Social-Choice-Inspired Postulates (Lindström 2022)

Let C = nonmonotonic consequence (defined over sets of formulas), Cn = classical (monotonic) consequence, S be a selection function (defined over the powerset of worlds), where S(X) are the preferred worlds in set X.

The first group of postulates are:

• Chernoff

  S(X) ∩ Y ⊆ S(X ∩ Y)

  This semantic condition corresponds to the following syntactic rule:

  C(Γ ∪ Δ ) ⊆ Cn(C(Γ) ∪ Δ)

• Path Independence

  S(S(X) ∪ S(Y)) = S(X ∪ Y)

  C(C(Γ) ∩ C(Δ)) = C(Cn(Γ) ∩ Cn(Δ))

• Gamma

  Let F be a nonempty set of sets of worlds. Then ⋂_(X∈F)S(X) ⊆ S(⋃_(X∈F)X). I.e., if x is a best choice in every set X in a family of sets, then x is also a best choice in their union.

  ∩_(Γ∈F) Cn(Γ) ⊆ Cn(∪_Γ∈F C(Γ)) where F is any non-empty family of sets of sentences.

Gamma has a simple finitary consequence: S(X) ∩ S(Y) ⊆ S(X ∪ Y). This corresponds to C((Cn(Γ)) ∩ Cn(Δ)) ⊆ Cn(C(Γ) ∪ C(Δ)).

The next postulate is:

• Sen

  If S(X) ∩ S(Y) ≠ ∅, then S(X ∩ Y) ⊆ S(X) ∩ S(Y)

  If C(Γ) ∪ C(Δ) is consistent, then C(Γ) ∪ C(Δ) ⊆ C(Γ ∪ Δ)

This is Sen’s property β. It can also be formulated as if X ⊆ Y and S(X) ∩ Y ≠ ∅, then S(X) ∩ Y = S(Y).

The final group of postulates is:

• Arrow (independence of irrelevant alternatives)

  If S(X) ∩ Y ≠ ∅, then S(X ∩ Y) = S(X) ∩ Y

  If C(Γ) ∪ Δ is consistent, then C(Γ ∪ Δ) = Cn(C(Γ ∪ Δ))

• Consistency preservation

  If X ≠ ∅, then S(X) ≠ ∅

  If ⊥ ∉ Cn(Γ), then ⊥ ∉ C(Γ)

Arrow is equivalent to Chernoff plus Sen. Consistency preservation plus Arrow imply Chernoff, Cautious monotonicity and Gamma.