings are of the same kind as “real world” emotions, include: asymmetries in their phenomenology, differences in their functional roles, the cognitive or evaluative content of each affective state, and the direct-objects of each state (Gilmore 2013; Stecker 2011).

Whatever the resolution is of that debate, it should be noticed that, even if such emotions are identified as only “quasi”—as within a pretense or imagining, not outside and directed in—this does not entail that they are somehow less painful or disagreeable.

For it is plausibly the case that in order to experientially imagine feeling sad over the death of a fictional character, one has to experience the most central, or even constitutive, aspect of sadness—its negative valence. Without that, why say one is (experientially) imagining feeling sad, rather than merely imagining that one occupies the perceptual and other dimensions that accompany feeling sad, without feeling sad? Also, it might be suggested that, aside from the negative evaluations they represent of their targets, what fiction-directed sadness and ordinary sadness have in common such that we treat them as intimately related is that they feel bad. In other words, any plausible interpretation of the role of quasi-emotions in our engagements with fictions must allow the possibility that they carry with them similar bodily, affective, and other phenomenological dimensions as their counterpart ordinary emotions. They may, as in one interpretation, lack the dimension of belief, or commitment to a proposition, about their object being real, and lack any motivation or reason for action (as one can’t intervene in a fictional world) but their being identified as quasi-emotions of particular type may depend upon their having a similar phenomenology to the real-world-directed prototypes. So even allowing that it is a quasi-emotion that we experience when we engage with aversive art forms (quasi-disgust, quasi-horror, quasi-sadness) we still need to explain how our pleasure in undergoing such feelings is consistent with our tendency (per the coordination condition) not to take pleasure in, and to avoid where possible, experiences with negative valences (Friend 2007). Whether the emotions we have for tragic dramas are real or pretend, they carry feelings of pain and distress; why we choose to engage in an activity that causes those feelings—perhaps even for the realization of those feelings—remains a puzzle.

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