Pragmatism

Pragmatism is a philosophical tradition that – very broadly – understands knowing the world as inseparable from agency within it. This general idea has attracted a remarkably rich and at times contrary range of interpretations, including: that all philosophical concepts should be tested via scientific experimentation, that a claim is true if and only if it is useful (relatedly: if a philosophical theory does not contribute directly to social progress then it is not worth much), that experience consists in transacting with rather than representing nature, that articulate language rests on a deep bed of shared human practices that can never be fully ‘made explicit’. After a brief historical survey, the first part of this entry explores the classical pragmatists’ distinctive methods, and how they give rise to an original a posteriori epistemology. After that, we briefly explore some of the many other areas of philosophy in which rich pragmatist contributions have been made, both in pragmatism’s classical era and the present day.

• 1. The Development of Pragmatism
  • 1.1 The Early Years
  • 1.2 ‘Neopragmatism’ and Beyond
• 2. The Meaning of Pragmatism
  • 2.1 Peirce: The Pragmatic Maxim
  • 2.2 James
• 3. Pragmatist Theories of Truth
  • 3.1 Peirce on Truth and Reality
  • 3.2 James on Truth
• 4. Pragmatist Epistemology
  • 4.1 Skepticism versus Fallibilism
  • 4.2 Inquiry
  • 4.3 Pragmatist Conceptions of Experience
  • 4.4 Representations
• 5. Pragmatism’s Contribution in Other Areas of Philosophy
  • 5.1 Philosophy of Religion
  • 5.2 Ethical and Political Philosophy
  • 5.3 Aesthetics
  • 5.4 Philosophy of Education
• Bibliography
  • Primary Texts of the Classical Pragmatists
  • Collections of Papers by Classic and Contemporary Pragmatists.
  • Other References and Supplementary Reading
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. The Development of Pragmatism

1.1 The Early Years

Pragmatism originated in the United States around 1870, and now presents a growing third alternative to both analytic and ‘Continental’ philosophical traditions worldwide. Its first generation was initiated by the so-called ‘classical pragmatists’ Charles Sanders Peirce (1839–1914), who first defined and defended the view, and his close friend and colleague William James (1842–1910), who further developed and ably popularized it. James’ Harvard colleague Josiah Royce (1855–1916), although officially allied with absolute idealism, proved a valuable interlocutor for many of these ideas, and as he increasingly came to be influenced by Peirce’s work on signs and the community of inquirers, was acknowledged as a fellow pragmatist by Peirce himself. A significant influence in those early years was the scientific revolution then taking place around evolutionary theory, of which first generation pragmatists were keen observers and sometime participants (Pearce 2020). These pragmatists focused significantly on theorising inquiry, meaning and the nature of truth, although James put these themes to work exploring truth in religion.

A second (still termed ‘classical’) generation turned pragmatist philosophy more explicitly towards politics, education and other dimensions of social improvement, under the immense influence of John Dewey (1859–1952) and his friend Jane Addams (1860–1935) – who invented the profession of social work as an expression of pragmatist ideas, and was awarded the Nobel Peace Prize in 1931. At the same time, new philosophies of race were germinated by pioneering African-American philosophers W.E.B Du Bois (1868–1963) and Alain Locke (1885–1954), who also engaged in productive dialogue with one another. Further valuable contributions were made at this time by George Herbert Mead (1863–1931), who contributed significantly to the social sciences, developing pragmatist perspectives on the relations between the self and the community (Mead 1934), and Mary Parker Follett who studied with Royce and James at Radcliffe/Harvard, and also critiqued prevailing individualist ontologies, developing a concept of “power-with” rather than “power-over” in institutional settings (Follett 1918; 1924), whose farsightedness has recently been recognised (Kaag 2011).

As the progressive Deweyan ‘New Deal’ era passed away and the US moved into the Cold War, pragmatism’s influence was challenged, as analytic philosophy blossomed and became the dominant methodological orientation in most Anglo-American philosophy departments. Transitional or ‘third generation’ figures included C.I. Lewis (1883–1964), the teacher of W.V.O. Quine (1908–2000) and several generations of Harvard philosophers. Lewis developed a philosophy that was a sort of pragmatist Kantianism, and in books such as Mind and the World Order (1929), he defended a pragmatist conception of the a priori, holding that our choices of laws of logic and systems of classification should be determined by pragmatic criteria (Lewis 1923, 1929; Murphey 2005: ch. four and five). Although Lewis and Quine developed a number of pragmatist themes, their analytic allegiance may be seen in their significant focus on theory of knowledge as first philosophy (which Dewey deprecated as ‘the epistemological industry’).

It would be wrong to conclude that pragmatism was restricted to the United States. There were pragmatists in Oxford, in France and, especially, in Italy in the early years of the twentieth century (Thayer 1968, part III, Baldwin 2003: 88–9). The work of Frank Ramsey at Cambridge in the 1920s (e.g. Ramsey 1926) developed Peirce’s views on statistical reasoning and inquiry in ways that inspired fertile new research programmes (Misak 2018). Wittgenstein’s later thought also acquired a pragmatist flavour through conversations with Ramsey (Misak 2018; Boncompagni 2016; Goodman 2002), and his reading of James’s Varieties of Religious Experience (1902).

1.2 ‘Neopragmatism’ and Beyond

Since the 1970s, the pragmatist tradition has undergone a significant revival. Richard Rorty (1931–2007) turned consciously to pragmatism to rectify what he saw as mainstream epistemology’s crucial mistake: naively conceiving of language and thought as ‘mirroring’ the world. Rorty’s bold and iconoclastic attacks on this ‘representationalism’ birthed a so-called neopragmatism to which a number of influential recent philosophers have contributed. Where early pragmatists such as Peirce and Dewey created systematic philosophies, Rorty treated pragmatism as a more critical or therapeutic philosophical project. What pragmatists teach us about truth, he tells us, is that there is nothing very systematic or constructive to be said about it. In particular, the concept does not capture any metaphysical relation between our beliefs and utterances, on the one hand, and reality on the other. We can describe what we do with the word ‘true’: we use it to endorse beliefs and sentences, and sometimes we might find it useful to express our fallibility by saying that some of our beliefs may not be true. (Rorty calls this the ‘cautionary’ use of the term ‘true’.) But beyond talking about the concept’s rather trivial formal properties, there is nothing more to be said about it. Nor can truth be our aim when we inquire, since we can only adopt an aim that we can recognize has been achieved, but since we are fallible, we can never prove that our beliefs are true – only that they meet standards of acceptance that are endorsed, for the time being, in our community (Rorty 1982; 1991; 1998). Therefore we are free to propose new ‘vocabularies’ – systems of classification and description. We do not test these vocabularies by seeing whether they can be ‘read off the nature of reality’, but by seeing how they enable us to achieve our current goals, formulate better and more satisfying goals, and become better at being human.

Another key contributor to pragmatism’s revival was Harvard philosopher Hilary Putnam, who at times made ambitious claims for the prospects of a ‘pragmatist enlightenment’(Putnam 2004: 89–108. For a more recent articulation of similar sentiments, see Kitcher 2012). Putnam identifies four key characteristics of pragmatism as: i) rejection of skepticism, ii) willingness to embrace fallibilism, iii) rejection of dichotomies such as fact/value, mind/body, analytic/synthetic, iv) what he calls ‘the primacy of practice’ (Putnam 1993; 1994).

Further pragmatist revival may be found in the work of Robert Brandom. Brandom’s philosophical interests are rather different from those of the classical pragmatists, of whom he is quite critical (Brandom 2011). His views owe more to philosophers such as Wilfrid Sellars and Quine, his teacher Rorty, and historical readings in thinkers such as Kant and Hegel. His concerns lie mostly with semantics and the philosophy of language. By contrast to the representationalism deplored by Rorty, he develops a version of inferentialist semantics, in order to construct accounts of our use of words like ‘true’ and ‘refers to’ which are liberated from the idea that the function of thought and language is ‘to provide a transcript of reality’. The connection to pragmatism is his focus on what we do with our practices of making assertions and evaluating the assertions of others. What constitutes an assertion is its normative pragmatics: it is the smallest unit of language for which we can take responsibility within a ‘game of giving and asking for reasons’. Logical relations are explicated as entitlements to make further moves in this ‘language-game’, which flow from the commitments one has assumed through one’s previous assertions (Brandom 1994; 2000). Brandom also joins the pragmatists in denying that truth is a substantial property, and in seeking to construct an account of reference which makes a difference in practice (his favored strategy is, broadly, explaining language-users’ anaphoric capacities). In (Brandom 2008) he goes further to discuss how different vocabularies understood pragmatically might be translated into – or reduced to – one another, thereby constructing an overall account of the relationship between ‘saying’ and ‘doing’ that he offers as a basis for reintegrating analytic and pragmatist philosophy. Brandom’s research program has inspired a new generation of philosophers to fruitfully combine Sellarsian and pragmatist ideas (e.g. Price 2013; Sachs 2015; Levine 2019; Stovall 2021).

Another notable recent foray into pragmatist-inspired normative pragmatics is found in the work of Jürgen Habermas, a philosopher from the Frankfurt School who has engaged with unparalleled breadth across the landscape of 20th century philosophy. He manages to combine analytic philosophers’ goal of systematically theorising language with a neo-Marxian and hermeneutic critique of modernity, whilst drawing on Mead’s pragmatist analysis of the self as irremediably social. His central concept of communicative action (Habermas 1981) is advocated as a foil to the instrumentalist rationality that he takes to be rampantly colonising the human ‘lifeworld’ under capitalism. The discourse ethics which he develops in order to scaffold an authentic communicative action that is free from the distortions of power and ideology owes much to pragmatism’s concept of the community of inquiry, although he is sceptical of Peirce’s inquiry-based analysis of truth as overly idealised (Habermas 2003). With major contributions in political philosophy, ethics, philosophy of law, aesthetics and philosophy of religion, amongst other areas, Habermas’ influence has reached far into the social sciences – something Dewey would likely have approved.

Meanwhile, a number of self-described pragmatists have objected to certain tenets of neopragmatism, particularly Rorty’s blithe dismissal of truth as a topic better left undiscussed (Rorty 1982), and have sought to rehabilitate classical pragmatist ideals of objectivity. (Examples include Susan Haack, Christopher Hookway and Cheryl Misak.) These philosophers are now sometimes referred to as New Pragmatists. Yet others have worked to place pragmatist ideas in a broader Western philosophical context, for instance tracing Peirce’s significant debt to Kant (Apel 1974, Gava 2014), and connections between pragmatism and 19th century idealism (Margolis 2010, Stern 2009). Meanwhile, classical pragmatism’s progressive social ideals lived on in some quarters, with notable contributions to philosophy of race made by Cornel West, who advanced a prophetic pragmatism drawing on both Christian and Marxian thought, and showcasing the earlier contributions of Du Bois and Locke (e.g. West 1989), while Shannon Sullivan has been a pioneer in ‘whiteness studies’ (Sullivan 2006). A number of other liberatory philosophical projects in areas such as feminism (Seigfried 1996), disability studies (Keith and Keith 2013), medical ethics (Hester 2001), ecology (Norton 1994; 2005, Alexander 2013), Native American philosophy (Pratt 2002) and Latin American philosophy (Pappas 1998) also currently look to the pragmatist tradition as their philosophical home. Pragmatists have also made significant recent contributions to legal philosophy (Sullivan 2007).

Meanwhile, increasingly pragmatism’s intellectual centre of gravity is moving out of North America, with vibrant research networks appearing in South America, Scandinavia and more recently central Europe and China.

2. The Meaning of Pragmatism

Pragmatism’s key ideas originated in discussions at a so-called ‘Metaphysical Club’ that met in Harvard around 1870. (For a popular history of this group, see Menand 1998.) Peirce and James participated in these discussions along with some other philosophers, psychologists and philosophically inclined lawyers. Peirce then developed these ideas in publications from the 1870s, and they achieved prominence through a series of public lectures given by James in 1898. Both James and Peirce used ‘pragmatism’ as the name of a method, principle, or ‘maxim’ for clarifying concepts and hypotheses and for identifying empty disputes, though we shall see significant differences in how they understood it.

The core of pragmatism as Peirce originally conceived it was the Pragmatic Maxim, a rule for clarifying the meaning of hypotheses by tracing their implications for experience in specific situations. For Peirce and James, a key application of the Maxim was clarifying the concept of truth. This produced a distinctive epistemological outlook: a fallibilist, anti-Cartesian explication of the norms that govern inquiry. Within that broad outlook, though, early pragmatists split significantly over questions of realism broadly conceived – essentially, whether pragmatism should conceive itself as a scientific philosophy holding monism about truth (following Peirce), or a more broad-based alethic pluralism (following James and Dewey). This dispute was poignantly emblematized in arguments between Peirce and James which led Peirce to rename his view pragmaticism, presenting this clarified viewpoint to the world as his new ‘baby’ which was, he hoped, ‘ugly enough to be safe from kidnappers’ (EP2: 355).

2.1 Peirce: The Pragmatic Maxim

Peirce made this canonical statement of his Pragmatic Maxim in 1878 in ‘How to Make our Ideas Clear’:

Consider what effects, which might conceivably have practical bearings, we conceive the object of our conception to have. Then, our conception of those effects is the whole of our conception of the object. (EP1: 132)

This offers a distinctive method for clarifying the meaning of concepts and the hypotheses which contain them, by identifying the practical consequences we should expect if a given hypothesis is true. This maxim raises some questions. First: what sort of thing does it recognize as a practical consequence? Second, what use does such a maxim have? Peirce’s first simple illustrative example urges that what we mean by calling something hard is that ‘it will not be scratched by many other substances.’ In this way, then, I can use the concept hard in certain contexts when I am wondering what to do, and absent such contexts, the concept is empty. The principle has something of a verificationist character: ‘our idea of anything is our idea of its sensible effects’ (EP1: 132). However the use of the phrase ‘practical consequences’ suggests that these are to be understood as having implications for what we will or should do. This is clear from Peirce’s later formulations, for example:

The entire intellectual purport of any symbol consists in the total of all general modes of rational conduct which, conditionally upon all the possible different circumstances and desires, would ensue upon the acceptance of the symbol. (EP2: 346).

So, for instance, if I want to break a window by throwing an object through it, that object needs to be hard. It is important that, as Peirce hints here, the consequences we are concerned with are general and intelligible: we are to look for laws that govern the behaviour of hard things, and draw on them to develop behaviours which advance our goals now and in the future.

James sometimes writes as if the practical consequences of a proposition can simply be effects upon the individual believer: if religious belief makes me feel better, then that contributes to the pragmatic clarification of ‘God exists’. Peirce saw uses for his maxim beyond those James had in mind. He insisted that it was a logical principle, in a broad sense which includes scientific methodology. So for instance he used it to clarify concepts central to scientific reasoning such as probability, truth, and reality. Pragmatism, described by Peirce as a ‘laboratory philosophy’, shows us how we test theories by carrying out experiments in the expectation that if the hypothesis is not true, then the experiment will fail to have some predetermined sensible effect.

Peirce’s description of his maxim as a logical principle is reflected in passages where he presents it as a development of a distinction that had been a staple of traditional logic texts, and familiar to readers of Descartes, between ideas that are clear and distinct (EP1: 126f). Peirce understood the first grade of clarity about the meaning of a concept to consist in the ability to identify instances of it, without necessarily being able to say how. He then took his philosophical contemporaries to hold that the highest grade of clarity, distinctness, is obtained when we can analyze a concept into its elements by providing a verbal definition (or, in more recent terminology, necessary and sufficient conditions for its application). Peirce complained that ‘nothing new is ever learned by analyzing definitions’, unless we already have a clear understanding of the defining terms. He therefore announced that the Pragmatic Maxim enabled a higher (‘third’) grade of clarity, that supplemented the verbal definition with a description of how the concept is employed in practice.

As well as treating the Pragmatic Maxim as part of a constructive account of the norms that govern inquiry, Peirce, like James, gave it a negative role as a tool for demonstrating the emptiness of a priori metaphysics. In section 3.1 we shall see how pragmatic clarification of reality may be used to undermine a flawed ‘nominalistic’ conception of reality that led to the ‘copy theory of truth’, problematic Cartesian certainty-seeking strategies in epistemology, and Kant’s concept of a ‘thing in itself’. A more vivid non-logical example of using the maxim to undermine spurious metaphysical ideas was Peirce’s early argument that the Catholic understanding of transubstantiation was empty and incoherent, since to talk of something as having all the sensible characters of wine, yet being in reality blood, is senseless jargon’ (EP1: 131f). It is important to note, however, that the Maxim is in the end only a tool for clarifying meaning; not Peirce’s theory of meaning proper. This is to be found in his theory of signs or semiotic, discussed below (4.4).

2.2 James

When William James published a series of lectures on ‘Pragmatism: A New Name for Some Old Ways of Thinking’ in 1907, he began by identifying ‘The Present Dilemma in Philosophy’ (1907: 9ff), a fundamental and apparently irresoluble clash between two ways of thinking, which he promised pragmatism would overcome. James begins by observing that the history of philosophy is ‘to a great extent that of a certain clash of human temperaments’: the ‘tough-minded’ and the ‘tender-minded’. The tough-minded have an empiricist commitment to experience and going by ‘the facts’, while the tender-minded prefer a priori principles which appeal to ratiocination. The tender-minded tend to be idealistic, optimistic and religious, believing in free will, while the tough-minded are materialist, pessimistic, irreligious, dogmatic and fatalistic.

By the early twentieth century, James notes, ‘our children … are almost born scientific’ (1907: 14f). But this has not weakened religious belief. People need a philosophy that is both empiricist in its adherence to facts yet finds room for faith. The challenge is to show how to reconcile ‘the scientific loyalty to facts’ with ‘the old confidence in human values and the resultant spontaneity, whether of the religious or of the romantic type.’ Pragmatism is presented as the ‘mediating philosophy’. Once we use the ‘pragmatic method’ to clarify our understanding of truth, of free will, or of religious belief the disputes – which we despaired of settling intellectually – begin to dissolve. William James thus presented pragmatism as a ‘method for settling metaphysical disputes that might otherwise be interminable.’ (1907: 28) Unless some ‘practical difference’ would follow from one or the other side’s being correct, the dispute is idle.

[T]he tangible fact at the root of all our thought-distinctions, however subtle, is that there is no one of them so fine as to consist in anything but a possible difference of practice. To attain perfect clearness in our thoughts of an object, then, we need only consider what conceivable effects of a practical kind the object may involve – what sensations we are to expect from it, and what reactions we must prepare. (1907: 29)

The lectures explained this with a memorable illustration. On a visit to the mountains, James’ friends engage in a ‘ferocious metaphysical dispute’ about a squirrel that was hanging on one side of a tree trunk while a human observer was standing on the other side:

This human witness tries to get sight of the squirrel by moving rapidly round the tree, but no matter how fast he goes, the squirrel moves as fast in the opposite direction … so that never a glimpse of him is caught. The resultant metaphysical problem now is this: Does the man go round the squirrel or not? (1907: 27f)

James proposed that which answer is correct depends on what you ‘practically mean’ by ‘going round’. If you mean passing from north of the squirrel, east, south, then west, then the answer is ‘yes’. If, on the other hand, you mean in front of him, to his right, behind him, to his left, and then in front of him again, then the answer is ‘no’. After pragmatic clarification disambiguates the question, all dispute comes to an end. So James offers his pragmatism as a technique for clarifying concepts and hypotheses so that metaphysical disputes that appear irresoluble will be dissolved. A good example is the dispute between free will and determinism: once we compare the practical consequences of both positions we find no conflict.

As James admitted, he explained the pragmatic method through examples rather than a detailed analysis of what it involves. He did little to explain exactly what ‘practical consequences’ are. He also made no claim to originality: ‘Pragmatism represents a perfectly familiar attitude in philosophy, the empiricist attitude’, although he acknowledged that it did so ‘in a more radical and in a less objectionable form than it has ever yet assumed’ (1907: 31). It shared with other forms of empiricism an ‘anti-intellectualist tendency’ (ibid), and it recognized that theories (and presumably concepts) should be viewed as ‘instruments, not answers to enigmas’.

3. Pragmatist Theories of Truth

Peirce and James differed in how they applied their respective pragmatisms to clarifying the concept of truth. Peirce’s account of truth is presented as a means to understanding a concept that he claimed was vital for the method of science: reality (3.1). James used his account to defend pluralism about truth (3.2).

3.1 Peirce on Truth and Reality

The final section of ‘How to Make our Ideas Clear’ addresses the concept of reality. This concept seems clear: ‘every child uses it with perfect confidence...’ Thus it reaches Peirce’s first level of meaning-clarity. A second-level verbal definition is also readily forthcoming: ‘we may define the real as that whose characters are independent of what anybody may think them to be.’ But, Peirce announces, if our idea of reality is to be ‘perfectly clear’, we need to apply the Pragmatic Maxim. At this stage the concept of truth enters the discussion: Peirce claims that the object represented in a true proposition is our best understanding of the real. So we must turn to his remarks about truth to see how this works.

His pragmatic clarification of truth is expressed as follows:

The opinion which is fated to be ultimately agreed to by all who investigate, is what we mean by the truth, and the object represented in this opinion is the real. That is the way I would explain reality. (EP1: 139)

Seven years earlier, in a review of a new edition of the writings of Berkeley, Peirce had described this way of thinking as the ‘realist conception of reality’ (EP1:88–9), in contrast with a ‘nominalist conception of reality’ which many early modern philosophers took for granted. Nominalists assume that the real can only be the antecedent cause of singular sensations which provide our evidence for beliefs about the external world. This naturally leads to a certain (age-old) solipsistic skepticism concerning whether a person can gain knowledge that transcends their own perceptions and epistemic perspective. Peirce’s pragmatist clarification of truth offers an alternative conceptualization of ‘being constrained by reality’, in terms of consequent convergence of opinion, through the process of inquiry, rather than as an antecedent cause of sensations.

All this has led Peirce’s account of truth to be expressed in the slogan: truth is the end of inquiry, where ‘end’ is to be understood not as a ‘finish’ (some point in time when all human questions will be settled) but as a goal, telos or final cause. This original understanding of truth has faced challenges that it is ‘too realist’ insofar as it takes for granted that inquiry will converge on just one answer to any given question. Here Bertrand Russell asked, ‘Is this an empirical generalization from the history of research? Or is it an optimistic belief in the perfectibility of man?’, concluding, ‘Whatever interpretation we adopt, we seem committed to some very rash assertion.’ (1939: 146). Similarly, Quine wrote, ‘…we have no reason to suppose that man’s surface irritations even unto eternity admit of any one systematization that is scientifically better or simpler than all possible others’ (1960: 23). However, later in life Peirce urged that the hypothesis of monistic convergence is best viewed as a regulative hope. In 1908, Peirce wrote to a friend, ‘I do not say that it is infallibly true that there is any belief to which a person would come if he were to carry his inquiries far enough. I only say that that alone is what I call Truth’ (cited Haack 1976: 246).

At the same time, others have criticised Peirce’s account of truth for not being realist enough, due to its ‘internal realist’ definition of truth in terms of belief and inquiry. Can there not be claims which no-one ever inquires into or believes, which are nonetheless true? What about ‘lost facts’, such as the number of cakes on a tray during a long-ago party? Here Peirce arguably doubles down on his fallibilism (Legg 2014: 211). How can we be sure that no amount of inquiry will settle such matters?

… it is unphilosophical to suppose that, with regard to any given question (which has any clear meaning), investigation would not bring forth a solution of it, if it were carried far enough… Who can be sure of what we shall not know in a few hundred years? (EP1: 140)

The objectivism of Peirce’s account of truth derives not from a world entirely external to our minds (a famously difficult thing to know), but from the potential infinity of the community of inquiry, which exposes all of our beliefs to future correction: ‘reality is independent, not necessarily of thought in general, but only of what you or I or any finite number of [persons] may think about it…’ (EP1: 139). By means of this mathematical analysis, Peirce deftly synthesises insights from traditional realisms and idealisms (Legg 2014: 212; Lane 2018).

3.2 James on Truth

James departed from Peirce in claiming that pragmatism was itself a theory of truth, and his writings on this topic rapidly became notorious. They are characteristically lively, offering contrasting formulations, engaging slogans, and intriguing claims which often seem to fly in the face of common sense. In his own words:

The true is the name of whatever proves itself to be good in the way of belief, and good, too, for definite assignable reasons. (1907: 42)

‘The true’, to put it very briefly, is only the expedient in the way of our thinking, just as ‘the right’ is only the expedient in the way of our behaving. Expedient in almost any fashion; and expedient in the long run and on the whole, of course. (1907: 106)

Other formulations fill this out by giving a central role to experience:

Ideas … become true just in so far as they help us to get into satisfactory relation with other parts of our experience. (1907: 34)

Any idea upon which we can ride …; any idea that will carry us prosperously from any one part of our experience to any other part, linking things satisfactorily, working securely, saving labor; is true for just so much, true in so far forth, true instrumentally. (1907: 34)

This might be taken to suggest that beliefs are made true by the fact that they enable us to make accurate predictions of the future run of experience, but other passages suggest that the ‘goodness of belief’ can take other forms. James assures us that it can contribute to the truth of a theological proposition that it has ‘a value for concrete life’ (1907: 40); and this can occur because the idea of God possesses a majesty which can ‘yield religious comfort to a most respectable class of minds’ (1907:40). This suggests that a belief can be made true by the fact that holding it contributes to our happiness and fulfilment. Such passages may seem to support Bertrand Russell’s famous objection that James is committed to the truth of “Santa Claus exists” (Russell 1946: 772). This is unfair; at best, James holds that the happiness that belief in Santa Claus provides is truth-relevant. He might call the belief ‘good for so much’ but it would only be ‘wholly true’ if it did not ‘clash with other vital benefits’. It is easy to see how, unless it is somehow insulated from the broader effects of acting upon it, belief in Santa Claus could lead to many surprising and disappointing experiences.

4. Pragmatist Epistemology

The pragmatists saw their epistemology as providing a return to common sense and experience, rejecting a flawed philosophical heritage which had distorted the work of earlier thinkers. The errors to be overcome include Cartesianism, nominalism, and the ‘copy theory of truth’: these are all related.

4.1 Skepticism versus Fallibilism

The roots of pragmatism’s anti-skepticism can be found in Peirce’s early (1868) paper ‘Some Consequences of Four Incapacities’ (EP1: 28–30). Here he identifies ‘Cartesianism’ as a philosophical pathology that lost sight of certain insights that were fundamental to scholastic thought (for all its faults), and – he argued – more suited to the philosophical needs of his own time. The paper begins by identifying four problematic teachings of modern philosophy:

1. One can and should doubt all one’s beliefs at once.
2. The ultimate test of certainty lies in individual consciousness.
3. The ‘multiform argumentation’ characteristic of the Middle Ages should be replaced by a single chain of inference.
4. Where scholasticism consciously limited its explanatory capacity (purporting to explain only ‘all created things’), ironically, Cartesianism’s stated ambition to explain everything renders its own presuppositions hidden, mysterious and philosophically dangerous.

The first, and most important of these Cartesian teachings was the method of universal doubt, whereby we should retain only beliefs that are absolutely certain. The test of this certainty, as Peirce next points out, lies in whether the individual consciousness is satisfied. Importantly, this self-examination includes reflection on hypothetical possibilities: we cannot trust our perceptual beliefs, for example, because we cannot rule out that they might be produced by a dream, or an evil demon. (See Hookway 2012, ch. 2,3.) The initial pragmatist response is that this is a strategy that in practice we cannot carry out effectively, and there is no reason to adopt it anyway. Peirce claims that any attempt to adopt the method of doubt will be an exercise in self-deception because we possess a variety of certainties which it does not occur to us can be questioned. So there will be no ‘real doubt’; these beliefs will lurk in the background, influencing our reflection. Peirce urges us not to ‘pretend to doubt in philosophy what we do not doubt in our hearts’ (EP1: 29).

It is necessary to separate some different threads in this argument. First, there is something unnatural about the Cartesian strategy. Inquiries normally occur within a context: we address particular questions or problems, relying on background certainties that it does not occur to us to doubt. The Cartesian suggestion that we should begin by trying to doubt everything appears to be an attempt to step outside of this. Second, the Cartesian strategy requires us to reflect upon each of our beliefs and ask what reason we have for holding it; skeptical challenges are then used to question the adequacy of these reasons. This is again at odds with normal practice. Many of our familiar certainties are such that we cannot offer any concrete or convincing reason for believing them. We tend to treat our established beliefs as innocent until ‘proven guilty’. The mere lack of a conclusive reason for belief does not itself provide a reason for doubt.

Descartes, of course, might have conceded this, but responded that his approach is required because once we allow error to enter our belief-corpus we may be unable to escape from its damaging effects. His was a time of methodological ferment, and he appreciated how many false beliefs he himself had acquired from his teachers. The pragmatist response here is to question some of Descartes’ assumptions about how we reason and form beliefs. First, his strategy is individualist and ‘to make single individuals absolute judges of truth is most pernicious’. Peirce noted that the natural sciences which were so conspicuously successful in Descartes’ day took a very different approach:

In sciences in which men come to agreement, when a theory has been broached, it is considered to be on probation until this agreement has been reached. After it is reached, the question of certainty becomes an idle one, because there is no one left who doubts it. We individually cannot reasonably hope to attain the ultimate philosophy which we pursue; we can only seek it, therefore, for the community of philosophers. (EP1: 29)

Peirce also questions Descartes’ understanding of reasoning in holding that we may rely on ‘a single thread of inference’ that is no stronger than its weakest link:

Philosophy ought to imitate the successful sciences in its methods, so far as to…trust rather to the multitude and variety of its arguments than to the conclusiveness of any one. Its reasoning should not form a chain which is no stronger than its weakest link, but a cable whose fibres may be ever so slender, provided they are sufficiently numerous and intimately connected. (EP1: 29)

Where the Cartesian holds that unless we begin from premises of which we can be absolutely certain we may never reach the truth, the pragmatist emphasises that, when we do go wrong, further discussion and investigation can identify and eliminate errors, which is our best hope for escaping their damaging effects. The possibility of error provides us with reason to be ‘contrite fallibilists’, not skeptics. The focus of epistemological inquiry should not be on showing how we can possess absolute certainty, but on how we can develop self-correcting methods of inquiry that make fallible progress.

William James makes similar observations. In ‘The Will to Believe’, he reminds us that we have two cognitive desiderata: to obtain truth, and avoid error (James 1897: 30). The harder we try to avoid error, the more likely we will miss out on truth; and vice versa. The method of doubt may make sense in special cases where enormous weight is given to avoiding error, but only there. Once we recognize our practical and forced decision about the relative importance of two goods, the Cartesian strategy no longer appears the only rational one. Later, Dewey in The Quest for Certainty similarly urged that a focus on eliminating all error from our beliefs is both doomed and destructive, with the added twist of a social diagnosis of the quest itself: the uncertainty, pain and fear of much early human life led to the erection of ‘priestly’ forms of knowledge which, in promising to intercede with Heavenly stability, sundered a priori theory from a posteriori practice, thereby enabling the knowing classes to insulate themselves from a more humble (and realistic) empiricism. The ‘quest’ continues, however, in many debates in contemporary mainstream epistemology.

4.2 Inquiry

Where much analytic epistemology centres around the concept of knowledge, considered as an idealised end-point of human thought, pragmatist epistemology examines inquiry, considered as the process of knowledge-seeking, and how we can improve it. Pragmatist epistemologists often explore how we can inquire in a self-controlled and fruitful way, offering rich accounts of capacities or virtues that we must possess in order to inquire well, and rules or guiding principles that we should adopt. A canonical account is Peirce’s classic early paper “The Fixation of Belief”. Here Peirce states that inquiry is a struggle to replace doubt with ‘settled belief’, and that the only method of inquiry that can make sense of the fact that at least some of us are disturbed by inconsistent beliefs, and will subsequently reflect upon which methods of fixing belief are correct is the Method of Science, which draws on the Pragmatic Maxim described above. This contrasts with three other methods of fixing belief: i) refusing to consider evidence contrary to one’s favored beliefs (the Method of Tenacity), ii) accepting an institution’s dictates (the Method of Authority), iii) developing the most rationally coherent or elegant-seeming belief-set (the A Priori Method). Notable recent reinterpretations and defenses of Peircean epistemology include (Haack 1993 and Cooke 2007). (See also Skagestad 1981.)

Dewey’s conception of inquiry, found in his Logic: the Theory of Inquiry is also rich, and arguably more radical than Peirce’s in its underlying ontology (ED2: 169–79). Dewey sees inquiry as beginning with a problem; it aims for ‘the controlled or directed transformation of an indeterminate situation into one that is so determinate in its constituent distinctions and relations as to convert the elements of the original situation into a unified whole’ (ED2: 171). As John E. Smith notes, where ‘Peirce aimed at “fixing” belief, Dewey aimed at “fixing” the situation’ (1978: 98). It is important to note that here the situation is objectively indeterminate, and is itself transformed by inquiry. The ‘pattern of inquiry’ that Dewey describes is common to the information-gathering of animals, practical problem solving, common sense investigations of our surroundings and scientific inquiry. He recognizes that when we face a problem, our first task is to understand it through describing its elements and identifying their relations. Identifying a concrete question that we need to answer is a sign that we are making progress. And the ‘logical forms’ we use in the course of inquiry are understood as ideal instruments, tools that help us to transform things and resolve our problem. The continuities Dewey finds between different kinds of inquiry are evidence of his naturalism and his recognition that forms of scientific investigation can guide us in all areas of our lives. All the pragmatists, but most of all Dewey, challenge the sharp dichotomy that other philosophers draw between theoretical beliefs and practical deliberations. In some sense, all inquiry is practical, concerned with transforming and evaluating the features of situations in which we find ourselves. Shared inquiry directed at resolving social and political problems or indeterminacies was also central to Dewey’s conception of the good life and, relatedly, the democratic ideal: more on this below.

4.3 Pragmatist Conceptions of Experience

The Pragmatic Maxim suggests that pragmatism is a form of empiricism (an idea recently explored further in Wilson 2016). Yet most pragmatists adopted accounts of experience and perception radically different from the views of mainstream empiricists from John Locke and David Hume to Rudolf Carnap, as well as the ‘intuition’ posited by Kant. These empiricists interpreted experience as what is sometimes (following C.I. Lewis and Wilfrid Sellars) called ‘the given’: we are passive recipients of determinate and singular ‘sense-data’. Experience provides raw material for knowledge, but does not itself have content informed by concepts, practical needs, or anything else non-sensory, and our only contact with the external world is through receiving such experiences. This way of thinking about experience can easily lead to skepticism about the so-called ‘external world’.

In different ways, Peirce, James, and Dewey all argued that experience is far richer than this, and earlier philosophers were mistaken to claim that we could identify ‘experiences’ as antecedents to, or separable constituents of, cognition. We can begin with James’ radical empiricism, of which he said that ‘the establishment of the pragmatist theory of truth [was] a step of first-rate importance in making [it] prevail’ (1909: 6f). Its fundamental ‘postulate’ is that ‘the only things that shall be debatable among philosophers shall be things definable in terms drawn from experience’. But this requires that experience be newly understood. He announced that ‘the relations between things, conjunctive as well as disjunctive, are just as much matters of direct particular experience as the things themselves.’ Relatedly, ‘the parts of experience hold together from next to next by relations that are themselves parts of experience. The directly apprehended universe needs, in short, no extraneous trans-empirical connective support, but possesses in its own right a concatenated or continuous structure.’

Peirce too emphasizes the continuous character of perceptual experience, adding that we directly perceive external things as ‘other’ to ourselves, that we can perceive necessary connections between objects and events, and that experience contains elements of generality (citing a picture of a connected series of circles which can be seen as a stone wall, in the manner of Wittgenstein’s famous duck-rabbit diagram). Around 1902–3, Peirce developed a complex and original theory of perception which combines a percept which is entirely non-cognitive, with a perceptual judgement which is structured propositionally and lies in the space of reasons. In this way he seeks to capture how perception is both immediately felt and truth-evaluable. In contrast to standard British Empiricist analyses of the relation between impressions and ideas, Peirce does not claim that a perceptual judgment copies its percept. Rather, it indexes it, just as a weather-cock indicates the direction of the wind. Although percept and perceptual judgment are intrinsically dissimilar, over time certain habits of association between the two are reinforced, leading them to (literally) grow in our minds and link with other habits. This enables percepts and perceptual judgments to mutually inform and correct one another, to the point where every perception is fallible and subject to reinterpretation in the light of future perceptions (Rosenthal 1994; Wilson 2016). The end result is that, as Peirce puts it, in stark contrast to the accepted understanding of experience as ‘given’: ‘[n]othing at all…is absolutely confrontitional’, although, ‘the confrontitional is continually flowing in upon us’ (CP 7.653).

Dewey’s account of experience, which is central to his entire philosophy, contributes an additional twist. Like Peirce, he thought that experience was ‘full of inference’, but he arguably took the notion further from the contents of individual consciousness than any previous pragmatist. For Dewey, experience is a process through which we transact with our surroundings and meet our needs:

Like its congeners life and history, [experience] includes what men do and suffer, what they strive for, love, believe and endure, and also how men act and are acted upon, the ways in which they do and suffer, desire and enjoy, see, believe, imagine, in short, processes of experiencing (LW1:18).

What we experience is shaped by our habits of expectation and there is no basis for extracting from this complex process the kind of ‘thin given’ beloved of sense datum theorists. We experience all sorts of objects, events and processes, and just as experience is inextricable from the ‘external’ world of things, Nature (its co-ordinate concept: what is experienced) is inextricable from the ‘internal’ world of concepts.

In sharp contrast to Dewey, neopragmatism no longer takes experience as an explicit philosophical theme. Rorty began his (pre-pragmatist) philosophical career as an eliminative materialist, and the view survives in Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature, newly bolstered by Sellarsian concerns about the ‘myth of the given’. On this basis, Rorty declares that ‘Dewey should have dropped the term “experience” rather than redefining it… He should have agreed with Peirce that a great gulf divides sensation and cognition, [and] decided that cognition was possible only for language users…’ (Rorty 1998: 297). Similarly, Brandom focusses his attention exclusively on linguistic meaning (albeit in this case qua rationalist rather than empiricist), and has famously ruled that (as ‘blasphemy’ was to Oscar Wilde) ‘experience’ is ‘not one of his words’ (Brandom 2011: 197). This neopragmatist neglect of one of classical pragmatism’s central concepts has become a major point of contention on the part of many New Pragmatists (e.g. Koopman 2007; Levine 2010, 2012; Sachs 2015).

4.4 Representations

Having discussed pragmatists’ views on the activity of inquiry and the thickness of experience, we turn to their accounts of the nature of thought. It has been common for philosophers to assume that the ‘content’ of a thought, judgment or proposition is a kind of intrinsic property. Perhaps it offers a ‘picture’ or ‘idea’ of some state of affairs, and we can identify this content simply by reflecting upon the item itself, and its structural properties. All pragmatists have rejected this idea as a key driver of an antinaturalistic Cartesian dualism. Instead, they have held that the content of a thought, judgment or proposition is a matter of the role it fills in our activities of inquiry, and should be explained by reference to how we interpret it or what we do with it. This shall be illustrated by considering three particular pragmatist views.

First, all of the classic pragmatists identified beliefs and other mental states as habits. According to Peirce, our beliefs ‘[g]uide our desires and shape our actions’ (EP1: 114). The content of a belief is determined by its role in determining our actions. This was reflected in Peirce’s formulations of his Pragmatic Maxim. In order to be clear about the content of a concept or hypothesis, we must reflect upon its role in determining what we should do in the light of our desires and our background knowledge. In Robert Brandom’s terminology, the philosopher ‘makes explicit’ aspects of our practice that are implicit in our habits and dispositions. The role of tacit habits of reasoning and acting in fixing our beliefs and guiding our actions is a theme that recurs in the work of the pragmatists, and is now finding strong echoes in recent empirically informed work on ‘4E’ cognition, which is embodied, embedded, enactive and extended. (For an accounts of this research area which explicitly engage classical pragmatism, see Menary 2007 and Gallagher 2017.)

The second illustration concerns a passage in which James defended his account of truth by urging that it was the concept used in successful science. He identified the ‘traditional view’ that, for early scientists, the ‘clearness, beauty and simplification’ provided by their theories led them to think that they had deciphered authentically the eternal thoughts of the Almighty. By contrast, contemporary scientists held that ‘no theory is absolutely a transcript of reality, but that any of them may from some point of view be useful …’. A scientific theory was to be understood as ‘an instrument: it is designed to achieve a purpose – to facilitate action or increase understanding’ (James 1907: 33). For James and Dewey, this holds of all our concepts and theories: we treat them as instruments to be judged by how well they achieve their intended purpose.

The third illustration comes from Peirce’s general theory of signs, or semiotics, which was developed entirely independently of the more well-known semiotics of Ferdinand de Saussure, and is one of the most original areas of his thought. Peirce’s semiotics offers an account of the contents of thoughts as well as language, visual media, music and any other item that can be said to have meaning (for introductions to this area of Peirce’s thought, see Liszka 1996; Short 2007). Unlike Saussure, Peirce insisted that the sign-relation was essentially triadic in structure, comprising a representation, an object and an interpretation. In other words: a sign is ‘about’ some object because it is understood, in subsequent thought, as a sign of that object. This subsequent thought Peirce calls the sign’s interpretant. In understanding or interpreting a sign, we may feel things about it (which at times Peirce called the emotional interpretant), undertake actions that are rational in the light of the sign and the other information we possess (the dynamic interpretant), or an indefinite number of inferences may be drawn from it (the logical interpretant) (Jappy 2016). Interpretation is generally a goal-directed activity and, once again, the content of a sign is determined by the ways in which we use it (or might do so).

A further triadic distinction deriving from Peirce’s theory of signs which has been influential in disciplines from Biology to Media Studies holds between three ways in which a sign may pick out its object:

1. by resembling it (or more generally, by possessing the very properties that the sign aims to signify), e.g. a map
2. by indicating it in some brute unmediated fashion, e.g. a weather-vane signifying the wind’s direction
3. via some arbitrary convention that must be learned, e.g. words in English.

These three kinds of signs Peirce termed: icon, index and symbol respectively. Meanwhile, the three ways in which a sign may give rise to its interpretant were categorised by Peirce as:

1. the rheme (essentially: a term)
2. the proposition
3. the argument

Peirce continued to richly evolve and clarify his sign theory right to the end of his life (Jappy 2016; Bellucci 2017), albeit by means of some rather forbidding special-purpose technical terminology.

5. Pragmatism’s Contribution in Other Areas of Philosophy

5.1 Philosophy of Religion

We have noted that a strong motivation for James’ interest in pragmatism was exploring truth in religion. He drew on his dual training in philosophy and psychology for his famous book The Varieties of Religious Experience: a unique compendium of testimonies concerning matters such as prayer, worship and mystical experience. These rich personal observations present an extended example of the ‘radical empiricism’ introduced in 4.3. James thereby trenchantly critiqued the intellectual methods of contemporary theology (‘the metaphysical monster which they offer to our worship is an absolutely worthless invention of the scholarly mind’ (James 1902: 447)). James also advanced a celebrated argument for religious faith in his paper “The Will to Believe”: that for questions that are living, forced and momentous (though only for those), ‘faith based on desire is certainly a lawful, and possibly an indispensable thing’. He thereby confronted his contemporary William Clifford’s evidentialist claim that, ‘It is wrong always, everywhere, and for anyone, to believe anything upon insufficient evidence’ (1877), generating a lively discussion which continues today (e.g. Bishop 2007; Aikin 2014).

Despite James’ efforts to tightly circumscribe his argument’s application, Peirce objected to such concessions in epistemology, calling the paper in a letter to James, ‘a very exaggerated utterance, such as injures a serious man very much’ (Misak 2013: 64). Peirce himself evolved from an early positivistic disdain for religious questions to producing his own theistic arguments in later life. In 1893, he published an essay entitled “Evolutionary Love”, which passionately contested the social Darwinism promulgated by many prominent thinkers in his era, most notably Herbert Spencer (Pearce 2020), which he called ‘The Gospel of Greed’. Here Peirce urges that amongst the three ways the Universe may unfold: (i) by chance, (ii) deterministically, (iii) through creative love, the third path is the highest and most likely to endure since ‘…growth comes only from love, from I will not say self-sacrifice, but from the ardent impulse to fulfill another’s highest impulse’ (CP 6.289). In his final years Peirce produced the remarkable essay “A Neglected Argument for the Reality of God”, where he argued for God’s reality, not existence, to signal an ontological priority of intelligible principles over efficient causes. The piece is structured into three argumentative layers: (i) The Humble Argument (an invitation to a phenomenological experiment) which is enfolded by, (ii) The Neglected Argument (an original version of the Ontological Argument) which is enfolded by, (iii) The Scientific Argument (a prophecy of the fullness of future scientific inquiry). Work is ongoing to draw out this unique piece’s full meaning.

Dewey turned his hand to religious questions in his 1934 book A Common Faith. Here he argued that – contrary to what many believe – removing faith in supernatural entities will not destroy religion, but rather set it free from the many ‘creeds and cults’ reflecting outdated social structures that currently survive fossilised inside religious institutions. Rather than being embodied by any kind of entity, he argued, the sacred is a phase or quality of experience, namely, ‘some complex of conditions that have operated to affect an orientation in life…that brings with it a sense of security and peace’ (LW9: 13). Such conditions might equally be found in a forest or art gallery as a church or temple. Despite its sophisticated argumentation and originality, as an explication of religious life Dewey’s approach has been considered abstract and somewhat anodyne.

5.2 Ethical and Political Philosophy

We’ve seen that philosophical pragmatism seeks to connect theory to practice. In ethics, it can seem natural to interpret this as recommending that normative notions be reduced to practical utility. Thus James embraced utilitarian ethics as one of the branches of pragmatism (James 1907). Peirce, however, took a different view. Initially (around 1898) his naturalism led him to advocate a sentimentalism according to which ethical questions should be settled by instinct, as our conscious reasoning is too recently evolved and fallible to determine ‘vitally important matters’. But around 1902 he began to warm towards ethical theorising, as he developed a philosophical architectonic which placed ethics directly prior to logic, since ethics studies what is good in action, and logic studies what is good in thought, which is a species of action. He noted, though, that such a ‘normative science’ should be understood to study what goodness is, not whether particular actions are good (by contrast to much normative ethics today) since, ‘a science cannot have for its fundamental problem to distribute objects among categories of its own creation’ (CP 2.198). Recently scholars have turned with renewed interest to developing Peirce’s ethics (e.g. Massecar 2016; Atkins 2016).

A rich and systematic early contribution to pragmatist value theory was made by Alain Locke, who wrote, ‘the gravest problem of contemporary philosophy is how to ground some normative principle or criterion of objective validity for values without resort to dogmatism and absolutism on the intellectual plane, and without falling into their corollaries, on the plane of social behavior and action, of intolerance and mass coercion’ (Locke 1935: 336). Locke taught that the distinctive feeling-qualities that values give rise to in us are our ultimate guide in studying them, although function has an important secondary role to play. He held the resulting axiology to be pluralist, as well as culturally relativist.

Dewey also sought to steer ethics between the traditional poles of an objectivism derived from some kind of human-transcendent authority, and a subjectivism derived from individual preference. He believed that both views err in granting the moral agent an identity prior to interactions with others. For Dewey, we are more frail beings than this, embedded in a sociality that runs much deeper, and the purpose of moral theory is to provide constructive methods for addressing human problems of a particular kind: those in which we find ourselves unable to choose between equally valuable ends, with a dearth of salient habits with which to cross the breach. With regard to such questions, much effort is required to clear away traditional ethical theory’s pretensions to deliver a spurious settled certainty. Progress can be made by recognising the inherent uncertainty of moral problems and the complexities of moral experience (Hildebrand 2008: 73), and being willing to inquire anew in every moral context, drawing from a variety of scientific disciplines, in order to lay down new intelligent habits. The evolution of Dewey’s ethical thinking across his long career is richly explored in (Welchman 1995). A notable recent attempt to develop a pragmatist metaethics drawing on classical pragmatism is (Heney 2016).

We noted above that Dewey’s ‘second generation’ pragmatists turned wholeheartedly to questions concerning social progress, contributing significantly to the activism and reforms of the so-called Progressive Era (1896-1917). As such, political philosophy has been an abiding interest within pragmatism. Dewey famously thematised democracy philosophically – as more than simply a system of government, rather, an ideal of egalitarianism and open communication which calls forth the potential contributions of every person to the greater good, and should equally be reached for in civil society, workplaces and schools (more on the last below). Far from a jingoistic apologist, Dewey was strongly critical of US democracy, arguing in support of a socialised economy, particularly during the Great Depression. He claimed that US adherence to classical liberal individualism grievously misunderstands how we become persons only in relation to one another, and the state can be said to represent us only so far as we ‘are possessed of unity of purpose and interest’ (EW1: 232. See also Westbrook 1991). Although Dewey’s democratic ideal received strong contemporaneous critique from ‘realists’ such as Walter Lippman and F.A. Hayek, some of his ideas find expression today in theories of deliberative democracy, which descend in part from ‘neopragmatist’ Habermas. A notable example is Christopher Ansell’s proposal for a new ‘problem-solving democracy’ (Ansell 2011. See also Westbrook 2005). Other pragmatist political philosophers advocate for Peirce’s more realist conception of inquiry over Dewey’s, as a superior ground for democratic deliberation (Hoopes 1998; Misak 1999; Talisse 2008). For a useful comparative summary of the political philosophies of major pragmatist thinkers, see (Festenstein 1997). For recent work on pragmatist approaches to justice, see (Dieleman et al 2017). As noted earlier, pragmatist philosophers may be found advocating for many contemporary liberatory projects (for a recent example, see McBride 2021).

5.3 Aesthetics

When (around 1902) Peirce defined ethics as a normative science directly prior to logic, he also defined aesthetics as a normative science directly prior to ethics (since aesthetics studies goodness in and of itself, which may then be used to understand good action). This focus on the intrinsically good or admirable broadens the purview of aesthetics, which Peirce claims ‘has been handicapped by the definition of it as the theory of beauty’ (CP 2.199, 1902). Aesthetics is one of the least well worked-out areas of Peirce’s philosophy; nevertheless he says some intriguing and suggestive things about it. For instance he argues that the so-called summum bonum (ultimate good) really consists in the growth of ‘concrete reasonableness’ (CP 1.602; 1.615; 2.34; 5.121; 5.433), as the only phenomenon ‘whose admirableness is not due to an ulterior reason’ must be the furthering of Reason itself (CP 1.615, 1903). Recent further development of this framework includes (Kaag 2014; Gava 2014).

James did not make sustained contributions to aesthetics, but Dewey did, particularly in his 1934 book Art as Experience. Dewey viewed aesthetic appreciation as a peak human experience and ‘the greatest intellectual achievement in the history of humanity’ (LW10:31, cited in Hildebrand 2008: 146). Consequently the most important question in this area of philosophy is not how to define necessary and sufficient conditions for Art, but how to enable ordinary people to enjoy more of it, so that their lives might be more meaningful. The way forward, Dewey suggested, is to learn to fetishize professionally-curated contexts and Art objects less, in order to open our eyes to consummatory experiences as they occur in the everyday experience of the ‘live creature’. Examples of such consummations include: ‘[a] piece of work is finished in a way that is satisfactory; a problem receives its solution; a game is played through…’ (LW10:42). In contrast to such integrated completions within experience, both hedonistic dissipation and rigid self-control count as ‘anesthetic’. True art alternates between doing and undergoing. Notable recent work building on Dewey’s aesthetics includes Richard Shusterman’s somaesthetics, which extends pragmatism’s defining interest in agency to exploring the complex role of the human body in aesthetic experience (Shusterman 1992; 2012).

5.4 Philosophy of Education

Peirce had some insightful things to say about pedagogy which anticipate today’s ‘inquiry-based learning’ and ‘research-led teaching’, but they are scattered across his writings (Strand 2005). The giant figure in philosophy of education is of course Dewey, who pioneered it as a separate sphere of study when he assumed the philosophy chair at University of Chicago in 1894. It is important to note that this key move of Dewey’s took place in a much broader context of reform-oriented, hands-on ‘experiments in living’ by pragmatist-aligned thinkers and activists, many of whom were female political and educational reformers (Gordon 1990). An outstanding example is Jane Addams, who in 1889, with Ellen Gates Starr, established Hull House in an impoverished immigrant neighborhood of Chicago. Here, as part of a wider discovery of the possibilities of social work, Addams innovated a pedagogy which used students’ own experiences as starting points for learning (Addams 1985; Fischer 2006; 2019; Knight 2005; 2010). Hull House exercised a crucial influence on the Laboratory School that Dewey later (1896) opened at University of Chicago with the help of his wife, Alice Chipman Dewey. W.E.B. DuBois also made significant contributions to the settlement movement: he was hired that same year by the University of Pennsylvania in connection with the Philadelphia College Settlement in order to study ‘the social condition of the colored people of the Seventh Ward of Philadelphia’ (Pearce 2020: 266). It is worth pondering the consonance of these ventures with pragmatism’s teachings on closing the gap between theory and lived experience, and asking what may have led pragmatist philosophers back to the text-based, scholarly approaches we largely see today.

Dewey’s career as philosopher of education coincided with a period in which North America’s population was rapidly growing, industrializing and urbanizing, shifting education delivery out of the home into public institutions, and his ideas had enormous impact. Many of his suggestions derive from his (aforementioned) vision of democracy as not merely a system of voting, but the idea that every societal institution might be designed to foster maximum flourishing in every citizen. Viewed from this angle, traditional modes of schooling whereby teachers deliver an approved (often employer-sanctioned) set of ‘facts’ for children to memorise count as despotic. Instead the emphasis should be on enabling children to grow from within, according to their present interests and capabilities, and become lifelong learners, although Dewey equally criticises certain romantic, ‘child-centred’ educational theorists of his day for neglecting to direct or guide the child’s interests in any particular direction (Hildebrand 2008: 127). It’s also worth noting that Dewey sees education as primarily a social not an individual process since, as noted above, he views human identity-formation as irremediably social.

The result is a ‘problem-centred pedagogy’ which looks to pragmatist epistemology understood as theory of inquiry for its structure. The teacher begins by facilitating contact with some phenomenon which proves genuinely puzzling to the students, then guides them through a process which (if all goes well) resolves the problematic situation to the satisfaction of all present. This ‘cycle of inquiry’ was formalised and developed further by Dewey’s student Matthew Lipman as the basis of a worldwide Philosophy for Children movement (Lipman et al 1977). It includes as stages: articulating the problem and questions which might need to be answered in its resolution, gathering data, suggesting hypotheses which might potentially resolve the problem, and testing or otherwise evaluating those hypotheses. Opening up the classroom to such ‘live’ thinking generates unpredictability which can be challenging for the teacher to manage, but if the genuine indeterminacy of the problematic situation can be successfully navigated, the reward will be students who have learned not just how to know, but how to think. In that regard, Dewey claimed that his writings on education summed up his entire philosophical position (Hildebrand 2008: 124). For Dewey, all philosophy was philosophy of education.

Bibliography

Primary Texts of Classical Pragmatists

For reasons of space, preference is given to comprehensive collections and critical editions.

• Addams, J., 1910 [1990], Twenty Years at Hull House, with Autobiographical Notes, Urbana, IL: University of Illinois Press.
• –––, 1902 [2002], Democracy and Social Ethics, edited with introduction by C. H. Seigfried, Urbana, IL: University of Illinois Press.
• –––, 1922 [2003], Peace and Bread in Time of War: Jane Addams’s Writings on Peace, edited with introductions by M. Fischer and J. Whipps, Bristol: Thoemmes Press.
• –––, 1985 [revised 1994]. On Education, collection of essays edited by E.C. Lagemann, New Brunswick, NJ: Transaction Publishers.
• –––, 2002. The Jane Addams Reader, edited by J.B. Elstain, New York: Basic Books.
• Dewey, J., 1999. The Essential Dewey (two volumes edited by Hickman, L. and Alexander, T.), Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999. (When possible, references to Dewey’s writings are given to this collection. They take the form ED n: m – to page m of volume n)
• –––, 1981–91. John Dewey: The Later Works, Carbondale: Southern Illinois University Press. (References to Dewey’s writings in this collection take the form LW n: m – to page m of volume n)
• DuBois, W.E.B., 2007. The Oxford W.E.B. DuBois, (nineteen volumes edited by Gates Jr, H.L.), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Follett, M.P., 1918. The New State: Group Organization, the Solution of Popular Government, New York: Longmans, Green.
• –––, 1924 [1951]. Creative Experience, New York: Peter Smith Publishers.
• James, W., 1890. The Principles of Psychology, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1981.
• –––, 1897. The Will to Believe and Other Popular Essays in Philosophy, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1979.
• –––, 1902. The Varieties of Religious Experience, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1902.
• –––, 1907. Pragmatism: A New Name for some Old Ways of Thinking, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1975.
• –––, 1909. The Meaning of Truth, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1975.
• Locke, A., 1989. The Philosophy of Alain Locke: Harlem Renaissance and Beyond, edited by L. Harris, Philadelphia: Temple University Press.
• Mead, G.H., 1934. Mind, Self and Society, Chicago: University of Chicago Press
• –––, 2011. G.H. Mead: A Reader, edited by F.C. da Silva, New York: Routledge.
• Peirce, C.S., 1992 and 1999. The Essential Peirce (two volumes edited by the Peirce Edition Project), Bloomington: Indiana University Press. (References to Peirce’s writings in this collection take the form EPn: m – to page m of volume n)
• –––, 1982–. Writings of Charles S. Peirce (a critical edition of Peirce’s entire oeuvre, arranged chronologically and edited by the Peirce Edition Project. So far 8 volumes have been released, covering the time-period up to 1892), Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
• –––, 1976. New Elements of Mathematics ed. Eisele, C. (Peirce’s writings on mathematics and related topics: four volumes in five books), The Hague: Mouton, Humanities Press (reprinted in 2011 by De Gruyter).
• –––, 1931–1958. Collected Papers, vol. 1–7 ed. Hartshorne, C., and Weiss, P., vol 8 ed. Burks, A.. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press. (References to Peirce’s writings in this collection take the form CPn.m – to paragraph m of volume n)

• Royce, J., 1897 [2000]. The Conception of God, New York: Macmillan; new edition with introduction by R.E. Auxier, Bristol: Thoemmes Press.
• –––, 1901 [1976]. The World and the Individual, Gloucester, MA: Peter Smith.
• –––, 1908 [1995]. The Philosophy of Loyalty, Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press.
• –––, 2005. The Basic Writings of Josiah Royce, two volumes edited by J.J. McDermott, New York: Fordham University Press.

Collections of Papers by Classic and Contemporary Pragmatists.

• Goodman, R. (ed.), 1995. Pragmatism, London: Routledge.
• ––– (ed.), 2005. Pragmatism: Critical Concepts in Philosophy (four volumes covering: volume one: Pragmatism’s first decade; volume two: metaphysics and epistemology; volume three: moral and political issues; volume four: neopragmatism and aesthetics). London: Routledge.
• Haack, S. and Lane, R. (eds.), 2006. Pragmatism, Old and New: Selected Writings, Amherst NY: Prometheus.
• Menand, L. (ed.), 1998. Pragmatism, New York: Random House.
• Stuhr, J.J. (ed.), 1999. Pragmatism and Classical American Philosophy: Essential Readings and Interpretive Essays, New York: Oxford University Press.
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