Notes to Paradox of Tragedy
1. Rozin and his colleagues cite numerous domains in which such “Hedonic reversals” occur, from the oral irritation stemming from eating hot peppers, to fear and sadness. They identify a common 2-stage process: an initial activation of negative and positive inputs, and an enjoyment of that co-activation, identifying that second stage, which is based on a “distance” from the stimulus, as exemplifying “benign masochism”.