Philanthropy

First published Tue Nov 12, 2024

Philanthropy involves the voluntary contribution of money or other goods and resources for broadly public purposes. Unlike taxation, contributions are not coerced: rather, their magnitude, their direction, and often their specific use is determined by the donor’s discretion. Unlike the case of ordinary market exchange, the giver does not ask or receive payment for what she offers, though she may receive psychological, reputational, or even material benefits from her gift (e.g., she may feel a “warm glow”, see her name above a building or on a wall honoring donors, receive perks from the organizations she supports, or enjoy tax benefits). What constitutes a “public purpose” is of course controversial, but for now we adopt a very broad definition (excluding, e.g., gifts to family and friends and politicians or electoral campaigns, but otherwise inclusive as to beneficiaries and purpose). It satisfies most ordinary understandings of philanthropy for a gift simply to be other-regarding.

Note that the above definition focuses on philanthropy as a practice. Alternative definitions might attempt to specify the philanthropic motivation (i.e., love of humanity, altruism, or public-spiritedness) or philanthropic organizations as a legal category. While this entry engages with these other meanings of philanthropy, a practice-based definition provides the most appropriate lens through which to evaluate philosophical reflection on practices of voluntary giving and receiving. Motives of altruism or beneficence can animate many actions not ordinarily classed as cases of philanthropy (e.g., a decision to run for office), and the legal and tax treatment of philanthropy varies across time and jurisdictions. Additionally, we do not, for the purposes of this entry, draw a distinction between “charity” and “philanthropy”, or assume a necessary contrast between philanthropy and justice: the relationship of philanthropy to justice is a complicated matter that we discuss below.

We begin with a historical survey of the role of gift-giving in philosophical traditions, followed by a discussion of the relationship between charity or philanthropy and justice. We then turn to a more detailed discussion of philosophical perspectives on the ethics of philanthropy (e.g., moral questions for prospective givers and recipients) and the politics of philanthropy (e.g., questions about philanthropy’s relationship to the state and to political values like democracy and freedom). Finally, we consider some more specific topics of contemporary philosophical controversy.

1. Philosophical Traditions

Every human society has practiced some form of gift-giving or gift exchange with non-intimates. Altruism is universal, perhaps even biological (see the entry on biological altruism). Despite its potential root in human nature, philanthropy has taken many different forms; various conventions of philanthropy reveal significant points of convergence as well as differences. Debates about philanthropy are also bound up with central developments in sociopolitical history and the history of moral and political philosophy.

The different words used to describe practices of non-intimate gift-giving tend to reflect different normative valences. The term “philanthropy” stems from the Ancient Greek φιλανθρωπία (“philanthrôpía”) and originally referred to the gods’ love of humankind. One of the first known usages of the term occurs in Aeschylus’s Prometheus Bound (5th century BCE) to describe Prometheus’s gift of fire to humankind (in defiance of Zeus) (Sulek 2010). Fire allowed humans more independence from the gods, which posed a challenge to the gods’ power. Zeus’s criticism prefigures an enduring debate in the ethics of philanthropy regarding who is an appropriate object of giving.

Romans were more likely to use the term beneficentia (beneficence), which focuses on the quality of the outcomes to be produced rather than the motives behind giving or the kinds of recipients to be sought. (For more on the reception and application of this concept in modern and contemporary philosophy, see the entry on the principle of beneficence in applied ethics.) Cicero’s De Officiis (On Duties) is a quasi-philosophical how-to on navigating giving expectations in Classical Rome. Despite many disagreements and differences, Greco-Roman traditions exhibit certain common elements. Generally speaking, Greco-Roman philanthropy emphasized gifts of benefit to the city and to its citizens—liturgia—such as stadiums, festivals, and military campaigns (Ober 1989; Reich 2018: chapter 1). Expectations of making gifts outside of friends and family were generally limited to the wealthiest members of society. Although notionally voluntary, failure to provide gifts could incur reputational costs or formal sanctions, such as loss of titles or exile.

Plato implicitly criticized the economic and political institutions of Classical Athens as disordered and unvirtuous. The Republic proposes common ownership of property as one potential corrective to these ills. One of Aristotle’s main critiques of Plato is that the communal property regime makes no space for individual acts of generosity, which facilitate friendship and are central to ethical life (Irwin 1987). This dispute reverberates in subsequent debates about the status and distribution of property and the role of giving in ethical and political life.

The Christianization of the Roman Empire largely upended Classical giving norms. Some scholars even link the fall of the Roman Empire to disagreements about the proper ends of philanthropic giving (Brown 2012). Early Christians discussed gift-giving in terms of agape (in Greek), caritas (in Latin), and later charity (in English), which referred to love for God as expressed by love for one another. For Christians, the point of such gifts was not to fund public works for the benefit of citizens. It was instead to bestow love on the least fortunate, regardless of their citizenship. Moreover, Christians believed that this practice of gift-giving was a universal virtue to be expected of everyone, not only the wealthiest.

A focus on poverty is common in other religious traditions of giving, though the basis is often different. The Jewish norm of tzedakah treats giving to the poor as a duty of justice, a matter of strict obligation and to be made in proportion to givers’ advantages and recipients’ needs (Topolski 2016). The medieval Jewish philosopher Maimonides famously postulates an ethic of giving that ranks different approaches, drawing special attention to the value of the recipient’s dignity and the donor’s anonymity (Twersky 1980). Islamic practices contain both zakat, a strict obligation to give a portion of one’s wealth for eleemosynary and religious purposes, as well as sadaqa, additional gifts made in excess of obligation that are nonetheless praiseworthy (Hashmi 2010). Hindu, Buddhist, and Jain traditions emphasize the unilateral and unreciprocated character of giving (Heim 2004). The dāna encourages giving that indicates renunciation of material concerns and targets worthy recipients, such as members of monastic societies who have taken voluntary vows of poverty.

A rejection of hierarchy and vertical relationships appears as a common thread in several other non-western perspectives on philanthropy, such as ubuntu, which recommends giving on reciprocal terms and sees it as central to the construction of common humanity (Mottiar & Ngcoya 2015).

Classical and Abrahamic religious views of giving came under pressure in the modern period thanks partly to institutional and technological developments (Schneewind 1996). Pre-modern perspectives largely assumed the naturalness and permanence of widespread poverty, and philosophical perspectives developed under such conditions typically carve out a large role for practices of private giving and its associated virtues. Industrialization and the emergence of the modern state revealed new possibilities for eradicating poverty as well as the possibility that economic inequalities were heavily dependent on social structures. In turn, debates arose over the justice of alternative economic systems as well as the responsibilities of different agents for addressing poverty and promoting general welfare. Many thinkers protested extreme inequalities and urged a larger state response. Bentham (1802/1840 [1908: 130]) excoriates the cruel unreliability of private giving for basic needs; Kant notes that evidence of destitution generally indicates an injustice of government (Kant 1996: 573); and Marx and Engels dismiss private giving as a handmaiden of capitalist exploitation (Marx & Engels 1848). Other modern thinkers, such as Wollstonecraft (1792), Mill (1869b), and Addams (1902), questioned the relationships of domination and subordination created by patterns of giving.

From the Enlightenment onward, various critics sought to distance philanthropy from its connection to religion, especially the Catholic Church. To Enlightenment rationalists such as Anne-Robert Turgot, Immanuel Kant, and Montesquieu, the Church was not merely the propagator of religious superstitions among believers but also held in tight possession land and capital, accumulated over centuries, that was tied up in perpetual endowments. Mill insisted, for example, that the state should be permitted to intervene in long-established endowments and even, when necessary, to appropriate the assets for the state (Mill 1869a). Perpetuity combined with fixed donor intent established rule of the dead over the living, and this ran afoul both of common sense and social utility. Mill therefore rejected perpetuity and argued for time-limited endowments.

Partly in response to these critiques, various commentators sought to preserve the virtues associated with philanthropy while redirecting its ends and developing new strategies for promoting them. Late Modern commentators extol the potentials of philanthropy for supporting social innovation, community enrichment, protection against government tyranny, and international development (Sealander 2003). Andrew Carnegie’s 1889 “Gospel of Wealth” argued that the surpluses of the wealthy should not be squandered on personal consumption but were best put to social benefit through philanthropy (Carnegie 1889).

Prefiguring later developments in the effective altruism movement (discussed below), Sidgwick criticized the duty of beneficence as understood in commonsense morality and advocated a wider conception of the duty, unlimited by geography or kinship (Sidgwick 1907).

2. Justice versus Charity

Any philosophical discussion of philanthropy must at some point engage the effort of many modern philosophers to distinguish between the concepts of justice and charity (variously dubbed “humanity” or “beneficence”). According to the French sociologist Marcel Mauss, the distinction is anticipated in pre-modern societies when, during periods of surplus, the social expectations concerning generosity shift from “the ancient morality of the gift” to a “principle of justice” in which the wealthy are seen as obligated to the poor (Mauss 1925 [1990: 18]). A social order of almsgiving and charity slowly gives way to a distinctively modern tradition of justice (Fleischacker 2004).

Stripped of its religious connotations, charity is typically considered to involve the voluntary fulfillment of an imperfect duty, a duty that requires agents to adopt an end but leaves to their discretion how to fulfill it (Hill 2018; see also the entries on supererogation and Kant’s moral philosophy). Some, if not all, charity may be supererogatory, worthy of praise when performed but unworthy of blame when not performed (McMahan 2018). By contrast, justice is obligatory and usually considered a perfect duty of persons and of social institutions, a duty that admits of limited discretion, correlates to rights and claims of specific individuals, and may be enforced or compelled by law. Of course, the distinction can quickly become complicated when unjust circumstances prevail, which is to say, nearly always in actually-existing societies. In unjust circumstances, the voluntary charitable actions of givers can supply goods that are owed to others as a matter of justice.

Allen Buchanan rejects the firm distinction between justice and charity (Buchanan 1987). He objects to the commonplace idea that justice is a perfect whereas charity is an imperfect duty. Duties of charity can be made perfect through the construction of social institutions that identify those to whom one is obligated and provide the means for supporting them. Thus, the common view that philanthropy is supererogatory and discretionary because it falls under charity rather than justice. With proper institutions, duties of aid can be made sufficiently determinate to be socially enforced to some degree, even if they don’t correlate with individual rights. So, philanthropy need not be an uncoordinated individual enterprise. In the end, whether philanthropic duties are required as a matter of justice depends for Buchanan on what ends philanthropy is intended to serve and the justifiability of the social arrangements that specify and allocate those duties. It cannot be settled by simply labeling them matters of charity rather than justice.

Will Kymlicka agrees that if justice is to be realized in a world where our basic institutional arrangements ignore or create unjust inequalities, then charity can be a welcome mechanism for addressing deprivation and disadvantage (Kymlicka 2001). But, contra Buchanan, charity is nevertheless still secondary to, and derivative of, justice. The primary obligation of citizens is to strive to bring about just institutions through social and political change. Responding to injustice through private almsgiving is at best a second-best response. This is so for two reasons. First, charity is inefficient, a patchwork of uncoordinated efforts in which donors tend to prefer those with similar religious or ethnoracial identities. Were charitable efforts directed more impartially, seeking out the neediest without concern for social identity, it would still be less effective than thoroughgoing institutional reform. Think here of J.S. Mill’s view that

the great error of reformers and philanthropists in our time [is] to nibble at the consequences of unjust power, instead of redressing the injustice itself. (Mill 1848: V.XI.§9)

Second is a point of principle, namely that the demands of justice subsume and define the aims of charity. The appropriate objects of charitable giving are those who suffer from injustice and unfairness. “[I]n identifying appropriate acts of charity”, says Kymlicka,

we invoke our criteria of justice to identify who should be giving charity, to whom it should be given, and how much should be given. (Kymlicka 2001: 95)

In short, justice crowds out the space for charity—and this is not to be regretted (Kymlicka 2001). If acts of charity are subsumed under the requirements of justice, then they are not truly "charity" in the traditional sense of voluntarily giving up resources one is entitled to keep. And if they go beyond justice, they seem more like optional personal goals rather than moral obligations.

On Kymlicka’s view, the virtue of charity exists in name only: it is either defined by justice (and hence not an independent virtue) or beyond justice (and hence not a moral requirement). The only way to give charity more theoretical space is via a radically different vision of justice. One such alternative (to be discussed later) is libertarianism.

This assumes, it must be said, a restricted view of charity. But for many, philanthropy has a weaker association with addressing deprivation and disadvantage or meeting the demands of distributive justice. Donating to a museum, for instance, is not an obligation of justice and yet many perceive this as a philanthropic act. Some donors may perceive their actions as an expression of their conception of the good, their understanding of what is valuable in life, or their personal tastes. Thus, for many it is crucial to emphasize philanthropy’s role in providing non-justice goods alongside its involvement in the realization or hindrance of justice (see Pevnick 2013; Lechterman 2022; Schiller 2023).

3. Ethics of Giving

3.1 Virtue Ethics

Consequentialist perspectives and their deontological critics have dominated much of the recent philosophical discussion of philanthropy. But the virtue ethics tradition provides a much longer history of philosophical reflection on giving. And from Aristotle to the Stoics to contemporary perspectives, virtually all philosophers whom one might place in the virtue ethics tradition have agreed that traits like generosity and compassion are important virtues. (Nietzsche, a controversial candidate for inclusion as a virtue ethicist, is a possible exception.) Aristotle offers up one of the earliest and most enduring reflections on the ethics of giving, writing

To give away money is an easy matter and in any man’s power. But to decide to whom to give it, and how large, and when, and for what purpose and how, is neither in every man’s power nor an easy matter. (Nicomachean Ethics 2.9.1109a27)

Virtue ethical perspectives treat characteristics of the virtuous agent as primary, rather than as derivative of moral duties or reasons to promote good states of affairs. They emphasize the cultivation of good moral character, which will have important implications for what matters in evaluating philanthropy: rather than simply assessing whether donors have done their duty, or whether they have promoted impartially good states of affairs, we will want to know about the character of the giver (which cannot be assessed on the basis of a single act of giving). Her motive and disposition will be important objects of ethical evaluation. Unlike a utilitarian, a virtue ethicist has reason to censure large-scale philanthropy motivated by a desire for prestige. And unlike a Kantian, a virtue ethicist will not be satisfied by donors acting from duty (even against inclination): the fully virtuous individual (unlike the merely continent one) does not experience internal conflict or engage in virtuous action only after a struggle (Hursthouse & Pettigrove 2016 [2023]).

Another important concept in the virtue ethics tradition is phronesis, or practical wisdom. Virtues are not simply emotional dispositions like pity, which a child might have (Hursthouse 1999; Hursthouse & Pettigrove 2016 [2023]). Rather, they are characteristics of rational agents who have learned from experience how to choose virtuous actions in a range of situations. The well-intentioned but thoughtless or profligate giver therefore lacks the virtue of the thoughtful and provident donor. In that sense, a kind of folk virtue ethics animates many classic discussions of giving by non-philosophers, such as Andrew Carnegie’s “Gospel of Wealth” (1889).

Virtue ethicists encourage us to disaggregate our ethical analyses: G.E.M. Anscombe’s pathbreaking “Modern Moral Philosophy” argues that, rather than saying something is (morally) “wrong”, it is better to always name “a genus such as ‘untruthful,’ ‘unchaste,’ ‘unjust’” (Anscombe 1958: 9). While they have been in the minority in contemporary philosophical discussion of philanthropy (e.g., Swanton 2018; Martin 1994), virtue ethical perspectives have the potential to vary and deepen the terms of discussion about it. When debate is framed in terms of whether making or accepting a philanthropic donation is right or wrong (or permissible or impermissible), some objections to philanthropy may be difficult to understand without availing ourselves of virtue ethics’ more granular vocabulary. For example, it may be morally permissible for a private university to sell naming rights to its graduate school of arts and sciences for $100 million dollars: both the donor and the university may be acting within their rights. But this need not mean that there are no ethical objections to be made: selling naming rights in this way might be “vulgar” or “undignified” even if not “morally wrong” in a general sense.

Crucially, it is not only virtues for givers about which a virtue ethicist will have something to say. There are also virtues of recipients: most importantly gratitude, but perhaps also providence and self-respect. Since contemporary philosophical discussion of philanthropy generally privileges the moral perspective of donors, virtue ethics also has the potential to contribute to a discussion of the ethics of receiving gifts (for both individuals and institutions).

As they develop, it will be important for virtue ethical perspectives on giving to consider the possibility of tensions between virtues (e.g., between compassion and respect, or between gratitude and dignity). Are any apparent tensions illusory or resolvable with sufficient practical wisdom? Or are there sometimes irresolvable conflicts between virtues that may limit the ability of virtue ethical perspectives to provide determinate action guidance? A further question is whether virtue ethical perspectives can contribute to the growing literature on philanthropy in political philosophy: perhaps, for example, by considering how the virtues and dispositions that should guide individual givers and recipients might be cultivated (or undermined) through political action.

3.2 Effective Altruism and Other Consequentialist Views

Aristotle may have set the agenda long ago for the most essential questions to answer concerning philanthropy. But until recently, contemporary philosophers have had little to say about philanthropy, perhaps because their concerns have been directed in large part to questions of justice. That has changed with effective altruism. Effective altruism is the label for an umbrella of views that are the product of recent philosophical argument that has also given rise to a growing social movement far beyond the quarters of philosophy departments and academic journals.

According to one of its most prominent exponents, William MacAskill, effective altruism asks individuals how they can make the biggest difference or maximize the good they can do in the world. It invites people to use evidence and reason to determine how to benefit others as much as possible (MacAskill 2019: 13). Effective altruism’s roots, however, can be found in Peter Singer’s argument, dating back to his famous 1972 article, “Famine, Affluence, and Morality”, that persons in the developed world have strong obligations to address desperate global poverty (and, as he would later argue, resist the inhumane treatment of sentient animals) (Singer 1972; Singer 1975). Singer’s pond example from that article prefigures the moral force of effective altruism. Singer asks the reader to imagine walking past a shallow pond in which a small child is drowning. It would be trivially easy to wade into the pond and rescue the child, but doing so would soil one’s clothes and make one late for work. Nevertheless, it would seem that we have a moral obligation to rescue the child; it would be morally monstrous not to do so.

Singer then argues that there is no morally relevant difference between the drowning child and a child in a poor country who will die without our assistance. Just as one has a moral duty to save the drowning child, we have a similar obligation to assist people in extreme poverty through donations to effective charities. Still more, taking the argument to its logical conclusion, individuals are obligated to divest themselves of resources to assist desperately needy others up to the point of being only marginally better off than those they would assist. Yet of course few people offer assistance to the global poor and almost none donate large percentages of their wealth for this purpose. One sees in the pond example some of the core claims of effective altruism—that all lives have equal moral worth, and distance or nationality or even membership in a generational cohort in time are not morally relevant factors. Effective altruism counsels us to maximize the good we can do for others, on impartial and welfarist grounds, using evidence and reason.

Effective altruism is responsible for inspiring a number of different organizations dedicated to spreading its message and reducing the effort involved in identifying highly effective charitable organizations, including Giving What We Can (where members pledge to donate at least 10 percent of their income to effective charities), 80,000 Hours (offering advice on effective altruist career choices), the Centre for Effective Altruism (founded by philosophers William MacAskill and Toby Ord), the charity rating organization GiveWell, and the grant maker Open Philanthropy.

Some of its proponents, such as MacAskill, eschew the idea that effective altruism is committed to utilitarianism or any other substantive moral view. For many others the consequentialist underpinnings are important. Though maximizing the good one can do in the world might allow for a variety of ways of defining the good, effective altruism seems committed to producing the best outcomes or, in prospect, identifying the best action by measuring the expected value of any action. The motive of the donor matters little or not at all. As a result, consequentialists embrace the idea of self-interest (e.g., the production of a “warm glow” in giving; taking satisfaction in doing good) alongside benefits to others. And they are eager to embrace self-interest when it might be shown to be useful in stimulating others to give or to give more (e.g., naming rights on buildings, reputational competition in philanthropic giving).

In recent years, effective altruism has spawned two new developments: earning to give and longtermism. Earning to give takes the approach of effective altruism and applies it to one’s time and career choice: what job should one take to maximize good in the world? Against conventional wisdom that doing good in the world involves working at an international aid organization, for example, earning to give suggests that an individual choose a high-earning career path with the intention of donating a significant portion of income to highly effective charities. By maximizing one’s earnings potential, effective altruists claim that one may do more good overall by donating that money to carefully selected charities than through typical altruistic career paths. The cryptocurrency mogul Sam Bankman-Fried adopted this approach, allegedly because of a college encounter with William MacAskill, in choosing a career that might earn him billions and allow him to donate most of it to effective altruist causes. (Bankman-Fried was convicted of criminal charges related to his cryptocurrency platform in 2023.)

Longtermism extends the concern of effective altruism from seeking to improve currently living human beings (and animals) to seeking to influence the indefinite future and the interest in there being a great many future generations. As a practical matter, this orients effective altruism away from identifying highly effective aid organizations and toward reducing existential risks to humanity, low probability events that could prevent future generations from coming into existence (Ord 2020; MacAskill 2022).

Critics of effective altruism frequently point to its antipolitics and strong orientation toward individual rather than institutional change (see Srinivasan 2015; Berkey 2018; Dietz 2019; Lechterman 2020; Crary 2021). Srinivasan, for example, criticizes effective altruism for a certain paradoxical conservatism. Despite its ambition to change the world for the better, the effective altruist takes the political and organizational structure of the world as is—global capitalism, minimalist democracy, and the existing set of international aid organizations.

No expected value calculation is likely to counsel an individual to undertake to uproot capitalism, build a new political movement, or even start a new aid organization,

she writes (Srinivasan 2015).

Its utilitarian calculations presuppose that everyone else will continue to conduct business as usual; the world is a given, in which one can make careful, piecemeal interventions. The tacit assumption is that the individual, not the community, class or state, is the proper object of moral theorizing. (ibid.)

Critics of longtermism may hold that we have stronger duties to the present and near-term generations because the relationships and causal connections we share make us more responsible for their interests. They may also point to the difficulty of predicting the effects of our actions over the long term, especially in comparison with more reliable predictions we can make about nearer events (Tarsney 2023). Others may point to controversial axioms prominent longtermists hold about population ethics (Setiya 2022). Some have sought to defend Parfit’s Repugnant Conclusion (Parfit 1984), which holds that maximizing wellbeing can lead us to prefer a world of many lives barely worth living over an alternative world where a smaller population enjoys flourishing lives (see the entry on the repugnant conclusion).

3.3 Nonconsequentialist Views

Kant, and those influenced by him, generally discuss philanthropy in connection with the virtue of beneficence, which directs us to promote the happiness of others and assist others in need (Kant 1797; see the entry on Kant’s moral philosophy). Beneficence is an imperfect duty, meaning that determining its targets and strategies requires individual judgment and cannot be defined in advance (Hill 2018). Imperfect duties are contrasted with perfect duties, like justice and promise-keeping, which admit of less discretion and whose satisfaction ordinarily take priority (ibid.).

Kant requires that individuals be attentive to others’ needs and respond to emergencies, and he stresses that beneficence is not optional, even as he denies that beneficence must always be impartial among potential objects or maximizing in its focus. He allows that individuals may sometimes count personal attachments as reasons to favor some persons or causes over others, and he supports investments in culture and education as necessary for cultivating human virtues. Proponents of a Kantian approach defend Kant’s lack of systematic guidance on these questions, stressing that choosing whom to benefit and how requires many personal and contextual judgments that resist precise calculation (Hill 2018).

It is important to consider Kant’s moral theory in connection with his political and legal theory, which covers property rights, economic institutions, and constitutional design. Kant assigns to the state the duty to insure against absolute deprivation, and he has mixed feelings about private almsgiving as a general practice—calling it demeaning (Kant Lectures on Ethics: AK 27:455 [1997: 209]) and illustrative of government injustice, while at the same time noting that unjustly rich citizens may indeed have duties to give alms, but as duties of reparative justice rather than beneficence (Kant 1797 AK 6:454 [1996: 573).

For an effective altruist, the core question is how one person can benefit another person, and the relationship placed in the foreground is benefactor to beneficiary. But for Kant, the core question is about justice, and the relationship placed in the foreground is mutual respect and accountability. (For more on the contrast between effective altruism and Kant, see Darwall 2024). Furthermore, because on Kant’s view the immiseration of some is likelier due to injustice than misfortune, the voluntary action of the advantaged to assist the disadvantaged is improperly described as charity.

Having the resources to practice such beneficence as depends on the goods of fortune is, for the most part, a result of certain human beings being favored through the injustice of government, which introduces an inequality of wealth that makes others need their beneficence. Under such circumstances, does a rich man’s help to the needy, on which he so readily prides himself as something meritorious, really deserve to be called beneficence at all? (Kant 1797 AK 6:454 [1996: 573])

Kant assigns the state the duty to provide public goods, noting that private action on behalf of the public can often be unauthorized, unilateral vigilantism (Ripstein 2009). To be legitimate, action that affects all members of a society must be authorized by all of them omnilaterally. Similar arguments can be found in contemporary Kantian treatments of philanthropy, which tend to see philanthropy as completing and adorning the work of just institutions and temporarily repairing the mistakes of unjust institutions, but never seeking to supplant them (e.g., Herman 2001; Cordelli 2016, 2020).

In addition to positive guidance about duties to give, deontological perspectives can be important in specifying constraints on philanthropic action. Without providing a complete positive theory of how or how much one ought to give, neo-Kantians have argued that donors’ moral discretion to give as they like does not apply under conditions of institutional injustice, where wealthy people’s moral claims to their property are significantly weaker than is generally supposed (Cordelli 2016, 2020).

4. Politics of Giving

4.1 Tensions between Philanthropy and Democracy

The relationship between philanthropy and democracy is a question of longstanding interest (e.g., Tocqueville 1840 [2000: 485–92]). Of course, a state need not be democratic for tensions between public power and private philanthropy to arise: Livy and Machiavelli, for example, both note that munificent citizens can acquire popularity and power through their giving, in ways that present threats to ruling political elites. But the role of philanthropy, and especially philanthropy by the very rich, is often thought to present particular problems in democratic societies (Reich 2018). Big philanthropy represents the direction of private resources toward some public purpose or influence, and in this respect it is an exercise of power. Democracies promise their citizens political equality and equal opportunity for voice or influence over important public decisions. By contrast, large scale philanthropy gives donors the power to influence public outcomes and thereby threatens to amplify the voices of the wealthy. In this respect, big philanthropy is a plutocratic element in a democratic setting, and the relevant question to be asked is whether wealth can be domesticated to serve rather than subvert core democratic principles and practices (Reich 2018).

Some democratic perspectives focus on the concept of legitimacy and attempt to resolve the tensions between philanthropy and democracy by more strictly delimiting the appropriate role of philanthropy in the institutional division of labor. Cordelli (2020) offers a Kantian argument against the privatization of state functions, which applies to much non-profit (not just for-profit) private action. On her account, privatization represents an illegitimate outsourcing of decision-making power to private actors, who are empowered to define and affect people’s rights in ways that can only legitimately be done by a state’s democratically authorized and accountable representatives. Beerbohm (2016) and Pevnick (2016) also attempt to isolate the state functions that must remain under democratic control. And Lechterman (2022) develops an account of “democratic sovereignty” which charges that philanthropic influence over essential public goods or matters of basic justice violates citizens’ rights to self-determination.

Many recent normative theories of democracy link its justification to a concern for people’s ability to relate as social equals, rather than as superiors and inferiors (e.g., Anderson 1999; Kolodny 2014, 2023; Wilson 2019). Social or relational egalitarian theories of democracy, while often focused on formal political institutions and processes, have reason to be concerned about social inequalities that arise informally—including through philanthropy, which has the potential to contribute to informal hierarchies of control and esteem. Saunders-Hastings (2019, 2022a) argues for a presumption against giving in paternalistic ways that express disrespect for the judgment of beneficiaries and that may contribute to subordinating relationships. The concern that philanthropy can express objectionable forms of paternalism grows stronger still once one considers that philanthropy consists not only of isolated transactions but often creates ongoing relationships between donors and recipients (e.g., in institutional settings). According to Saunders-Hastings and Reich (2024), paternalism involves one party putting itself in a position of longer-term authority over an autonomous agent and making judgments on their behalf, even if the paternalized party consents. Thus, paternalism can be objectionable even if it makes the paternalized party better off and they genuinely consent. The wrong lies in the insult to autonomy and the unequal power dynamic, not just in coercion or negative outcomes. Philanthropic foundations often act paternalistically by retaining control over decision making and imposing their own judgments rather than empowering grantees and beneficiaries. Respect for those affected requires foundations to give them more of a say, both for instrumental reasons (local knowledge improves outcomes) and intrinsic reasons (mitigating power imbalances and respecting autonomy).

Some perspectives argue that the relationship between philanthropy and democracy can be complementary, or that the tensions between philanthropy and democracy can be resolved through institutional designs that render philanthropy compatible with democratic ideals. Reich (2018) argues that philanthropy can be supportive of democracy when it contributes to the distinctive goods of pluralism (i.e., in the provision of public goods) and discovery (roughly, innovation in the provision of public goods, in ways that electoral incentives may militate against). For Reich, if democracy is construed as a political system that champions a diverse and contestatory civil society, then philanthropic support from a broad base of ordinary citizens can provide one form of fuel for a pluralistic civil society and diminish governmental orthodoxy in defining its contours. Institutionalized philanthropy, such as through philanthropic foundations, can be one vehicle for experimentalism in social problem-solving, over longer-time horizons than state agencies and commercial firms are likely to undertake. Pevnick (2013) argues that the nonprofit sector might be democratized if the power to contribute were more widely dispersed, e.g., by replacing existing tax mechanisms for subsidizing philanthropy with vouchers distributed in equal amounts to all citizens. Rubenstein (2022) argues that small-dollar donating is itself a democratic practice. MacKenzie (2021) has proposed using participatory budgeting models within philanthropic foundations to democratize the allocation of funds.

The tensions between philanthropy and democracy are often explored within the context of the nation-state, but some philosophers explore them in a global context. International non-governmental organizations (INGOs) are often government-funded, but many rely at least in part on philanthropic funding (from either elite donors, large numbers of small donors, or a combination thereof). There is ongoing debate as to whether the activities of INGOs ought to be understood as a form of (unelected) interest-representation, and how (if at all) such representation can meet democratic standards (Rubenstein 2015; Montanaro 2018). Others have proposed mechanisms for democratizing the allocation of international philanthropic funds themselves: Tanasoca and Dryzek (2021) advocate for deliberative democratic fora in which the global poor could exercise collective voice in the direction of proposed donations.

4.2 Philanthropy and Freedom

Libertarian views vary in their justifications and implications, but most tend to create comparatively wide space for philanthropy as a consequence of limiting the scope of permissible state action. For libertarians, freedom is typically understood as non-interference with individual choices (except to prevent harm or protect the rights of others) and a just society is one that minimizes the exercise of coercive force. Liberty encompasses the freedom to allocate one’s resources according to one’s preferences, and it includes the permission to donate one’s resources to willing recipients. For libertarians, philanthropy—as with marketplace activity—can be understood as a form of consensual exchange or contract (Nozick 1974). A society organized largely in terms of voluntary transactions will likely contain many inequalities and unmet needs. Consequently, libertarians tend to see philanthropy as an especially praiseworthy exercise of liberty (Lomasky 1995). But it is more than praiseworthy; a libertarian view emphasizes the beneficial outcomes and moral superiority of philanthropy when compared to government-provided assistance. Charity is regarded as a commendable and liberty-preserving means of aiding the underprivileged, as it is voluntary in nature, unlike public provision, which relies on state coercion through taxation and redistribution. Consequently, private charity is considered to have greater legitimacy than government programs. Furthermore, libertarians argue that, due to its often localized and innovative approach, private charity is more likely to yield effective results than government aid.

However, this position also suggests that the appropriate role of the state with respect to philanthropy is not to subsidize it (which involves interfering with the liberty of some for the benefit of others) (Fleischer 2010). And the state is generally to respect and enforce the terms that donors choose to attach to their gifts—despite the disadvantages this may create for recipients and third parties (Florino 2016).

Republicans understand freedom as non-domination, where to be dominated is to be susceptible to arbitrary exercises of power (Pettit 1997). Government legitimacy requires that power is limited in ways that track citizens’ interests. But the threat of domination can also come from private sources, and republicans are especially critical of dominating relationships between philanthropists and beneficiaries, who may depend on gifts for their livelihood and thus live a precarious and servile existence. Republican arguments can thus lend support to institutional designs that seek to make the necessities of life more reliably accessible. The welfare state and universal basic income schemes are familiar proposals here (Pettit 2006). However, republicanism also supports the position that a sufficient number of philanthropists competing in an area can limit domination by enabling beneficiaries to choose more freely among them (Taylor 2018). For many republicans, whether or how much philanthropy dominates depends on background conditions and policy choices. Additionally, a prominent theme in republican thought is the importance of a contestatory citizenry for checking government domination (Pettit 2012). Such efforts require resources, and philanthropy is the most obvious source of funds for civil society organizations that monitor, protest, and advocate (Lechterman & Reich 2020).

5. Current Controversies

5.1 The Problem of Dirty Money

Putatively “dirty” or “tainted” gifts are a perennial source of controversy in the ethics and politics of philanthropy. Is it morally permissible to accept tainted wealth if it supports a praiseworthy cause? “Dirty money” and related terms (e.g., tainted money, blood money) can be used in different ways. In legal and business contexts, these terms are often used narrowly to refer to money that represents the proceeds of illegal activities such as fraud or organized crime (i.e., money that needs to be “laundered”). Philosophers often use the terms more broadly, to refer to money or other goods produced from unjust or otherwise seriously morally objectionable activities, transactions, and relationships (even if the activities in question are not illegal). More broadly still, “dirty money” can refer to gifts from controversial donors, even if moral criticisms of the donors are not primarily about how their wealth was acquired (e.g., donations from accused or convicted sex offenders, such as Jeffrey Epstein or Harvey Weinstein). Prominent contemporary examples include debates about whether universities and art institutions should refuse or return gifts from the Sackler family, given their company Purdue Pharma’s role in the opioid epidemic.

Traditionally, worries about dirty money have been more prominent in non-consequentialist philosophical traditions. Both consequentialists and non-consequentialists can take account of the potential bad effects of accepting dirty money, such as the risk of legitimizing or further encouraging harmful economic activities. But for consequentialists, the potential for donations to do good (relative to the relevant alternative uses to which the money might be put) will often outweigh these risks. Peter Singer, for example, has argued against a generalized rejection of Sackler money (Singer 2019). Put in the extreme, one thinks of the adage attributed to the founder of the Salvation Army, William Booth, who is alleged to have said, “The only problem with tainted money is that there just tain’t enough of it”.

Dirty money debates often focus on particularly famous individuals or families. However, objections to institutions profiting from—and to donors’ discretion in disposing of—ill-gotten gains potentially apply much more widely. Cordelli (2016, 2020) argues that everything that donors own, beyond what they would have under just institutions, is morally speaking not theirs at all; they should therefore enjoy no moral discretion in deciding how to spend it but should instead direct it to improving the condition of the worst off members of society, as a demand of reparative justice. For philosophers who object to economic injustice more broadly, and not only to particular bad actors, any distinction between clean and dirty money may be difficult to sustain.

5.2 Corporate Giving and Corporate Social Responsibility

One of the most striking developments in the practice of philanthropy over the past several decades has been the attempts to combine philanthropy with commercial activity. Should business firms engage in philanthropy, and if so, how? Strong social norms support the donation of some portion of profits to charitable causes. Corporate philanthropy might be justified, for instance, on the grounds that corporations have surplus resources that can often be put to better uses than padding executive salaries or lining shareholders’ pockets. Perhaps businesses owe donations to society in return for their many privileges. However, corporate philanthropy also invites fundamental criticisms. Some libertarians, such as the economist Milton Friedman, hold that the social responsibility of business is to increase profits, and therefore corporate philanthropy is tantamount to theft of shareholder’s assets (Friedman 1970). Corporate profits are shareholders’ property, and it is the right of shareholders—not business managers—to determine whether and how to donate their property. A more recent “market failures” view holds that businesses maximize their contribution to social welfare by seeking efficiency, which they accomplish by conscientious profit-seeking (Heath 2014). From this perspective, directly seeking good outcomes through philanthropy may reduce firms’ efficiency gains and compromise their contributions to social welfare. Democratic critics question the potential distortions to political equality of corporate giving programs, which may allow corporations disproportionate influence over matters of common concern, and the ways in which firms’ business goals may distort their philanthropic priorities (Lechterman 2022; Saunders-Hastings 2022b). And a common cynical view regards philanthropy as a way of deflecting attention from misconduct and exploitation in other areas of a firm’s business activities. Critics of corporate philanthropy often agree there are nonetheless certain limited forms of corporate giving that may be morally permissible if not morally required in certain cases, such as the sharing of proprietary resources during emergencies (Mejia 2021).

A more recent development shows organizations blending commercial and philanthropic purposes more fundamentally, by designing business models that seek to achieve social goals using commercial tactics. So-called social enterprise offers many potential advantages. For instance, by eliminating donations from the equation, such organizations may work against longstanding worries about inequitable benefactor-beneficiary relations. Additionally, the ability to draw on multiple funding sources may make their services easier to sustain. But their unusual combination of purposes and tactics may create conflicts of interest that create challenges for their stakeholders. The aggressive pursuit of social-problem-solving by entrepreneurs may also raise democratic concerns about power and voice. Under what conditions is social enterprise a morally superior approach to conventional philanthropy or business, a valuable complement to conventional forms and strategies, or neither (Lechterman & Mair 2024)?

5.3 Tax Treatment of Giving

In the modern age, philanthropy is a legally codified and institutionalized practice. It’s possible, of course, to give money away outside the sight of the state. But contemporary philanthropy is embedded within a legal framework, varying across societies, that structures and defines its practice. Whether, when, to whom, and how much a person gives is to some extent a consequence of laws that govern the establishment of not-for-profit organizations, charitable trusts, philanthropic and community foundations, and related charitable vehicles such as donor-advised funds. Donor intent is protected by the law in many different countries, and charitable endowments and philanthropic foundations are often legally designed to exist beyond the grave in perpetuity.

Beyond establishing legal entities and frameworks, however, one of the most distinctive and controversial practices concerns whether the law should provide affirmative encouragement for philanthropy via advantageous tax treatment. Philanthropy is often considered a paradigmatic example of voluntary activity, nothing more than the rightful exercise of one’s liberty to dispose of one’s possessions as one likes. But in many countries, philanthropy is a tax-advantaged activity, and therefore subsidized by citizens.

The tax treatment of charitable donations in the United States allows individuals to deduct (up to some limit) the sum of their eligible charitable donations from their taxable income. However, this policy instrument contains a plutocratic bias that favors the wealthy and their charitable projects. The deduction creates an “upside-down effect” where higher income earners in a system of progressive taxation receive a larger subsidy for the same charitable contribution compared to lower income earners. Insofar as charitable giving is a virtue, the cost of virtue is distributed unevenly.

But if the distribution of charitable contributions were directed chiefly, or better exclusively, at the deprived and disadvantaged, the plutocratic bias of a tax deduction might be less objectionable. Whatever the amount of the subsidy, it is the beneficiary that matters most. Liam Murphy and Thomas Nagel point in this direction:

The word charity suggests that this deduction is a means of decentralizing the process by which a community discharges its collective responsibility to alleviate the worst aspects of life at the bottom of the socioeconomic ladder. Since there is disagreement about what the exact nature of that responsibility is, and about which are the most efficient agencies, it is arguably a good idea for the state to subsidize individuals’ contributions to agencies of their choice rather than making all the decisions about the use of public funds for this purpose. (Murphy & Nagel 2002: 127)

But they quickly reverse ground because the catalogue of eligible charitable organizations in the United States includes cultural and educational organizations, far beyond organizations whose mission it is to fight poverty and disadvantage.

If support for the pluralism of civil society rather than the fulfillment of basic needs is the rationale for public subsidies for philanthropy, then the policy instrument of a charitable tax deduction is harder to support. The plutocratic bias in the charitable deduction policies means that the public funds forgone due to the deduction flow disproportionately to the favored charities and causes of the wealthy. The charitable priorities of the rich are weighted more heavily than those of lower and middle-income households. According to data from 2005, the distribution of charitable giving across causes differs significantly between high-income and general households. Religious and basic-needs organizations receive a much smaller share of donations from high-income households compared to the general population (Reich 2018: chapter 2).

If a key justification for tax exemptions for charitable giving is to support a diverse and pluralistic civil society that amplifies the voices of citizens, then the current charitable deduction fails this test. Its plutocratic bias makes it indefensible from the perspective of supporting democracy. Some argue that the tax advantages should be eliminated. Others, such as Pevnick (2016), argue that it should be replaced with a flat tax credit, available to all taxpayers, that provides an equal subsidy for the charitable contributions of all citizens regardless of income. This would better align tax policy with the aim of promoting equality of citizen voice and influence in civil society.

6. Conclusion

This entry has traced debates over the concept, conception, and practice of philanthropy across periods and schools of philosophical thought. As we have seen, philanthropy raises ethical and political issues that have long been subjects of philosophical investigation; more recently, a contemporary philosophical literature has developed that considers philanthropy as a distinctive space of ethical and political action. Space limitations naturally preclude a comprehensive treatment of the topics we have chosen, and we have omitted many interesting and important topics altogether. We have made only brief contact with the ethics of nonprofit organizations (the intermediaries of philanthropic gifts), as a related but distinct topic of philosophical study. We have entirely ignored the question of state philanthropy, i.e., whether philanthropy is something in which states can also engage, and if so, how such a practice might figure in moral and political philosophy (Dworkin 1985; Murphy & Nagel 2002; Weinberg 2011). As philosophers show increasing interest in the topic of philanthropy, we look forward to further efforts to unravel lingering puzzles about this crucial and stimulating topic.

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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

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Theodore M. Lechterman <tlechterman@faculty.ie.edu>
Emma Saunders-Hastings <saunders-hastings.1@osu.edu>
Rob Reich <reich@stanford.edu>

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