Notes to Philosophical Aspects of Multi-Modal Logic

1. See the discussions between summativism (e.g., Quinton 1976) and non-summativism (e.g., Gilbert 1987).

2. For proposals of systems in which justifications are made explicit, see the semantic representations of evidence in van Benthem & Pacuit (2011); Baltag, Bezhanishvili, Özgün, & Smets (2016); van Benthem, Fernández-Duque, & Pacuit (2014), as well as the more syntactic accounts in Baltag, Renne, & Smets (2012, 2014) and in the entry on justification logic.

3. For more details on the notions of explicit and implicit Beth definability of knowledge in terms of beliefs in modal settings, the reader is referred to the aforementioned Halpern, Samet, and Segev (2009a); for a general treatment of definability in modal logic, the reader is referred to Halpern, Samet, & Segev (2009b).

4. More precisely, they are not definable within \(\cL_{\left\{ \oK{1}, \ldots, \oK{n} \right\}}\). Of course, they might be definable if the language is extended with further operators. Details about this non-definability of distributed and common knowledge can be found in the appendix.

5. Note: this approach uses the transitive closure of \(R_E\) instead of its transitive and reflexive closure. Thus, the factivity of common knowledge (the desired validity \(C\varphi \rightarrow \varphi\)) is not embedded in its definition; it is rather a consequence of the factivity of the knowledge of the group's agents. Indeed, if the knowledge of all agents is factive (i.e., all individual epistemic relations \(R_i\) are reflexive), then so is their common knowledge (\(R_C\) is reflexive).

6. The topology generated by \(E\subseteq \wp(W)\) is the smallest set \(\tau_{E} \subseteq \wp(W)\) that extends E (\(E \subseteq \tau_{E}\)), contains both \(\emptyset\) and W (\(\left\{ {\emptyset,W} \right\} \subseteq \tau_{E}\)), and is closed under finite intersections and arbitrary unions.

7. It should be noted that, in a multi-agent setting, an epistemic indistinguishability relation would need to be defined in a different way, as some worlds might be considered possible by some agent, but not by some other. In fact, in a multi-agent setting, the plausibility relation is now required to be a locally-well preorder: a reflexive and transitive relation such that its restriction to each comparability class is a well-preorder (with the comparability class of each world given by all those worlds that are \(\leq\)-comparable to it).

8. Still, when a particular interpretation is attached, some properties might be required. For example, one can give PDL an epistemic interpretation (van Benthem, van Eijck, & Kooi 2006).

9. For our purposes, the single-agent case will be enough.

10. Note how a formula needs to be true in order to be announced (for other alternatives, see van Ditmarsch, van Eijck, Sietsma, & Wang 2012; Ågotnes, van Ditmarsch, & Wang 2016; van Ditmarsch 2014); hence \([\chi{!}] \varphi\) is vacuously true for any \(\varphi\) whenever \(\chi\) is not the case.

11. Still, the expressivity equivalence between \(\cL_{\left\{ K, {!} \right\}}\) and \(\cL_{\left\{ K \right\}}\) does not mean that the modality \([\chi{!}]\) is useless. A quick inspection at the translation function suggests that, even though \([\chi{!}]\) is not required expressivity-wise (anything that can be expressed with it can be also expressed without it), such modality does make a big difference succinctness-wise. This is indeed the case: formulas using \([\chi{!}]\) are more succinct that their semantically equivalent counterparts in \(\cL_{\left\{ K \right\}}\) (Lutz 2006; French, van der Hoek, Iliev, & Kooi 2013).

12. The question of finding those valid principles for which all substitution instances are valid (and, moreover, whether such set of “schematically valid” principles is even decidable) was raised in van Benthem (2006a, 2006b), and answered in Holliday, Hoshi, & Icard (2012, 2013).

13. Note the difference between a syntactic/semantic definition, as discussed in section 2 (take a modal system, then use either a formula or else a semantic component in order to define a new concept), and a syntactic/semantic combination, as discussed in this section (take two or more systems, then put their components together).

14. For more on the computational complexity of epistemic logics, see Fagin, Halpern, Moses, & Vardi (1995: Chapter 3).

15. More general formulations can be found in van Benthem, Gerbrandy, & Pacuit (2007); van Benthem, Gerbrandy, Hoshi, & Pacuit (2009).

16. Technically, the generation and reconsideration of intentions can be represented in different ways. For example, while Icard, Pacuity, & Shoham (2010) simply ‘adds’ the new intention, Lorini, Dastani, van Ditmarsch, Herzig, & Meyer (2009) models intention dynamics by means of local operations on an agent’s choices.

17. For more on these different levels of mens rea, the reader is referred to Dubber (2002).

18. It is important to note that replacing the knowledge modality by a belief modality in the above setting will not in itself solve the paradox. Indeed, if we replace K with an introspective and serial non-factive operator B stating “it is rationally believed that”, then we get a different but related version of the paradox.

19. Following the setting proposed by Balbiani et al. (2007, 2008), in which \(\langle\ast\rangle \varphi\) is read as “there is a formula that can be announced such that, afterwards, \(\varphi\) is the case”, the statement can be expressed with the formula \(\varphi \rightarrow \langle\ast\rangle K \varphi\).

20. Given the properties of \(\sqsubseteq\), this yields an S4 temporal logic.

21. This infimum, the greatest lower bound, can be alternatively defined as the least upper bound (i.e., the supremum) of the converse relation \(\sqsupseteq\).

Copyright © 2023 by
Sonja Smets <S.J.L.Smets@uva.nl>
Fernando Velázquez-Quesada <fernando.velazquezquesada@uib.no>

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