1. For more on the reference of mental states, see the entries on mental representation, causal theories of mental content, externalism about mental content, and teleological theories of mental content. For more on the reference of pictures, see the entry on Goodman’s aesthetics.

2. Searle (1983) claims that to construe reference-determining content as in all cases specifiable linguistically, is to misconstrue the nature of such content. Some such content may (for instance) be perceptually based, but not linguistically specifiable. See also Frege (1892).

3. For criticisms, see Soames (2002). And for a defense, see Nelson (2002). See also the entry on rigid designators.

4. For a formal proof of the necessity of identity in quantified modal logic, see Marcus (1947).

5. See Evans (1973, 1982) for a number of additional cases which have proven vexatious for the committed causal theorist. Evans also sketches an important variation on the causal theory, one which focuses on the cause of the plurality of the speaker’s beliefs, rather than on their acquisition of the name itself. For further developments of this general line of thought, see Dickie (2015). For a defense of the causal theory in light of Evans’ cases, see Michaelson (2023).

6. For arguments that this consequence is less counterintuitive than we might initially be inclined to take it to be, see Michaelson (forthcoming).

7. See Rami (2014) for helpful discussion on these issues and an alternative formulation of the indexical view designed to deal with many of them. There are also some prominent ways of trying to deal with cases like these but which have it that names aren’t themselves referential. Rather, they denote properties. On such ‘predicativist’ views of names, as developed by Burge (1973) and Graff Fara (2015), singular reference only emerges once a determiner like ‘that’ or ‘the’ is appended to the name. In languages like English, these determiners are silent or ‘covert’. For more, see the entry on names.

8. A significant literature has sprouted up regarding this claim, centered on what has been called ‘the answering machine paradox’. See Cohen and Michaelson (2013) and the entry on indexicals for further discussion and references.

9. See, however, Gray (2014, 2015) and Jeshion (2015) for complications regarding this notion of name-bearing.

10. The terminology was introduced to the philosophy of language in MacKay (1968). The allusion is to some of Humpty Dumpty’s memorable comments in Lewis Carroll’s Through the Looking Glass regarding the degree of control he takes himself to exhibit over the meanings of the words that he utters. For an argument to the effect that Humpty Dumpty-ism is, in fact, defensible for demonstratives like ‘this’ and ‘that’, see Radulescu (2019).

11. Such agreement is not universal, however. King (2013), for instance, claims that (10) is false due to reference failure, whereas Radulescu (2019) contends that it is, in fact, true and Nowak (2020) challenges the presumption that there need be an answer to this question.

12. This sort of view has also been fleshed-out and defended by, among others, Schiffer (1981) and Bach (1992). For some more recent variations on the Gricean approach, see Unnsteinsson (2022) and Keiser (2023).

13. See King (2013) for a similar suggestion. King considers the reference of demonstratives to be ‘semantic’ whereas Bach characterizes it as ‘pragmatic’, but from our present perspective this looks like a terminological dispute. Both agree on how to explain our judgments regarding reference and truth when it comes to utterances of sentences containing demonstratives. We will return to this distinction in section 4. For discussion and criticism of this kind of view, see Speaks (2016, 2017), Radulescu (2019), Michaelson (2022), and Unnsteinsson (2022).

14. A different sort of constraint on demonstrative reference has been developed in Neale (2004), Stokke (2010), and King (2014). Prescinding from various differences between these accounts, each of holds that referential success requires the referent either be recoverable or actually recovered by the listener (or an idealized version thereof). For arguments against this range of views, see Nowak and Michaelson (2021).

15. Another challenge that the Russellian looks set to avoid has to do with descriptions that, intuitively, refer to nonexistent objects. Descriptions like ‘the sun god’ or ‘the protagonist of The Broken Earth trilogy’ don’t seem to refer to real objects, yet they are hardly meaningless. The Russellian can easily accommodate this by making use of her translation procedure, whereas the referentialist will have to offer some additional story regarding how these count as meaningful. Note that an analogous problem, the problem of empty names, also arises for Millians. For more on these issues, see the entry on nonexistent objects.

16. See Devitt (1997) and Reimer (1998) for an application of these ideas to the present context. For criticism, see Schoubye (2011).

17. See Abbott (2008) and the entry on descriptions for further discussion.

18. See Devitt (2022) for an extension of the causal theory along these lines.

19. For more on these issues, see the entry on the problem of the many.

20. Granted, if Heck really is denying that there is any such thing as linguistic reference, then following them in that would obviate the need to address the problem of the many for linguistic reference. Still, Heck clearly thinks that there are important explanatory roles for the speaker and listener’s respective construals of referential terms. And each of those construals will face a version of this problem.