The Psychology of Normative Cognition

From an early age, humans exhibit a tendency to identify, adopt, and enforce the norms of their local communities. Norms are the social rules that mark out what is appropriate, allowed, required, or forbidden in different situations for various community members. These rules are informal in the sense that although they are sometimes represented in formal laws, like the rule governing which side of the road to drive on, they need not be explicitly codified to effectively influence behavior. There are rules that forbid theft or the breaking of promises, but also rules that govern how close it is appropriate to stand to someone while talking to them, or how loud one should talk during the conversation. Thus understood, norms regulate a wide range of activity. They exhibit cultural variability in their prescriptions and proscriptions, but the presence of norms in general appears to be culturally universal. Some norms exhibit characteristics that are often associated with morality, such as a rule that applies to everyone and prohibits causing unnecessary harm. Other norms apply only to certain people, such as those that delimit appropriate clothing for members of different genders, or those concerning the expectations and responsibilities ascribed to individuals who occupy positions of leadership. The norms that prevail in a community can be more or less fair, reasonable, or impartial, and can be subject to critique and change.

This entry provides an overview of interdisciplinary research into the psychology and evolution of norm-guided cognition, motivation, and behavior. The notions of a norm and normativity occur in an enormous range of research that spans the humanities and behavioral sciences. Researchers primarily concerned with the psychology distinctive of norm-governed behavior take what can be called a “cognitive-evolutionary” approach to their subject matter. This kind of approach, common in the cognitive sciences, draws on a variety of resources and evidence to investigate different psychological capacities. This entry describes how these have been used to construct accounts of those cognitive and motivational features of minds that underpin the capacity to acquire, conform to, and enforce norms. It also describes how theories of the selective pressures and adaptive challenges prominent in recent human evolution have helped to inform and constrain theorizing about this psychological capacity, as well as how its features can influence the transmission and cultural evolution of norms.

Section I begins by laying out the broad evolutionary perspective shared by theorists who take a cognitive-evolutionary approach to normative cognition, and against which many contemporary debates among them take place. It then goes on to map out several key psychological dimensions along which contemporary accounts of normative cognition differ. Section II reviews several areas of contemporary empirical and theoretical research into normative cognition, including questions about norms and cultural variability, the role of punishment and punitive motivations in normative cognition, the ontogeny of normative cognition, and debates about norm cognition in nonhuman animals. Section III focuses on the relationship between normative cognition and moral theory, broadly construed.

• 1. A Cognitive-Evolutionary Approach to Norms
  • 1.1 Normative Cognition and Human Evolution
  • 1.2 The Architecture of Normative Cognition
• 2. Contemporary Debates
  • 2.1 Norms and Cultural Variability
  • 2.2 The Ontogeny of Normative Cognition
  • 2.3 Normative Cognition In Nonhuman Animals
  • 2.4 Third-party Punishment and Normative Cognition
• 3. Normative Cognition and Morality
  • 3.1 Normative Cognition and Moral Psychology
  • 3.2 Normative Cognition and Moral Philosophy
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Cognitive-Evolutionary Approach to Norms

“Norms,” as we will use the term in this entry, refer to the rules of a group of people that mark out what is appropriate, allowed, required, or forbidden for various members in different situations. They are typically manifest in common behavioral regularities that are kept in place by social sanctions and social pressure. When a person is born into or otherwise enters a community, they need to be able to identify and extract information about the broad assortment of norms that shape it, who different norms apply to and when, and what the consequences of breaking them are. They must be able to see some behaviors as normatively regulated, and then to infer what the governing rule is. Learning about norms in these ways is sometimes guided via explicit mentoring (Sterelny 2012), but people, especially children, are able to acquire much of the relevant information and skills without intentional pedagogy (Schmidt, Rakoczy, & Tomasello 2011). Once a person adopts a norm, it functions both as a rule that guides behavior and as a standard against which behavior is evaluated. Individuals often become motivated to enforce as well as comply with the norms they adopt. Enforcement and punishment are broad categories, and can include correcting, communicating disapproval through body language or explicit criticism, ostracizing or gossiping about norm violators, even threatening or inflicting physical violence (but see also Westra & Andrews 2022). Thus, individuals become responsive to norms and the social pressure by which they are enforced, and motivated to apply social pressure to others who transgress. In this way, prevalent norms and standards of conduct are collectively maintained by a community, which in turn help stabilize the community’s social arrangements and the norms that structure them.

“Normative cognition” (or “norm psychology”) refers to the psychological mechanisms that explain how individuals learn, comply with, and enforce norms (c.f. Westra & Andrews, 2022; Andrews, Fitzpatrick, and Westra 2024; Heyes 2024). The central questions driving contemporary debates within the cognitive-evolutionary approach to norms concern the nature of these mechanisms: their causal structure, their proper functions, their neural bases, their ontogeny, and their evolutionary origins. This section will focus on the broad theoretical and methodological background of these debates. First, it will situate questions about normative cognition against the backdrop of contemporary theorizing about human evolution, especially concerning cooperation and culture. Then it will lay out key points of theoretical disagreement about the nature of the psychological mechanisms underlying normative cognition. But first, a few disclaimers about the scope of the entry as a whole are in order.

Importantly, while questions about the nature of norms are relevant to a range of debates in philosophy (and beyond), contemporary work on the psychology of norms is not primarily driven by one particular philosophical tradition or debate. Rather, it is motivated by a set of general issues concerning human nature: the structure and distinctive features of human minds, the pathways of human evolution that produced them, and the commonalities and differences between human minds and behaviors, on one hand, and those found in non-human species, on the other (Tomasello 1999; Richerson & Boyd 2005; Tooby & Cosmides 2005; J. Henrich 2015; Westra, Fitzpatrick, & Andrews 2024). One upshot of this is that theorists draw on the full range of explanatory resources made available by contemporary cognitive science. Thus, these accounts of normative cognition are not constrained by folk-psychological explanations of behavior, and so are free to posit and appeal to psychological mechanisms, states, and processes that need not bear much resemblance to beliefs and desires, credences and preferences, conscious deliberation and explicit inference.

This entry is organized around research whose focal point is the psychology distinctive of normative cognition. However, any discussion of norms and norm-guided behavior will involve, tacitly or otherwise, some picture or other of agents and the characteristics that make them responsive to normative influence. Some begin with analytic formalizations of the kinds of agents and mental states assumed by common sense folk psychology, and use these formalizations, along with various refinements, to account for different norm related phenomena. These fall beyond the scope of this entry, but see especially Bicchieri, Muldoon, and Sontuoso (2023) for an overview of such approaches (also see Bicchieri 2006, 2016; Brennan et al. 2013; Conte, Andrighetto, & Campennì 2013; Hawkins, Goodman, & Goldstone 2019; cf. Morris et al. 2015). It is also worth noting that the cognitive-evolutionary approach is sometimes presented as importantly different from classic rational choice approaches to human decision and social behavior (Boyd & Richerson 2001; Henrich, Boyd, et al. 2001, 2005). Whether these are genuinely distinct alternatives remains unclear (Elster 1991, cf. Wendel 2001), but those who make the case typically point to a growing body of evidence that suggests humans rarely approximate the unboundedly rational, purely self-interested agents of classical economics (Gigerenzer & Selten 2001; Kahneman 2011, cf. Millgram 2021. To illustrate, participants in one-time, anonymous cooperation games have been observed to routinely cooperate, even when they are made explicitly aware of their anonymity and the fact that they will play the game just once (Marwell & Ames 1981; see Thaler 1992 for a review). Those sympathetic to the cognitive-evolutionary approach to norms have an explanatory template for this kind of finding ready at hand, and will explain participants’ behavior by appeal to their norm psychology and the pro-social norms that they have internalized.

Finally, norms are often classified into kinds or subcategories, with common examples including moral, social, conventional, epistemic, aesthetic, and organizational norms. The correct or theoretically most useful way to taxonomize kinds of norms is the subject of much debate, but one that will be set aside here (see O’Neill 2017 for a review and Kelly (2022) for discussion). Rather, this section will sketch a general overview of the conceptual space common to cognitive-evolutionary work on the psychology of norms. Later sections will provide elaboration where it will help to locate different theories within that conceptual space and identify their distinguishing commitments.

1.1 Normative Cognition and Human Evolution

A hypothesis influential among those who take a cognitive-evolutionary approach is that the psychological mechanisms underlying norm psychology are evolved adaptations to important selection pressures in human evolutionary history (Richerson & Boyd 2005; Sripada & Stich 2007, Tomasello 2009; Chudek & Henrich 2011; Kelly & Davis 2018, cf. Cosmides & Tooby 1992; Heyes 2024).

It is widely agreed that humans are extraordinarily social animals, and that our hypertrophied abilities to learn from and cooperate with each other are key to what set us apart from our closest primate ancestors and other hominid species. A crucial difference is thought to be that human capacities to imitate and learn from each other became powerful enough to sustain cumulative culture (Tomasello 1999; J. Henrich & McElreath 2003, Laland 2017). Culture is understood as information that is transmitted between individuals and groups via behavior, rather than processes like genetic transmission (Ramsey 2013). Beliefs, preferences, norms, skills, techniques, information-containing artifacts, etc., are passed from individual to individual, and thus across populations and between generations, mainly by social learning (Mathew & Perreault 2015). For example, development of the set of techniques and skills associated with throwing spears, or the knowledge and tools enabling the controlled use of fire, have been tied to increases in opportunities for social learning provided by expanding social networks and more complex forms of social activity (Thieme 1997; Gowlett 2006). Culture is cumulative in the sense that the body of information in the cultural repository does not remain static, but can itself grow larger and more complex. Grass huts evolve into wood-frame houses, then brick buildings, and eventually skyscrapers. Tribal leaders evolve into kings, then emperors, then prime ministers. Simple sets of norms evolve into more complicated informal institutions, then byzantine formalized legal codes. As each generation adds its own new innovations, discoveries, and improvements, functional sophistication is accumulated in cultural traits in much the same way as it is accumulated in genetic traits.

This general evolutionary outlook gives reason to think that as human groups increased in size, they also grew in their capacity to carry more culture and produce more cultural innovations (Kline & Boyd 2010; J. Henrich 2015: chapter 12), though the causal relationship between population size and cultural complexity remains controversial (Fogarty & Creanza 2017, cf. Vaesen et al. 2016). As cultural innovations continued to accumulate, they allowed humans to more significantly control and reshape the environments in which they lived. Such transformations also reshaped the environments inhabited by subsequent generations, thus shifting the contours of the physical, social, and informational niches in which they evolved. Such changes, in turn, created a range of new selection pressures, many of which favored bodies, brains, and minds better equipped for sociality and cultural inheritance. Researchers continue to develop and debate the merits of different conceptual tools with which to conceive of this kind of evolutionary dynamic (Tomasello 1999; Laland, Odling-Smee, & Feldman 2001; Laland, Odling-Smee, & Myles 2010; Sterelny 2003, 2012; Richerson & Boyd 2005; Tennie, Call, & Tomasello 2009; Boyd, Richerson, & Henrich 2011, J. Henrich 2015; Boyd 2017).

Humans are able to inhabit a wide range of environments, and socially transmitted information—as opposed to innately specified and biologically transmitted information—is particularly useful in the face of ecological and social variation (Richerson & Boyd 2013). Information about which plants in various environments are edible and which are toxic has straightforward adaptive advantage. Information about what kinds of norms prevail in various social environments is also important, and knowing it allows individuals to smoothly participate in their community and coordinate with other members in an array of collective activities that ranges from producing food and raising children to responding to threats and dealing with outsiders (Chudek & Henrich 2011). While different types of cultural variants can be useful in different ways, not all socially transmittable information is equally valuable, and individuals are not indiscriminate social learners. Theorists posit that human minds evolved to contain a number of social learning biases or heuristics that help facilitate more selective learning. These influence which, of the many cultural variants to which an individual is exposed, she will actually adopt for herself. Two heuristics appear to be particularly important in amplifying the advantages of a system of cultural inheritance. One is a conformity bias, which prompts individuals to adopt those cultural variants that have been adopted by most others in their community (Muthukrishna, Morgan, & Henrich 2016), and another is a prestige bias, which sensitizes individuals to hierarchy and status, prompting them to model their behavior on those who have achieved success and high social rank (J. Henrich & Gil-White 2001; Cheng et al. 2012; Maner 2017). In addition to these two, researchers have posited other learning biases that can influence norm acquisition, including one that makes information about norms easier to remember than other, non-normative information about behavior (O’Gorman, Wilson, & Miller 2008).

Culture looms increasingly large in evolutionary explanations of human ultrasociality, i.e., our species’ ability to cooperate on a remarkably large scale (Tomasello 2009, 2016; Richerson 2013; though see Hagen & Hammerstein 2006; Burnham & Johnson 2005 for alternative views, and Sterelny, Calcott, & Fraser 2013 for broader context on the evolution of cooperation). An increasingly prominent idea is that explaining the full range of behaviors involved in human sociality will require some appeal not just to culture in general, but to culturally transmitted norms and institutions in particular (Mathew, Boyd, & van Veelen 2013). Some have taken the significance and complexity of the adaptive challenges posed by large-scale cooperation to have implications for human psychology, arguing from these grounds that human minds have a capacity specific to norms (Chudek, Zhao, & Henrich 2013), which may have evolved in tandem with our capacities for language (Lamm 2014). Others argue further that cultural group selection, generated by various forms of competition between cultural groups like communities, tribes, clans, and even nations, has contributed to the spread of more effective cooperative norms (Turchin 2018; Richerson, Baldini, et al. 2016, though see Krasnow et al. 2015). Still others agree that culture and social learning are central to the evolution of normative cognition, but argue that core elements of normative cognition first evolved as an adaptation for transmitting complex craft and motor skills, such as those required for toolmaking (Birch, 2021).

On these views, culture-driven selective pressures further remodeled human social psychology, supplementing more evolutionarily ancient social instincts to form what have been called tribal social instincts (Richerson & Boyd 2001; Boyd & Richerson 2008; Richerson & Henrich 2012). This family of evolutionarily recent “instincts” is posited as including a capacity for norms, but also other psychological features thought to refine norm-guided behavior in various ways, including sensitivities to markers of tribal membership and the boundaries between ethnic groups (McElreath, Boyd, & Richerson 2003) and social emotions like guilt, pride, and loyalty.

1.2 The Architecture of Normative Cognition

The theoretical toolkit common in the cognitive and behavioral sciences affords theorists several dimensions along which they can stake out and explore more specific views about human normative psychology. The following list of such dimensions is not exhaustive, but it gives a sense of some of the most significant ones. The psychological mechanisms posited by different accounts of normative cognition can differ with respect to

1. Whether and to what extent they are fast, automatic, intuitive, non-conscious, or otherwise fit the description of “type 1” cognition, or are slow, controlled, effortful, conscious, or otherwise fit the description of “type 2” cognition
2. Whether and to what extent they use proprietary mental representations to store information about norms, and if so the format and content of those mental representations
3. Whether and to what extent they are the product of innate, domain-specific adaptations or of domain general processes
4. Whether and to what extent the motivation associated with the mechanisms is intrinsic or instrumental

The first dimension concerns a distinction between type 1 and type 2 cognitive processes made by dual processing and dual systems theories (see Frankish 2010 for a review, Cushman, Young, & Greene 2010). Type 1 processes are typically characterized as “fast and frugal,” intuitive, heuristic processes which deliver “rough-and-ready” responses (Gigerenzer et al. 2000). These processes are automatic, unconscious, and prone to error, but they make up in speed and resource-efficiency what they lack in precision. Type 2 processes, by contrast, are typically characterized as slower, rule-based, analytical processes which require more concentration and cognitive effort, take place consciously, and deliver more precise responses. The mechanisms of normative cognition appear to cross-cut this distinction. There is considerable evidence that normative cognitive operates in an intuitive and implicit manner, shaping our social motivations and thinking in ways that we hardly notice (Reber & Norenzayan, 2018; Bear et al. 2020; Kalkstein et al. 2022). However, we also clearly have the capacity to explicitly represent, reason about, teach, and question the norms around us (Kelly, 2022; Heyes, 2024). Thus, one important challenge for theories of normative cognition is to explain how implicit, Type 1 and explicit, Type 2 processes each contribute to normative behavior.

Commitments about whether normative cognition is supported by Type 1 or Type 2 processes could support different views about the extent to which normatively governed expectations and behavior require or are susceptible to voluntary control. If the processes subserving the capacity for norms are to some degree automatic and unconscious, and are insensitive to changes a person makes to her explicit beliefs, judgments, or volitions, those processes would be able to affect her behavior without the need of any guidance from her will, and could help produce behaviors and judgments that oppose it. Research on implicit bias may provide useful resources for thinking about the relationship between normative cognition and voluntary control. Recent work sheds light on what kind of intervention strategies are effective (Lai et al. 2014; Devine et al. 2012; Mack 2024), and suggests that deliberate cognitive effort and voluntary control can, under certain conditions, override the influence of implicit and automatic cognition. Turning to normative cognition, research suggests that self-control may be required to violate a norm one has internalized, such as the norm against breaking promises (Baumgartner et al. 2009), but the details remain unclear (Peach, Yoshida, & Zanna 2011; Yoshida et al. 2012; also see Kelly (2022a) for discussion of differences between internalized and avowed norms).

The second dimension concerns the extent to which normative cognition involves explicit representations of rules. Norms are often characterized in terms of rules (including in this entry), but it is not always clear what this implies about the psychological processes that lead us to comply with and enforce them. One possibility is that our norm psychology stores information about local norms as sentence-like representations in the head (i.e. imperative as opposed to declarative or interrogative sentences). One advantage of positing such sentential representations is that they appear able to explain the specificity that characterize many norms. However, this possibility raises difficult questions about the format of these sentence-like representations (Heyes 2024). If normative rules are exclusively represented as sentences in natural languages like English, this would have potentially radical implications about the evolution and development of norm psychology. It would seem to imply, for example, that language evolved before normative cognition, and that non-linguistic creatures such as infants and nonhuman animals lack the capacity for norms. It would also render various “implicit” aspects of norm psychology somewhat mysterious. Sentence-like representations of norms would fit well within a language of thought framework (Fodor 1975, Rescorla 2019, Quilty-Dunn et al 2023), but this framework remains controversial. Other researchers have posited several alternative ways of making sense of normative cognition that do not require explicit, rule-based representations. Birch (2021), for example, has suggested that norm-guided behavior is governed by causally structured, model-based representations whose primary function is to guide skilled action. Colombo (2014) has proposed that norms are implicitly represented by reinforcement learning systems through stored maps of the reward structures of different environments. Westra and Andrews (2022) suggest that some norms may not be represented in individual minds at all, but are simply the emergent products of recurrent patterns of social interaction. They endorse a pluralistic approach to norm psychology that can accommodate the possibility that some instances of normative behavior involve explicit, sentential representations of rules, while other instances involve non-linguistic model-based representations, while still others do not involve any explicit representations at all.

The third dimension concerns the extent to which the mechanisms that support normative cognition are innate and domain-specific: specialized for dealing with certain kinds of problems, responding to distinctive kinds of cues, and processing specific types of information (similar to innate perceptual mechanisms for e.g. detecting faces and biological motion). In contrast are views that see norm psychology as supported mostly by general-purpose cognition, processes like classical conditioning or statistical learning that handle relatively unrestricted kinds of information and contribute to solving a wide range of problems. Notably, researchers have invoked notions of domain-specificity and domain-generality in many different ways across the cognitive sciences (see Laurence & Margolis 2023), and the range of theoretical options recently developed by those working on normative cognition is impressive.

For example, several theorists have sought to develop an analogy between Chomskyan theories of language acquisition and use, on one hand, and the acquisition and application of (what they call) moral rules, on the other (Mikhail 2007, 2011; Dwyer, Huebner, & Hauser 2010; Hauser, Young, & Cushman 2008; Roedder & Harman 2010; see section 3.1 below for more debates over which rules and norms might count as moral, and over the scope of “moral” more generally). This approach posits a universal psychological competence that guides learning specifically in the domain of morality, and contains enough innately specified structure to account for the putative poverty of stimulus that children face when attempting to learn the norms that prevail in their local environment (see Laurence & Margolis 2001 for discussion of poverty of the stimulus arguments in cognitive science). Some advocates also suggest that in addition to information specifying the structure of the mechanisms dedicated to acquiring and processing these rules, a few particular norms themselves may also be included as part of this innate capacity, perhaps norms against incest or intentionally causing harm (e.g., Mikhail 2007, 2011). For direct criticisms of this approach, see Prinz (2008) and Sterelny (2012).

Another prominent kind of view posits the existence of a specialized norm system–an integrated suite of cognitive mechanisms dedicated to learning, storing, complying with, and enforcing norms as such (e.g., Sripada & Stich, 2006, described in detail below). Others who have developed this idea emphasize the ways in which norm psychology appears to be more of a kludge (see Marcus 2007) made up of many distinguishable, domain-specific subsystems. These evolved piecemeal and independently, each to solve its own specific adaptive problem (e.g., challenges related to selective social learning, cooperation, parasite avoidance, etc.) but in normative cognition have come to exhibit a significant degree of functional integration and operational cohesion (Kelly & Davis 2018, Kelly 2020, also see Richerson & Boyd 2001, Stich 2006).

Others have explored the potential of domain-general processes to explain aspects of norm psychology, arguing that they are better able to account for many of its aspects, including how norms are learned (e.g., by detecting statistical regularities in the behaviors of ingroup members (Nichols et al 2016; Gaus & Nichols 2017; Ayars & Nichols 2017, 2019; Nichols, 2021; Roberts, 2022; Partington, Nichols, & Kushnir 2023)), as well as the motivation to comply and enforce them (e.g., by pointing to affective costs of the disfluency that comes from norm deviations (Birch 2021, Theriault, Young, & Barrett, 2021)). Meanwhile, proponents of pluralistic approaches have argued that normative cognition is supported by a highly heterogeneous mix of domain-general and domain-specific processes, and which ones are involved in any given episode of norm-relevant behavior is likely to vary from one to the next (Westra & Andrews, 2022).

Celia Heyes has deployed her general cognitive gadgets framework (see Heyes 2018) to develop an account that similarly depicts norm psychology as involving a mix of the domain specific and the domain general (c.f. D’Souza and Karmiloff-Smith, 2011). Cognitive gadgets are bundles of integrated psychological mechanisms and routinized processes that support domain specific skills, such as reading and writing, playing chess, and driving. These bundles of mechanisms, however, are neither innate nor the product of genetic evolution by natural selection. Rather, cognitive gadgets are fashioned and bundled together by cultural evolution. Once a particular gadget emerges in a group’s cultural repertoire, members can possess it, i.e. acquire the bundle of psychological mechanisms itself (rather than merely the content they process.) Crucially, on Heyes’ view, the learning processes involved in acquiring a cognitive gadget are domain general (Heyes 2018). Applying this framework to norm psychology, Heyes (2024) argues that human normative behavior is initially supported in childhood by implicit, domain-general forms of cognition and cultural learning, but that it typically comes to be supplemented with a domain-specific “gadget” that supports explicit, rule-based thought and communication about what is permissible, impermissible, and appropriate (see Kelly 2024 for more discussion).

The fourth and final dimension concerns motivation. Especially in light of the roles that punishment and reward play in the stabilization of group-level patterns of behavior (Sripada 2005), an initially plausible idea is that normative motivation is instrumental (for discussion see Fehr & Falk 2002). On such views, an individual conforms to a norm in order to receive some benefit, or to avoid reprimand, or because she wants to behave in the way she thinks others expect her to behave. Such motivation would be instrumental in the sense that people obey norms merely as a means to some further end that more fundamentally drives them; in counterfactual terms, if the external reward, punishment, or social expectation is removed, and the individual’s norm compliant behavior will disappear along with it. Those who explore this kind of account have recently emphasized the role of psychological states like conditional preferences, together with 2^nd order social beliefs, i.e., people’s beliefs about other people’s expectations, and people’s beliefs about other people’s beliefs about what should be done (see Bicchieri, Muldoon, & Sontuoso 2023 for discussion of such a family views).

Other accounts construe normative motivation as intrinsic (Kelly & Davis 2018; Nichols (2021), especially chapter 10). On such a view, once a norm is acquired and internalized, it typically becomes infused with some kind of non-instrumental motivation. People will be motivated to comply with and enforce a such rule for its own sake, and experience an impetus to do so that is independent of external circumstances or the perceived likelihood that they will receive social sanctions if they flout the norm. Intrinsic motivation, however does not imply unconditional behavioral conformity. For example, a person may feel the intrinsic pull of a norm that prescribes leaving a 20% tip, but still choose to override it and instead act out of material self-interest, stiffing the waiter. This second family of accounts raises a broader set of questions about the psychological nature of normative motivation, and if and how it might be special. Is normative motivation best treated as a primitive, its own sui generis psychological category? Or is it better construed as being generated by more familiar psychological elements like desires, emotions, drives, or other types of conative states, posited on independent grounds, that are recruited to work in conjunction with normative psychology? (see Kelly 2020 for discussion)

An early and influential account of norm psychology given by Sripada and Stich (2007) illustrates how these kinds of theoretical pieces might be put together. The preliminary model posits two innate mechanisms, a norm acquisition mechanism and a norm execution mechanism. The functions or tasks of the norm acquisition mechanism are

1. to identify behavioral cues indicating the existence of a norm
2. to infer the content of that norm, and finally
3. to pass information about that content on to a norm execution mechanism

The tasks of the norm execution mechanism, on the other hand, are

1. to encode and store those norms passed along to it by the acquisition system in a norm database, which may have some proprietary processes for reasoning about the contents represented therein
2. to detect cues in the immediate environment that indicate if any of those norms apply to the situation, and if so to whom
3. to generate motivation to comply with those norms that apply to oneself,
4. to generate motivation to punish those who violate norms that apply to them

Sripada and Stich provide an initial pictorial representation:

The acquisition and execution mechanisms themselves are posited as innate, but are highly sensitive to the local social setting in which an individual develops. On this account, this bifurcation into innate psychological architecture, on the one hand, and socially learned normative content, on the other, helps to explain why the presence of norms is culturally universal, whereas the behaviors, roles, and social arrangements governed by those norms exhibit variation. In addition, the model depicts the operation of many components of the norm system as “automatic and involuntary” (Sripada & Stich 2007: 290), but takes no stand on particular processes or more granular characteristics associated with dual processing. Finally, the model is designed to accommodate evidence suggesting that when a norm is acquired and represented in the database it thereby gains a distinctive kind of motivational profile. Specifically, this profile construes normative motivation as

1. intrinsically as opposed to instrumentally motivating
2. both self- and other-oriented
3. potentially powerful

On this account, normative motivation has the third property in the sense that in some cases it is capable of overpowering even fairly compelling motivations that pull in conflicting directions; extreme examples include suicide bombers overriding their instincts for self-preservation, or other fanatics who expend significant resources to enforce their favored norms on others. The self- and other-directedness of normative motivation captures the idea that the norm system produces motivation to keep one’s own behavior in compliance with a norm as well as motivation to enforce it by punishing others who violate it.

Finally, the model depicts normative motivation as intrinsic in the usual sense that people comply with norms as ultimate ends, or for their own sake. Sripada and Stich suggest that intrinsic motivation helps explain a property of norms they call “independent normativity”. This marks the fact that norms can exert reliable influence on people’s behavior even when those norms are not written down or formally articulated in any formal institution, and thus not enforced via any official mechanisms of punishment and reward (also see Davidson & Kelly 2020). They also discuss motivation and independent normativity in terms of an “internalization hypothesis” drawn from sociology and anthropology, and suggest that the idea of internalization can be interpreted in terms of their model. On this story, a person has internalized a norm when it has been acquired by and represented in her norm database. The internalization hypothesis can then be construed as a claim that internalized norms are intrinsically motivating for the simple reason that it is a fundamental psychological feature of normative cognition that once a norm has been acquired, delivered to, and represented in a person’s norm database, the norm system automatically confers this distinctive motivational profile on the norm. Being accompanied by self- and other-directed intrinsic motivation is part of the functional role a rule comes to occupy once it is represented in the database of a person’s norm system—when it is “internalized”—in something analogous to the way that being accompanied by avoidance motivation and contamination sensitivity is part of the functional role a cue comes to occupy once it is represented in a person’s disgust system (Kelly 2011; also see Gavrilets & Richerson 2017 for a computational model exploring the evolution of norm internalization and the kinds of selective forces that may have given normative psychology this intriguing characteristic).

2. Contemporary Debates

This section reviews several areas of ongoing study about normative cognition and debate within the cognitive-evolutionary tradition. These focus on questions about cultural variability, about the ontogeny, about whether elements of normative cognition are present in nonhuman animals, and an ongoing debate about the centrality of third-party punishment to normative cognition.

2.1 Norms and Cultural Variability

The ethnographic record indicates that all cultures are structured by norms—rules that guide behavior and standards by which it is evaluated (Brown 1991). Evidence also suggests that norms are fairly evolutionarily ancient, as there is little indication that the capacity for norms spread from society to society in the recent past. Anthropologists also have shown that norms governing, e.g., food sharing, marriage practices, kinship networks, communal rituals, etc., regulate the practices of extant hunter-gatherers and relatively culturally isolated groups, which would be unlikely if norms were a recent innovation (see J. Henrich 2015 for a review). Much attention, however, has been given to the ways in which the prevailing sets of norms vary between cultures (House, Kanngiesser, et al. 2020; cf. Hofstede 1980, 2001) and the manner in which packages of norms develop and change over time within particular cultures (Gaus 2016, Schulz et al. 2019; cf. Inglehart 1997; Bednar et al. 2010).

For example, one line of evidence from comparative ethnography looks at cooperative behavior, and reveals variation between groups even in the kinds of activities, relationships, and contexts that are governed by norms. Some groups “cooperate only in warfare and fishing, while others, just downstream, cooperate only in housebuilding and communal rituals” (Chudek, Zhao, & Henrich 2013: 426). That behavioral variations like these can persist even in the face of the same ecological context (i.e., “just downstream”) suggests that they are due to differences in norms and other socially transmitted elements of culture, rather than responses more directly evoked by the physical environment (also see N. Henrich & J. Henrich 2007).

It is a platitude that different individual norms, identified by their scope, content, and the specific behaviors they prescribe and proscribe, are present in different cultures. Systematic empirical work has also recently investigated the prominence of different normative themes across cultures. Familiar examples include the different families of norms that mark cultures of honor versus cultures of shame, especially those that that govern violence and its aftermath (Nisbett & Cohen 1996; Uskal et al. 2019), or the different kinds of norms found in societies that prize individualistic values versus those dominated by more collectivist ones, especially norms that delimit the scope of personal choice (McAuliffe et al. 2003; Nisbett 2004; Ross 2012, Hagger Rentzelas, & Chatzisarantis 2014; J. Henrich 2020, also see J. Henrich, Heine, & Norenzayan 2010 for discussion of methodological issues). Other researchers have distinguished still other themes, for instance identifying the kinds of values and “purity” norms that predominate in a community governed by what they call an ethics of divinity, in comparison to those prevalent in communities that are governed by an ethics of autonomy or an ethics of community (Shweder et al. 1997; Rozin et al. 1999; this line of thought has been further developed in the influential Moral Foundations Theory, Haidt 2012; Graham et al. 2013). Theorists also use these kinds of empirical findings to help assess claims about norm psychology, shedding light on those features of individual normative cognition that are more rigid and universal versus those that are more culturally malleable, and on how such psychological features might make various patterns of group-level variation more or less likely (O’Neill & Machery 2018).

A more recent contribution along these lines is Gelfand and colleagues’ investigation of patterns in the tightness and looseness of different cultures’ norms. This work looks at differences in the general overall “strength” of norms within and across cultures: how many norms there are, how tolerant of deviations from normatively prescribed behavior members of a culture tend to be, and how severely they punish violations (Gelfand, Nishii, & Raver 2006; Gelfand, Raver, et al. 2011; Gelfand, Harrington, & Jackson 2017). Tighter cultures have more numerous and exacting standards, with members who are less tolerant of slight deviancies and prone to impose more severe sanctions. Cultures whose members are more lenient and accepting of wiggle room around a norm, and who are less extreme in their enforcement, fall more towards the loose end of this spectrum. Gelfand and colleagues explore the manifestations of tightness and looseness not just at the level of cultures but also across a number of other levels of description, from the communal and historical down to the behavioral, cognitive, and neural (Gelfand 2018). A central claim of this account is that a culture’s orientation towards norms—whether the norm psychologies of its members tend to be calibrated more tightly or more loosely—reflects the severity of the challenges faced in its past and present:

[t]he evolution of norm strength is adaptive to features of ecological environments and, in turn, is afforded by a suite of adaptive psychological processes. (Gelfand, Harrington, & Jackson 2017: 802, our italics)

A group whose ecology is characterized by things like frequent natural disasters, disease, territorial invasion, or resource scarcity is likely to possess a more comprehensive and demanding system of norms and to take a stricter stance towards its norms, in part because more efficiently coordinated social action is required to overcome more severe threats. Groups faced with less extreme ecological stressors have less dire need for tightly coordinated social action, and so can afford to have weaker norms and more tolerance for deviation.

Another recent innovation in the study of cross-cultural variation in norms focuses on a construct known as kinship intensity (Schulz et al. 2019). Kinship institutions are composed of norms governing marriage, inheritance, familial obligations, and tribal or clan-based identities. There is considerable variation in the strength and centrality of kinship institutions relative to the overall structure of different cultural groups, and those differences have been hypothesized to reflect a variety of geographical, environmental, and contingent historical factors. For example, many modern hunter gatherer groups favor “extensive” kinship institutions supported by strong norms that prohibit marriage among close kin. These norms limit genetic interrelatedness within smaller, more local units of social organization and help create loose but sprawling networks that can be drawn upon for support in times of need (also see Walker 2014). Contrasted with these are more kinship “intensive” institutions, believed to have spread with the advent of agricultural food production around 12,000 years ago when cultural evolution began to favor norms prescribing cousin marriage. These norms, in turn, strengthened kinship bonds between neighboring families (Bowles & Choi 2013), leading to larger clan-like institutions that became denser and more interdependent. These features enabled communities to better organize themselves for collective activities like defending territory and producing goods (Sterelny 2021). Groups whose institutions were high in kinship intensity were inclined to adopt a range of other kinds of norms as well, including those favoring in-group loyalty, reciprocity, conformity, deference to authority, and nepotism.

Building on this package of ideas, Joseph Henrich and his collaborators have argued that the rise of the Roman Catholic Church in different parts of the world–with its strict bans on cousin marriage, polygamy, concubinage, and legal adoption, as well as its encouragement of marriages that were monogamous and initiated by individual choice rather than family arrangement–systematically undermined many of the traditional norms and kin-based institutions that preceded it (Schulz et al. 2019; Henrich 2020). In their place, new political, economic, religious, and legal institutions emerged, as well as new norms governing interpersonal social interactions. In the absence of the rich range of kinship ties that once guided interpersonal relationships and commerce, these new norms provided standards based on values like individual autonomy, freedom of association, impartiality, universalism, and impersonal prosociality. Henrich and colleagues argue that this new set of norms and institutions would come to form the basis of a distinctively WEIRD psychology. Their measures of kinship intensity indicate that it correlates in suggestive ways with a number of other well-known indices of cultural variability, including cultural tightness and looseness, performance on Asch conformity tasks, and individualism and collectivism.

2.2 The Ontogeny of Normative Cognition

An impressive range of evidence suggests that humans are natural-born norm learners (Schmidt & Rakoczy 2023). The developmental trajectory of normative cognition in humans appears to exhibit robust similarities across cultures, with children beginning to participate in normative behavior around the same early age (see House et al. 2013 and Tomasello 2019a for context). Between three and five years of age children exhibit knowledge of different kinds of normative rules (Turiel 1983; Smetana 1993; Nucci 2001), and at as early as three years of age they are able to perform competently in deontic reasoning tasks (R. Cummins 1996; Beller 2010). They also enforce norms, both when they believe the transgressive behavior was freely chosen (Josephs et al. 2016) but also when they understand that it was unintentional (Samland et al. 2016) at least in some circumstances (cf. Chernyak & Sobel 2016; also see Barrett et al. 2016 and Curtin et al. 2020 for evidence and discussion of cross cultural variation in people’s sensitivity to the mental states of norm violators). Developmentally, norm enforcement behavior at 2.5 years of age is predicted by children’s understanding of normative language at 1.5 years of age (Essler and Pauls 2023). Moreover, children are alert to how other people respond to transgressions, showing more positive feelings towards those who enforce a norm violation than toward those who leave violations uncorrected (Vaish et al. 2016).

Perhaps most striking is the ease and rapidity with which children acquire norms. Preschoolers have been found to learn norms quickly (Rakoczy, Warneken, & Tomasello 2008), even without explicit instruction (Schmidt, Rakoczy, & Tomasello 2011), although learning is facilitated when norms are modeled by adults (Rakoczy, Haman, et al. 2010). Children’s enthusiasm for rules—their “promiscuous normativity” (Schmidt, Butler, et al. 2016)—even appears to outstrip being sensitive to common norm-governed behavior in their social environment. Evidence suggests that sometimes a single observation of an action is sufficient for children to infer the existence of a norm, and that left to their own devices they will spontaneously create their own norms and teach them to others (Göckeritz, Schmidt, & Tomasello 2014).

That said, behaviors that are perceived to be statistically normal in a community are particularly salient to individuals’ norm psychology, which is liable to infer that a behavior is correct from the mere fact that it appears common. Another facet of children’s normative promiscuity is that they are prone to false positives in the course of acquisition, seeing behavior as norm-guided even when it is merely usual, and inferring the presence of normative rules when there are none. One series of studies found that when participants (children and adults from both the United States and China) detected or were told that a type of behavior was common among a group of people, they came to negatively evaluate group members who behaved in a non-conforming way (Roberts et al. 2018; Roberts, Ho, & Gelman 2019). Perceptions of what types of behaviors are normal can also be drastically distorted by social media, which influences users’ perception of norms (Brady and Crockett 2024, Robertson et al 2024). Researchers have investigated this feature of norm acquisition from different angles, and have labeled it with various names, including the “descriptive-to-prescriptive tendency” (Roberts, Gelman, & Ho 2017), the “common is moral heuristic” (Lindström et al. 2017), and the “injunctive inference hypothesis” (Davis, Hennes, & Raymond 2018, discussing, e.g., Schultz et al. 2007). Since the evidence suggests that human normative cognition invites an easy inference from the “is” of an observed pattern of common behavior to the “ought” of a norm (Tworek & Cimpian 2016), philosophers may be tempted to think of this as a “naturalistic fallacy bias”.

Another line of research suggests that key to understanding the roots of normative cognition is the fact that human children are overimitators. They are not just spontaneous, intuitive, and excellent imitators, but they also tend to copy all of the elements in the sequence of a model’s behavior, even when they recognize some of those elements are superfluous to the task at hand (Lyons, Young, & Keil 2007; Kenward, Karlsson, & Persson 2011; Keupp, Behne, & Rakoczy 2013; Nielsen, Kapitány, & Elkins 2014, cf. Heyes 2018: chapter 6). Children attend to the specific manner in which an action is carried out rather than merely to the goal it is aimed at, and conform to the full script even if they see that the goal can be achieved in some more direct way. Moreover, children monitor others to see if they are doing likewise, and enforce overimitation on their peers by criticizing those who fail to perform the entire sequence of steps (Kenward 2012; Rakoczy & Schmidt 2013). Overimitation can lead to the unnecessary expenditure of energy on these extraneous behaviors, but the trait may be an adaptation nevertheless. According to this argument, the costs of what look like individual “mistakes” are ultimately outweighed by the communal benefits generated by a population whose individual capacities for transmitting norms and other cultural variants are more insistent in this way, erring on the side of too much imitation rather than too little (J. Henrich 2015: chapter 7). Researchers have also suggested that whatever it was initially selected for, the psychological machinery responsible for overimitation makes important contributions to normative cognition. Evidence indicates that this machinery generates strong (perhaps intrinsic) social motivation aimed at behavioral conformity with others. When working in conjunction with a person’s norm psychology, this source of motivation may also help facilitate performance of the key task of keeping an individual’s behavior compliant, inducing her to conform not just to behaviors she is observing but to those norms she has internalized (Hoehl et al. 2019. Essler et al 2023).

2.3 Normative Cognition in Nonhuman Animals

Overimitation is also noteworthy because it may be distinctively human. For example, although chimpanzees imitate the way conspecifics instrumentally manipulate their environment to achieve a goal, they will copy the behavior only selectively, skipping steps which they recognize as unnecessary (Whiten et al. 2009, also see Clay & Tennie 2018 for similar results with bonobos). Evidence suggests that learning in human children is comparatively more attuned to peer influence in other ways as well. Once chimpanzees and orangutans have figured out how to solve a problem, they are conservative, sticking to whatever solution they learn first. Humans, in contrast, will often switch to a new solution that is demonstrated by peers, sometimes even switching to less effective strategies under peer influence (Haun, Rekers, & Tomasello 2014). However, other researchers have recently contested the claim that overimitation is strictly absent in non-humans (Andrews 2017; Allen & Andrews 2024).

Beyond questions about overimitation specifically, there is an increasingly lively debate about animal normativity, which includes questions about whether a psychological capacity dedicated to norms is distinctively human or whether some of the mechanisms that underpin it might be present in rudimentary form in other animals. For example, some researchers have interpreted chimpanzees’ behavioral responses to aggression and violence towards infants as evidence of rules surrounding the proper treatment of infants and a prohibition against infanticide (Sakamaki et al. 2001; Rudolf von Rohr et al. 2011). Play fighting behaviors in chimpanzees and canids has also been described as involving a series of rules and conventions aimed at preventing an outbreak of genuine violence, such as play bows and play panting (Bekoff 2001; Matsusaka 2004). Others have drawn parallels between norm-governed hierarchies in human societies and the strict dominance hierarchies in chimpanzee communities (de Waal 2014). Along these lines, Nishida et al. (1995) describe an evocative incident in which an individual male chimpanzee was violently attacked by higher-ranking males and females and ultimately ostracized for failing to show proper deference to higher-ranking males. There is also suggestive evidence of “cultural traditions” that vary in surprising ways across wild chimpanzee groups in the same region. While some chimpanzee groups in the Taï Forest of Côte d’Ivoire use stone tools to crack nuts, immediately adjacent groups use wooden tools for the same purpose. Interestingly, when immigrant females move between these groups, they reliably adopt the tool-use behaviors of their new group, even when these new tools are less efficient than those of their previous group (Luncz & Boesch 2014). Other potential “cultural traditions” in captive chimpanzee populations include a distinctive cross-armed walk behavior and a “fashion trend” where chimpanzees would keep stalks of grass in their ears for no apparent purpose. In both cases, these trends were initiated by a dominant female and then emulated by other members of the group.

Despite these suggestive examples, there is considerable skepticism about whether such behaviors constitute evidence for genuinely normative cognition in chimpanzees. Some doubt that chimpanzees’ behaviors are really driven by mental representations that take the form of rules, or whether they are merely acting in ways that happen to accord with some hypothetical rule (Schlingloff & Moore 2017). Another source of skepticism comes from a lack of evidence that chimpanzees engage in third-party punishment of norm violations, even in controlled experimental paradigms (Riedl et al. 2012; Prooijen 2018; Powell 2023; though see Suchak et al. 2016). Doubt also stems from broader theoretical considerations about the human uniqueness of the cognitive prerequisites for normative cognition. For example, gene-culture coevolutionary theories posit a dedicated psychological capacity for norms as a key mechanism of human’s uniquely sophisticated forms of cultural evolution and ultrasociality, and a major ingredient of “the secret of our success” (Richerson and Boyd 2005, Henrich 2015). Likewise, Michael Tomasello has suggested that the psychological capacity for normative cognition stems from a more basic capacity for shared intentionality, which he also holds is found only in humans (Tomasello 2019b, 2020). Bicchieri’s (2006; 2016) account of social norms (a technical term in her theory) requires that individuals have the capacity to represent other agents’ beliefs, another capacity thought to be uniquely human (but see Krupenye et al. 2016).

Proponents of the claim that animals display some form of normative cognition have responded to these critiques in several ways. One strategy has been to argue that nonhuman animals do in fact possess the psychological prerequisites for normative cognition, and that the evidence is less equivocal than critics might suggest (Fitzpatrick 2020). Another argues for weaker and more graded conceptions of normative cognition that are more plausibly attributed to nonhuman animals like chimpanzees (Rudolf von Rohr, 2011; Vincent, Ring, & Andrews, 2018; Andrews 2020; Andrews, Fitzpatrick, & Westra 2024). Andrews, for instance, proposes four cognitive capacities that are widespread in nonhuman animals and argues that they are jointly sufficient for normative cognition: “(1) the ability to identify agents, (2) sensitivity to in-group/out-group differences, (3) the capacity for social learning of group traditions, and (4) responsiveness to appropriateness” (Andrews 2020, 37).

Another approach (which borrows from methodological advances in the study of animal culture (Whiten 2019; Heyes 2020) has been to argue for a more behavioral conception of norms themselves. This approach construes the initial explanatory target of a theory of normative cognition as a pattern that emerges from certain kinds of social interactions. This has the advantage of making the key phenomenon, that which different accounts of normative cognition are posited to explain, more amenable to empirical observation. It also allows theorists to remain neutral (at least at first) about the exact character of the cognitive and motivational mechanisms that allow organisms to participate in those patterns of interactions. For example, Westra and colleagues introduce the terminology of “normative regularities” to characterize socially maintained patterns of conformity within a community, where “socially maintained” refers to processes of social enforcement. If norms are understood first and foremost as normative regularities (as opposed to, say, mentally represented rules), then they are a category of behavioral regularity picked out by its diffuse but still perceivable characteristics. Thus a social pattern will qualify as a norm independently of anything about the psychology of the individual organisms that participate in it. Different instances of normative regularities might then be supported by, and thus explained by appeal to, the operation of different kinds of cognitive and motivational mechanisms, some of which use rule-like mental representations but also others that don’t (Westra and Andrews 2022; Westra et al. 2024; Andrews, Fitzpatrick, & Westra 2024). Proponents of this approach argue that it has the advantage of making room for a pluralistic conception of normative cognition, where norms may emerge in different populations and across different species as the result of social interactions driven by a range of different, and more or less sophisticated, psychological processes (Westra and Andrews 2022). It also shifts the emphasis of comparative research on animal normativity away from specific cognitive capacities and towards more observational methods for ascertaining the presence or absence of norms in nonhuman animal communities.

2.4 Third-party Punishment and Normative Cognition

Another recent focal point of empirical research on norms is enforcement, and the social and psychological processes that incentivize norm compliance (Schmidt and Tomasello 2012). Historically, norm enforcement has been thought of mostly in terms of punishment and the disposition to sanction norm violations. This line of thought has its roots in theories of the evolution of human cooperation, especially cooperation within large groups of genetically unrelated individuals. Cooperation is puzzling from an evolutionary perspective in general, and this form presents distinctive challenges that are not easily met by kin or reciprocity based altruism. Large groups of genetically unrelated individuals appear to provide ripe conditions for free-riding individuals to take advantage of the cooperative efforts of others, thereby subverting the cooperative efforts of the group. If free-riders are reliably punished, however, this creates a dynamic wherein free-riding becomes more costly than cooperation (Sober and Wilson 1998). In game theoretic models, if enough members of a group are inclined to punish free-riders, cooperative norms can be stabilized across the group, even if engaging in sanctioning behavior is costly to both the individual being sanctioned and the sanctioner (Axelrod 1986; Boyd & Richerson 1992). This kind of punishment is widely believed to have been critical to the evolution of human cooperation on large scales (Price et al. 2002, Mathew & Boyd 2011, Mathew et al. 2013).

Notably, while these proposals were originally introduced to explain the stabilization of cooperation, a classic paper showed that the same punitive dynamics can in theory stabilize conformity to any behavioral norm whatsoever, even costly and maladaptive ones (Boyd & Richerson 1992). This fact can help explain cases of costly conformity to arbitrary norms, depicting them as by-products of the same evolutionary forces that drove the emergence of large-scale cooperation. When paired with social learning heuristics such as conformity and prestige biases, as well as a general sensitivity to markers of tribal boundaries (McElreath, Boyd, & Richerson 2003), this hypothesized disposition to punish would have functioned as a key psychological mechanism in the cultural evolution of group-specific norms (Chudek & Henrich 2011). Moreover, many who take a cognitive-evolutionary approach to normative cognition further hypothesize that this disposition to punish norm violations is a key element of our normative cognition.

Some of the best-known evidence for this idea comes from results in behavioral economics showing that individuals will routinely punish others even at a cost to themselves (Fehr & Gachter 2002; J. Henrich, McElreath, et al. 2006). For example, in public goods games participants are given a non-trivial sum of money and must decide if and how much to contribute to a common pool over the course of several rounds. How much each investment pays off depends on how much everyone collectively contributes that round, so each participant’s decisions should factor in the past and expected behavior of every other participant. In some versions, participants can also spend their money to punish others, based on knowledge of the contributions they have made. Results indicate that some participants are willing to engage in so-called “altruistic punishment”, incurring a cost to themselves in order to sanction low contributors (Fehr & Gachter 2002). Neuroimaging results indicate that engaging in this form of altruistic punishment tended to activate the brain’s reward circuitry (de Quervain et al. 2004; Strobel et al. 2011).

Another noteworthy aspect of punitive behavior revealed by behavioral economic experiments is that humans are willing to punish even when they are mere bystanders to the incident that they are responding to. In such cases of third-party punishment, an individual enforces a norm despite the fact that she is neither the offender who commits the violation, nor the offended who was wronged, the victim affected by the transgression (Fehr & Fischbacher 2004; Strobel et al. 2011; though see Bone, Silva, & Raihani 2014). Such interventions can appear initially puzzling from an evolutionary standpoint, but third-party punishment can also function as a social signal, a costly and thus credible way for the punisher to indicate to others that they are trustworthy and concerned with the community’s rules (Gintis, Smith, & Bowles 2001). Punishers can thus reap reputational benefits that might exceed whatever it cost them to intervene (Jordan, Hoffman, Bloom, & Rand 2016).

However, other researchers have challenged the view that punishment as such is central to normative cognition, or even to the psychology of norm enforcement. Some of this skepticism comes from the fact that evidence of people administering direct, confrontational punishment outside of heavily circumscribed experimental paradigms has been difficult to find. For example, in studies that ask participants to record their responses to norm violations in their daily lives, people rarely report engaging in direct, confrontational forms of punishment. Instead, they tend to respond in more indirect ways, like gossiping about the norm violator, or simply avoiding them (Balafoutas et al., 2014; Molho et al. 2020). On those rare occasions where someone did take direct, confrontational action, the punisher’s self interest was often at stake: people tend to confront norm violators when they value the welfare of the victim (Pedersen et al. 2018; 2020), or when they are simply retaliating because they themselves are the victim of the transgression (Molho et al., 2020). A number of ethnographic studies have also found third-party punishments to be rare in small-scale societies (Black 2000; Wiessner 2020; Fitouchi & Singh, 2023). Even in behavioral economics experiments, which have yielded evidence of third-party punishments in Western populations, there is considerable variability in punitive responses across cultures (Henrich et al. 2006; Herrmann et al. 2008). Meanwhile, other lab-based studies have found that given the option, third parties actually prefer positive over negative forms of enforcement, rewarding norm conformers rather than punishing norm violators (Chavez & Bicchieri, 2013; Jordan & Kouchaki, 2021). Observers also tend to approve of helping victims of norm violations, and to evaluate third-party helpers more highly than third-party punishers (Raihani & Bsharry 2015; Jordan, Hoffman, Bloom, & Rand 2016; Dhaliwal et al. 2021).

These latter findings raise questions about the existence of a generalized disposition to directly sanction norm violations and the role it might play in the psychology of norm enforcement. The prevalence in daily life of less costly, more indirect responses to norm violations suggests that many norms are maintained in other ways besides this kind of punishment. One idea, suggested by new modeling techniques that treat the distribution of norms present in a population as varying continuously rather than discreetly, is that in addition to propensities to imitate others and punish norm violators, moral preferences may be required to sustain cooperative norms within a community (Yan et al. 2023). Another possibility is that gossip is a key mechanism of enforcement and thus plays a significant role in stabilizing norms. Communities collectively discuss and share information about the past deeds and social tendencies of their members. In doing so, they create an incentive structure that typically motivates people to comply with group norms: adhering to those norms will garner a good name and social rewards, while breaking the rules will incur reputational damage and potentially more extreme consequences like social ostracization (Baumard, André, & Sperber 2013). Norm adherence may also be positively incentivized through the social benefits that come with belonging: conformity to cooperative norms can yield not only the benefits of cooperation but may also feel good and serve as a signal of trustworthiness (Jordan et al. 2016). Conformity to even arbitrary norms can signal an individual’s status as an ingroup member and thus as viable partner (McElreath, Boyd, & Richerson 2003). In short, norm enforcement may be the product of a number of different social processes grounded in a variety of psychological mechanisms (Westra & Andrews, 2022).

Consistent with this perspective on norm enforcement is the idea that whether or not human normative cognition contains a strong disposition to punish, those behaviors that serve to enforce and stabilize norms, like nearly all human behaviors, are themselves likely to be heavily regulated by norms (Boyd et al. 2010, Bowles et al. 2012.). Norms that coordinate enforcement are also likely to exhibit cultural variation. One suggestion along these lines is that some norms of third-party punishment originally evolved in small-scale societies as a means of managing within-group conflict and restoring cooperative equilibria: episodes of norm enforcement serve as a deterrent to norm violators but also as a means of making restitution for victims of norm violations (Wiessner 2020; Fitouchi and Singh 2023). From this perspective, third-party punishment does not so much function as a basic mechanism of norm enforcement, but rather as a communal tool for restoring norms when they break down (Gao et al. 2015). Meanwhile, Wylie and Gantman (2024) argue that in societies with formalized institutions, third-party punishment is much more prevalent in response to violations of rules that have been explicitly codified by institutions with formal sanctioning authority, whereas informal or implicit norms are primarily enforced through indirect social sanctions, such as gossip. They also suggest that in the former contexts, third-party punishments of codified rule violations are often motivated by the goal of domination, and that in practice they serve to reify existing social hierarchies.

Proposals like these contain challenges to received views, and raise important and unanswered questions about the idea that normative cognition contains a core disposition to punish norm violators, about the range of forms that norm enforcement can take, and about the social function (or functions) of third-party punishment.

3. Normative Cognition and Morality

Norms are relevant to areas of research across philosophy, the humanities, and the behavioral sciences, and the kinds of cognitive-evolutionary accounts of norm psychology described here have the potential to inform and enrich many of them (see e.g. Bell forthcoming on transgender experience). The most immediate implications would seem to fall within the domain of moral theory.

3.1 Normative Cognition and Moral Psychology

Moral psychology has emerged as a thriving interdisciplinary area of study in the last few decades (see Sinnott-Armstrong 2008a,b,c; Doris et al 2010, 2020; Alfano, Loeb, & Plakias 2018; Vargas and Doris 2022). While the investigation of normative cognition is a key part of its subject matter, norm psychology and moral psychology are categories that appear to crosscut each other. The study of moral psychology outstrips research on normative cognition to include work on the psychology of altruism, well-being, character and virtue, moral emotions, intentional versus unintentional action, and so forth. Our normative cognition also appears to readily handle norms beyond those that are paradigmatically moral; typical examples include conventional norms, etiquette norms, epistemic norms, aesthetic norms, etc.

However, the relationship of norms and norm psychology to morality and moral psychology is itself a subject of philosophical debate, as the status of the category of morality itself remains unclear (Machery 2012). The quest to delimit the boundaries of the moral domain, and to distinguish the genuinely moral from non-moral norms, has a long history, but has yet to produce a view that is widely accepted (Stich 2018). For example, some researchers argue on empirical grounds that there are proximate psychological differences that can be used to distinguish a set of moral rules distinct from other types, e.g. conventional, prudential, etiquette. According to one prominent account rooted in developmental psychology, moral rules are marked by the fact that individuals judge them to hold generally rather than only locally, to apply independently of the pronouncement of any authority figure, and to govern matters concerning harm, welfare, justice, and rights (Turiel 1983, Smetana 1993, Nucci 2001, also see Machery and Stich 2022). Some have drawn inspiration from the sentimentalist tradition in moral theory to build on this account, explaining the features posited as distinctive of moral rules by appeal to their connection to emotions like anger or disgust (Nichols 2004; cf. Haidt 2001). Others have contested this characterization of moral norms, marshalling arguments and evidence that it is not psychologically universal, but is rather found only in certain cultures (Kelly et al. 2007; Kelly & Stich 2007, also see Berniūnas, Dranseika, & Sousa, 2016; Berniūnas, Silius, & Dranseika, 2020; cf. Kumar 2015; Heath 2017).

More generally, while some theorists hold that our species possesses an evolved psychological system dedicated specifically to morality (Joyce 2007; Mameli 2013; Stanford 2018; cf. Kitcher 2011), others remain skeptical. They argue instead that the evidence better supports the view that humans have an evolved psychological system dedicated to norms in general, but there is nothing about the mechanisms that underlie it, the adaptive pressures that selected for it, or the norms that it can come to contain that would support a distinction between moral norms and non-moral norms (Machery & Mallon 2010; Davis & Kelly 2018; Stich 2020). On this view, rather, human norm psychology evolved to be able to deal with, and can still acquire and internalize, a wide range of norms, epistemic, aesthetic, sartorial, religious, etiquette, as well as norms that might be classified by a contemporary Westerner as moral. Indeed, this view of norm psychology has been taken to support a historicist view of morality itself, according to which the practice of distinguishing some subset of norms and normative judgments as moral, and thus as possessing special status or authority, is a culturally parochial and relatively recent historical invention (Machery 2018). This suggestion can seem implausible, even jarring upon first encounter. But there are other lines of nearby research suggesting that seemingly bedrock features of social life and categories that are foundational to Western sensibilities may also be relatively recent, local developments. For example, it might seem straightforward that when judging a person’s action—whether it is right or wrong, how much responsibility the person bears, how much blame or praise it merits—the person’s intentions and motivations are relevant, and should factor heavily into such judgments. However, evidence suggests that this focus on inner mental states is considerably less prominent in the way normative judgments are typically made in many cultures (Barrett et al 2016, McNamara et al 2019, Curtin et al 2020, Barrett & Saxe 2021).

3.2 Normative Cognition and Moral Philosophy

Caveats in place, several debates with broadly moral subject matter have already begun drawing on empirically inspired accounts of norm psychology. Some have argued that cultural variation in norms and persistent disputes over right and wrong have significant implications for metaethics. The “argument from disagreement” (Loeb 1998) holds that if dispute over the permissibility of some activity or practice persists even after reasoning errors and non-moral factual disagreements have been resolved, such intractable disagreement would militate against moral realism (Mackie 1977). Empirically establishing the existence of persistent disagreement is difficult (Doris & Plakias 2008), but the character of the norm system and its influence on judgment may speak to whether or not it is likely. Consider two individuals from different cultures, who have internalized divergent families of norms (individualistic and collectivist, honor based and shame based, divinity and autonomy, tight and loose, etc.) Such individuals are likely to disagree about the permissibility of a range of activities and practices, such as what counts as a fair division of resources, or whether people should get to choose who they marry, or what is and is not an appropriate way to respond to an insult. This disagreement may very well endure even in the face of agreement about the non-moral facts of the matter, and even when neither side of the dispute is being partial or making any reasoning errors. Such persistent disagreement may be explainable by appeal to differences in the individual’s respective norm systems, and to the different norms each has internalized from their culture (Machery et al. 2005). Empirical details of the operational principles of normative cognition—especially knowing whether and the extent to which it is automatic, non-conscious, recalcitrant and insensitive to other psychological processes—can help assess the plausibility of this argument.

Philosophers concerned with moral progress have also begun to explore the relevance of empirical work on normative cognition. On one prominent view, recent moral progress is thought to have come largely in the form of expansions of the moral circle, the spread of inclusive norms, and the demoralization of invalid ones (Singer 1981; Buchanan & Powell 2018; cf. Sauer 2019, 2023.) Much attention has focused on understanding changes in the distribution of norms that occur as the result of reasoning about norms (Campbell & Kumar 2012, Kumar & Campbell 2022), though some remain skeptical that much is known about the role of reasoning (Rehren & Blunden 2024). Others hold that social change, including instances in the direction of moral progress, mostly occurs as the result of myopic, though not fully blind, processes of cultural evolution (Kling 2016; Brownstein & Kelly 2019; Gaus 2021). Advances in the empirical accounts of the cultural transmission of norms, and of the relationships of normative cognition to rationalization, critical reasoning, and explicit argumentation promise to further illuminate these dynamics (Summers 2017; Mercier & Sperber 2017). For example, further investigation into the ways our norm psychology is likely to produce a kneejerk resistance to social change of any kind—progressive, regressive, or otherwise—could yield useful insights about how such resistance might be anticipated and overcome (Kelly & Westra 2024).

More and more philosophers are taking an interest in social change more generally, and many of the emerging conversations have assumed the shape of venerable and long-standing debates between individualists and structuralists. This common pattern of discussion makes central the question of whether social changes are best explained (injustices best addressed, moral progress best achieved, etc.) by focusing attention on individual people and their psychological characteristics, on the one hand, or on features of the institutions and social structures that they inhabit, on the other (see e.g. Haslanger 2015, Beeghly & Holroyd 2020, also see Chater & Loewenstein 2023). Some have resisted this way of framing the issues, however, explicitly arguing that it is confused and ineffective (Madva 2016, Brownstein, Kelly, & Madva 2022, Madva, Brownstein, & Kelly 2023). In its place, they advocate for the development of an interactionist approach that gives equal priority to both individuals and structures, and replaces “either/or” with “both/and” thinking (see Brownstein, Madva, & Kelly forthcoming for a book length discussion).

Recent integrative work by philosophers along these lines has focused on specific features of our psychology that are relevant to social change and responsive to cultural influence, such as memory (Soon 2020) and social scripts (Eickers 2024, Hesni 2024). Many of these appeal to norms (Ayala-López 2018, Berio & Musholt 2023), and researchers across the social sciences are exploring ways to harness different aspects of norm psychology and its descriptive-to-prescriptive tendency (mentioned in section 2.2) to advance a variety of social changes (Tankard & Paluck 2016, Nyborg et al 2016, Sparkman & Walton 2017; Davis, Hennes, & Raymond 2018; Raymond, Kelly, & Hennes 2021). Others put empirical work on normative cognition itself center stage, explicitly arguing that it shows how norms are fundamental ingredients of the social fabric, serving as a connective tissue that weaves individuals and soft social structures together (Davidson & Kelly 2020). Understood this way, norms are both part of our individual minds and part of the social structures we live in.

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