Evolutionary Approaches to Religion

Within the broader conversation about religion and science, no topic has sparked more interest than the Darwinian revolution and whether it can be fully reconciled with faith. Although the traditional focus concerned evolutionary biology and its implications for design arguments, biblical hermeneutics, human uniqueness, the problem of evil, and secularism, the past few decades have witnessed evolutionary attempts to explain religion itself. These explanations have produced new challenges for attempts to uncover the overall significance of evolution for religion.

This entry overviews evolutionary approaches to religion in both science and philosophy. After exploring broadly evolutionary (including cognitive) attempts to explain religion as a natural phenomenon, it considers whether these theories would, if on track, “explain away” religion, provide it with support, or lack relevance for religious belief and practice. The next section overviews evolutionary approaches to the philosophy of religion. This includes Darwin’s impact on arguments concerning God’s existence, or natural theology, and another area that might be called “evolutionary religious epistemology”. The latter subfield has produced a reliability challenge for naturalism and a more recent idea from J.L. Schellenberg called “evolutionary religion”, which imagines a non-theistic future of faith. A closing remark about the contemporary status of Stephen J. Gould’s suggestion that evolution and religion are best seen as non-overlapping spheres, rather than paradigms in conflict or overlapping harmony, will help to integrate diverse strands of thought.

• 1. The Evolutionary Origins of Religion Itself
  • 1.1 Religion as an Evolutionary By-Product
  • 1.2 Religion as Evolutionarily Advantageous and a Controversy about the Rise of Social Complexity
  • 1.3 Hybrid Models, Explanatory Pluralism, and Methodological Criticism
• 2. Philosophical and Religious Dimensions
  • 2.1 Evolutionary Debunking Arguments
  • 2.2 Criticisms of Evolutionary Debunking Arguments
  • 2.3 A Puzzle About Coexistence Reasoning and Methodological Atheism
  • 2.4 Consensus Gentium, Religious Diversity, and the Cognitive Underpinnings of Nature Spirits
• 3. Evolutionary Approaches to the Philosophy of Religion and Natural Theology
  • 3.1 Design Arguments, Divine Hiddenness, and Evil After Darwin
  • 3.2 The Epistemology of Deep Time, the Future of Faith, and a Reliability Challenge for Naturalism
  • 3.3 The Contemporary Status of Non-Overlapping Magisteria (NOMA) and Other Models
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

---

1. The Evolutionary Origins of Religion Itself

Evolutionary accounts of religion often begin with a striking observation. There are thousands of religions in the world today. Many more have gone extinct. There was also a time without religion—a time before anything like gods or spirits was affirmed, followed, feared, or revered, and a time before spiritual practices. What explains this shift? Why did religion, in the sense of characteristically religious ways of thinking, behaving, and experiencing the world, arise and spread to virtually every known human society? Why do structurally similar and often costly rituals arise? And why, despite the notable diversity across and within the world’s faiths, have concepts of a moralizing God become so culturally successful in recent millennia?

Over the past few decades, a number of researchers from a wide range of disciplines including biology, anthropology, evolutionary psychology, complexity science, cultural evolutionary theory, philosophy, and religious studies have sought to address these questions. In contrast to more traditional attempts to explain religion in natural terms—from Xenophanes, Epicurus, and Hume—recent theorists draw on a range of tools and methods that emerged following the Darwinian and cognitive revolutions (Guthrie 1980; Boyd & Richerson 1985; Boyer 2001; Atran 2002; Kelemen 2004; Whitehouse 2004; J. Barrett 2007; Cohen 2007; Taves 2009; Norenzayan 2013; C. White 2021; Lior & Lane 2022; Turchin, Whitehouse, Gavrilets, et al. 2022; Grande 2024). While there is likely no single explanation for why anything as multifaceted as “religion” exists—a complexity that justifies a multidisciplinary approach—these thinkers agree that religion has broadly evolutionary roots. However, since they characterize the relationship between evolution and religion in different ways, these differences need to be examined.

1.1 Religion as an Evolutionary By-Product

For many in the field, religion is an evolutionary accident or by-product. Sometimes called the “Standard Model” (R. Powell & Clarke 2012), this cognitive approach proposes that culturally recurring forms of religious expression, including what Darwin called “the belief in unseen or spiritual agencies” (Darwin 1871: 65), evolved not because they promoted our survival or enhanced our genetic fitness. Rather, religion emerged as a side-effect of our ordinary evolved cognitive capacities. As Justin Barrett puts it,

Commonly scholars in the cognitive science of religion (CSR) have advanced the naturalness of religion thesis. That is, ordinary cognitive resources operating in ordinary human environments typically lead to some kind of belief in supernatural agency and perhaps other religious ideas. Special cultural scaffolding is unnecessary. Supernaturalism falls near a natural anchor point. (J. Barrett 2010: 169)

This cognitive science of religion (hereafter CSR) framework can acknowledge that “religion” is a form of culture that may be impossible to precisely define. But its proponents often claim that characteristically religious features can be identified and investigated, and that particularly ubiquitous features are “informed and constrained” by human cognition or how the mind works. Taking inspiration from the cognitive revolution in the second half of the twentieth century—which suggested that the human mind is naturally built to process or think about information in certain ways—many theorists have made a broad analogy to natural language. They argue that if diverse languages share underlying structural and cognitive foundations that inform and constrain their development and expression, religion may be similar (Bloom 2007: 148).

According to the cognitive approach to religion, then, a fundamental explanation for why rocks, dinosaurs, and horses aren’t religious and why most developed human beings are religious boils down to evolved cognitive differences. So, what are the cognitive features that allegedly gave rise to religious representations and behaviors as a side effect? No doubt various mental prerequisites are required before complex cultural expression could emerge, including causal reasoning, imagination, foresight, perspective taking, and memory. But since versions of these capacities exist in large-brained birds called Corvids (Schnell & Clayton 2022), who aren’t religious in the relevant senses, they won’t be deemed sufficient in CSR. Turning to more recent hominid evolution, increased neocortex size also matters to cultural expression (Dunbar 2003), as does increased precision and control in the prefrontal cortex and executive function—evidenced in the Lower Paleolithic handaxe (Stout et al. 2015).

Again, these neurocognitive structures are connected and important. But if you ask by-product theorists about the cognitive underpinnings of religion, many will point to more specific cognitive habits, content-biases, predispositions, and tendencies directly involved in—or related to—social cognition, teleological perception, and meaning-making, such as:

• Agency Detection Capacity. We’re naturally inclined to perceive the world in terms of agency, to see faces in clouds, trees, and pretty much everything else (Guthrie 1993). This tendency helped our ancestors to avoid predators but as a side effect human beings (not just so-called “animists”) anthropomorphize in nature and religion. Some propose a hypersensitive agency detection device (HADD) that automatically leads us to interpret certain ambiguous stimuli (such as movements and sounds) in terms of agency, even when no one is present (J. Barrett 2004; Boyer 2001). Darwin himself observed a rudimentary form of agency detection in his dog, who barked at “movement without any apparent cause”, as if a mysterious agent were present (Darwin 1871: 67).
• Theory of Mind. Once an agent has been detected, we seek to read their minds and to wonder what they are thinking or feeling—often with the goal of predicting or explaining their behavior. This natural tendency to “mentalize” others by adopting the “intentional stance” also has apparent religious side-effects: it is hard to stop mind reading a loved one who dies (Dennett 2006). This may encourage thoughts of afterlife (Bering & Bjorklund 2004) and divine minds (J. Barrett 2004). Some even suggest that deficits in mentalizing may reduce belief in personal deities (Norenzayan et al. 2012).
• Existential Theory of Mind. Our mentalizing tendencies may extend beyond social cognition, shaping how we see the world. According to existential theory of mind (EToM), key life events—such as births, deaths, diseases, and tragedies—are often implicitly interpreted as happening for a reason, rather than being the result of pure chance or happenstance (Bering 2002). This causal tendency may also interact with other mental habits just mentioned, creating a larger sense of meaning or purpose in life that is consistent with much explicit religious teaching.
• Teleological Thinking. Children seem prone to teleological explanations of nature (Kelemen 2004) and even educated adults can find gradual explanations of observed phenomena unintuitive (Evans 2000). When combined with other cognitive processes or dispositions, our teleological mode of perception supports the idea that religious thinking is easier and more “maturationally” natural for many people than scientific thinking or other academic styles of thinking, including from theology (McCauley 2011).
• Dualistic Thinking. We may also be prone to dualistic thinking or cognition early on in life, perceiving physical bodies and minds as very different from one another (Bloom 2007: 149). This developmental tendency is consistent with ethnographic observations of spirit possession (Cohen 2007) and may also help to explain some ancient and modern burial practices (Swan, Bering, et al. 2023). If dualistic reasoning stems from something fundamental, like theory of mind, it should arise in diverse cultural settings, including early and contemporary China. Some suggest that this is the case (Slingerland 2013; Zhu 2017; Cook 2006).
• Attraction to Minimally Counterintuitive Agents and Stories. Some cognitive anthropologists argue that we are more likely to remember and spread stories involving minimally counterintuitive (MCI) concepts (Boyer 2001). These concepts violate our normal expectations about how the world works (e.g., a weeping statue and supernatural agents). If the right religious concepts, types, or cognitive templates are more easily remembered and spread, in comparison to highly ordinary or maximally counterintuitive concepts, this might help explain their cultural pervasiveness (Boyer & Ramble 2001). Even Buddhism, despite some contemporary atheistic expressions of it, has historically included a number of MCI agents and features (Pyysiäinen 2003).

By-product theorists may disagree about which and how many of these evolved cognitive features are required to explain religion. They may also disagree about whether certain core capacities, like theory of mind, require a specialized mental module or a robustly computational view of mind. But many will insist that some combination of the above features help to explain the prevalence and staying power of much religious thought and action—including, some may add, ritualistic behaviors (McCauley & Lawson 2002). Put differently, this traditional CSR framework tends to see most people as implicit believers, for whom religious thinking is often the path of least resistance—which doesn’t strictly imply that it is innate. In fact, even atheists who explicitly reject the reality of any supernatural agents, including ghosts, occasionally exhibit fear responses to them in the lab (Bering, Smith, et al. 2021). Religious believers, moreover, often exhibit “theologically incorrect” ideas while online that they explicitly reject offline, meaning that how the divine gets represented, including degrees of anthropomorphism or transcendence, is highly context-dependent (Slone 2004).

This is not to deny the reality of controversy. CSR (although maturing) is still a relatively new research program and not everyone is on board with every idea above. For instance, criticisms of HADD, MCI theory, and the idea that differences in mentalizing reduces religious belief in autistic persons have been advanced (Purzycki & Willard 2016; Farias et al. 2017; Maij et al. 2019; Van Leeuwen & van Elk 2019; Beebe & Duffy 2020; Hayat et al. 2024). There is also the “Mickey Mouse problem”, which concerns why only some MCI concepts gain serious religious traction. These and other criticisms (whether conceptual or empirical) are often met with responses, modifications, or further proposals (Lior & Lane 2022; Swan & Halberstadt 2019; Guthrie 2016).

1.2 Religion as Evolutionarily Advantageous and a Controversy about the Rise of Social Complexity

Another viewpoint proposes that religion, far from a functionless by-product or accident, is a biological or cultural solution to coordination problems. Maybe religion evolved (or was culturally selected) because of its effects on cooperation, group cohesion, and well-being. To get a flavor of some proposed group-level advantages of religious thinking and behaving, consider some commonly addressed questions in the field:

• Do religious communes outlast secular ones? If so, does this support costly signaling theories of religion?
• Does the idea that one is being watched by unseen agents, who can issue supernatural punishment, promote prosocial behaviors? If so, are atheists more prone to distrust and prejudice than believers?
• Does the emergence of Big Gods precede and help to explain the transition from small to big societies over the last ten thousand years?
• Might the explanation for why humans started to believe and behave in religious ways, after diverging from the great apes six to eight million years ago, have less to do with the fear of supernatural watchers and more to do with early and beneficial “trance” states or spiritual consciousness?
• Does religiosity reduce death anxiety or enhance well-being?

In response to question one, Richard Sosis and Eric Bressler (2003) found that religious communes, with an average duration of just over 25 years, last more than three times longer than the secular ones on average. In follow-up research, historical data for eighty-three communes from the nineteenth century were compared, and secular communes were apparently “3 times more likely to dissolve in a given year than religious communes” (Sosis & Bressler 2003). These findings, which combine insights from Darwin and Durkheim, are sometimes thought to provide some support for the costly signaling theory of religion—which roughly holds that risky religious rituals and other costly modes of religiosity culturally evolved because they facilitate in-group loyalty, trust, and cooperation, by selecting members willing to walk the walk with “hard-to-fake” commitments. Indeed, risky behaviors like “ritual mutilation, animal sacrifice and martyrdom” function as “credibility enhancing displays (CREDs)” of genuine commitment to one’s faith and group (Henrich 2009). To further test the social benefits of extreme rituals, two ritual practices in the Hindu festival of Thaipusam were economically measured to reveal higher generosity (Xygalatas et al. 2013).

While many evolutionary biologists think in terms of individual-level adaptationism, where natural selection works on individuals, David Sloan Wilson is a major proponent of group selection theories of religion (Wilson 2002). If a group can function as a single organism or unit of selection, subject to Darwinian forces, then altruistic behaviors and individual sacrifice might become less biologically puzzling. As Wilson puts it, “Many features of religion …can be explained as adaptations designed to enable human groups to function as adaptive units” (Wilson 2002: 51). This framework needn’t deem group selection the only force relevant to the (relatively fast) cultural evolution of religion; it can also acknowledge the (much slower) genetic formation of the psychological mechanisms involved in religion. Still, the core idea that natural selection involves “differential success of groups rather than individuals” makes the view controversial among many biologists (Coyne 2002)—though see Haidt (2012) for an updated group selection account of religion and Davis (2015) for an explanation of why cultural group selection models in the social sciences are distinct from more “tenuous” genetic group selection models in biology.

Question two concerns the monitoring dimensions of religion. Even if certain core biological and emotional features of morality predate religion—and so can exist without it (de Waal 2013)—a cultural evolutionary lens permits further adaptive connections between moral emotions and religious belief. According to supernatural punishment theories of religion, the belief that “God is watching you”, combined with fear of supernatural punishment, disincentivizes cheaters and free riders and promotes prosocial behaviors like giving (Schloss & Murray 2011). This generosity effect has been observed in economic games with religiously primed givers (Shariff & Norenzayan 2007), including Moroccan shopkeepers during Islamic calls to prayer (Duhaime 2015)—though not every finding in this domain has replicated (Miyatake & Higuchi 2017). In another study, being told about an invisible Princess Alice dissuaded children from cheating in videotaped games (Piazza, Bering, & Ingram 2011). The above effects are also sometimes said to predict and explain an independently observed pattern: namely a nearly global distrust of atheists and anti-atheist bias (Gervais, Xygalatas, et al. 2017). Not unrelatedly, since group cohesion and trust can impact reproduction, some biological anthropologists call for cooperation theories of religion to compare reproductive rates between religious and nonreligious groups—while also examining how religion influences cooperation among both kin and non-kin (Shaver et al. 2024).

Evolutionary approaches to religion also tackle a historical question that has long puzzled cultural evolutionary theorists: namely, how human beings made the transition from small societies to much larger and more complex societies over the last ten thousand years or so. Such a shift would presumably involve massive levels of cooperation. One popular proposal contends that the emergence of Big Gods—familiar in many major monotheistic and polytheistic cultures—helped to drive social complexity and cooperative stability during the Holocene, even if it also sparked new tensions between competing groups (Norenzayan 2013). If the gods or spirits of “older” hunter-gather religions were generally unconcerned about human morality (Baumard & Boyer 2013), or failed to promote cooperation (C. White, Marin, & Fessler 2022), and if moralizing gods with increased monitoring powers did the opposite, then Big Gods do not merely permit big religious societies. They may also drive their evolution in ways that might eventually permit big secular societies (with adequate surveillance) to replace them (Norenzayan 2013).

The proposal that “watched people are nice people” and that “nice people drive social complexity” has gained some traction. But the field of cultural evolutionary studies is currently divided about which came first, big Gods or big societies. Many acknowledge a widespread correlation between big Gods and big societies. But some scholars claim the causal direction goes the other way, so that big societies generally preceded big Gods in world history. Drawing on Seshat data, the latter scholars tested 414 societies from 30 different locations around the globe (Turchin, Whitehouse, Gavrilets, et al. 2022). It is important to note, however, that this study, even if still defended as mostly valid by the research team (Turchin, Whitehouse, Larson, et al. 2023; Whitehouse et al. 2021), originally appeared in a now retracted paper in Nature (2019 [retracted 2021]). The retraction followed criticism that the study treated “all cases of missing data as known absences of moralizing gods…both in their t-tests…and logistic regression…”, rather than “unknown” (Beheim et al. 2021). Whether the key error amounted to the mislabeling of still-valuable data or was fundamental and cataclysmic depends on which research team one asks. It also rests on wider assumptions about the nature of statistical inference, the validity of using Seshat data to test history, and partly philosophical questions about when absence of evidence is evidence of absence and when it is not (Sober 2009).

Other evolutionary proposals exist. Robin Dunbar, notable for his controversial idea that close-knit human groups tend to max out at 150 individuals, has recently turned his attention to religion (Dunbar 2022). In contrast to those who focus on more recent doctrinal religions or big supernatural monitors, Dunbar thinks the raw-feelings of mystical elements or early “trance states” represent the evolutionary core of religion. These more experiential features are said to pre-date doxastic religions and to promote social bonding, along with psychological well-being. Given the growing call for more experiential explanations of religiosity in the science of religion (Taves 2009; Baker & Zimmerman 2019), Dunbar’s claims might feel timely—though some theorists may argue that more mystical (rather than ordinary) religious experiences fall more properly within the domains of psychology or neuroscience of religion. Lastly, some evolutionary systematists seek to map the phylogenetic tree of religion by charting its shared characteristics, evolved differences, and key extinction events. One recent attempt here proposes distinct branches for Asian cyclism, polytheism, and monotheism and seeks to trace how religion develops from the more spiritual, to the more archaic, to the more organized (Grande 2024). As with evolutionary biology itself, the latter approach is less about finding an absolute origin and more about mapping change over time.

The above proposed social, moral, and prudential benefits of religion need not be exhaustive. For example, Terror Management Theory (TMT) theorists have claimed that religious commitment evolved to help individuals manage existential fear and death anxiety (Vail et al. 2010)—though an examination of 100 studies reveals a weaker link between fear of death and religiosity than this framework predicts (Jong, Ross, et al. 2018). A different meta-study notes a strong connection between religiosity and life-satisfaction (Yaden et al. 2022), though the authors note that some religious frameworks may reduce well-being even if most religious people score higher here.

1.3 Hybrid Models, Explanatory Pluralism, and Methodological Criticism

A third approach combines the first two: maybe “religion” (or key aspects of it) both contains accidental cognitive elements and is culturally adaptive in ways that permit a more traditional evolutionary analysis. Even if some earlier theorists felt the need to divide into two competing camps, hybrid theories that more fully connect cognition and culture are on the rise. Indeed, it is becoming increasingly less clear that the by-product interpretation remains the standard model. A well-known theorist in the area, Ara Norenzayan, discusses his own shift toward pluralism:

I got started on this journey steeped in the cognitive byproduct perspective…I still think the insights of the cognitive byproduct account are foundational to any grand evolutionary explanation of religion, but I have come to the conclusion that it cannot do the job alone. When it is fused with a cultural evolutionary framework, we get a powerful, and more comprehensive evolutionary synthesis that explains both recurrent features and cultural and historical variability found in religion. (2015: 328)

One version of a hybrid theory is the Dual Inheritance Approach—which posits that genetic and cultural factors evolve together. This gene-culture coevolutionary framework has been said to enjoy “considerable support” in explaining widespread forms of nonbelief (Gervais, Najle, & Caluori 2021). While the details of how to combine different ideas remain controversial, it is telling that many of the scholars cited in prior sections are open to a range of interwoven evolutionary causes. To cite just one example, in a joint-work with a religion scholar that introduces “evolutionary religious studies” David Sloan Wilson notes that “positions that previously seemed incompatible have been reconciled with each other” (Wilson & Green 2011: 224). Philosophers of biology also see more room for pluralistic views than many earlier theorists (Bourrat 2014; R. Powell & Clarke 2012). Since different levels of evolutionary causation and explanation are possible, a common proposal is that religion arose as a cognitive product, in ways that the standard model suggests but was later co-opted for adaptive functions. Perhaps because the field is characterized by what Justin Barrett calls “explanatory pluralism”, which permits “whatever data collection analysis methods that appear appropriate to the questions at hand” it was almost inevitable that “a genuine cognition-evolution synthesis…” would “increasingly characterize the field” (2007). Consistent with Barrett’s soft prediction, in 2020, the International Association for the Cognitive Science of Religion (IACSR) was renamed the International Association for the Cognitive and Evolutionary Sciences of Religion (IACESR).

More recent hybrid frameworks incorporate cultural group selection models, where cultural behaviors like “intergroup competition will favor…group-beneficial traits…” like reciprocity (Henrich & Boyd 2016). More generally, since traits can get transmitted to the next generation genetically (by passing down genes through reproduction) and culturally (by passing down ideas through cultural transmission), this allows for multiple levels of evolutionary interaction. So, for instance, once religious ideas and behaviors emerge, the wider mechanisms of cultural group selection might kick in, impacting how particular religions compete, spread, and change. These mechanisms include intergroup competition (e.g., war and conquest), differential group survival without conflict (e.g., using cultural products like fur clothing to survive a harsh winter), differential reproduction (e.g., teachings that forbid non-reproductive forms of sex or that require procreation). Additionally, sheep stealing or inspiring others to mimic one’s religious culture can contribute to cultural change. Some of these processes appear analogous to random genetic drift in evolutionary biology, and many of them allow for relatively rapid changes. The combination could impact not just which groups succeed and spread, but also which ideas do—though for some theoretical challenges to cultural evolutionary studies, see Nichols et al. 2024.

This is not to deny the possibility of larger doubts about evolutionary approaches to religion, including hybrid approaches. Paul Thagard distinguishes various possible evolutionary possibilities but thinks that absent “a dramatic increase in historical and biological knowledge about the evolution of homo sapiens…” (2005: 72) evolutionary explanations of the origins of religion (like language) will fall short. At the same time, this was penned before much of the most significant work in the field had been completed. Other criticisms range from more friendly (Laidlaw 2016) to more critical (N.F. Barrett 2010; B. Smith 2009; Plantinga 2009; Cho & Squier 2008). Some critics deem the entire approach too Abrahamic, atheistic, reductionistic, or otherwise Western, Educated, Industrialized, Rich, and Democratic (WEIRD). Others see evolutionary theorizing as sidestepping interpretive approaches to religion (while preserving problematic comparative approaches); or as otherwise connected to the colonial history of science. In addition, many of the above theories make evolutionary assumptions about morality—for instance, those who claim that fear of supernatural punishment dissuades cheating in humans (Schloss & Murray 2011) somewhat resemble those who suggest that bonobos are altruistic because they readily react to allegedly moral emotions (de Waal 2014). In response, some Kantians may worry that evolutionary frameworks of morality (both biological and cultural) tend to misconstrue what counts as morality and to overlook our species’ unique rational capacity for “normative self-government”. This includes our capacity to reason from principles and isn’t merely about coordinating groups or responding to emotions (Korsgaard 2010). Such criticisms might also extend to evolutionary accounts of so-called moral religions.

Not all of these criticisms are fair and some may reflect misunderstandings of the field (Grande 2024; Cohen et al. 2008). For instance, few cognitive or evolutionary scientists are out to replace other disciplines or approaches to the study of religion. And since evolutionary theorists tend to see value in uncovering bottom-up causal processes that can function to coordinate groups, even when reasoned reflection isn’t clearly present (Kitcher 2011), Kantian criticisms might only go so far. To be sure, certain social critiques of the field may have some merit. For instance, contemporary discussions of “animism” could more often dissociate themselves from the problematic assumptions of earlier theorists, such as Darwin, Hume, or Tylor (Wilkinson 2023), who framed animism in homogeneous and Eurocentric terms. Even so, it is worth noting that the scientific study of religion needn’t (and often doesn’t) assume a normative conception of progress when it describes biological or cultural evolution (Grande 2024). What’s more, some of the founders of WEIRD (Henrich, Heine, & Norenzayan 2010) are also pioneers in the scientific study of religion. (As for whether the field is inherently atheistic, we will consider this in section 2.3.) In a word, many practitioners within the scientific study of religion remain fairly optimistic about the prospects of a pluralistic, empirically informed account of religion.

Although more could be said, this provides a general overview of evolutionary accounts of religion without invoking outdated ideas like a “God gene” (e.g., VMAT2; M. Goldman 2004), a “God center” in one region of the brain, or religious memes evolving solely for their own replication, possibly to our detriment (Dennett 2006; Dawkins 1993).

2. Philosophical and Religious Dimensions

Let us suppose that broadly evolutionary explanations are on track and that scientific accounts of religion are doing for religion what Darwin did for life’s development: they are slowly naturalizing it, and are explaining why most people believe in gods, spirits, or miracles. Let us suppose, too, that religious commitment—even if it goes well beyond belief—does involve belief that is aimed at truth (but see Van Leeuwen 2023 for a different view). This raises a philosophical question relevant to the wider relationship between evolutionary thought and religion: Do evolutionary accounts of religion debunk religious belief? Do they show that such beliefs are false or irrational or less than knowable, at least for those who become aware of the relevant science? Alternatively, might these accounts be more epistemologically neutral or even supportive of faith?

2.1 Evolutionary Debunking Arguments

In the philosophical literature on debunking arguments, two broad ideas enjoy widespread consensus. First, uncovering the origins of one’s beliefs won’t (by itself) reveal that they are false. Here some point to the genetic fallacy (Jong & Visala 2014). Second, under the right circumstances, uncovering the origins of one’s belief might nonetheless pose some kind of an epistemological problem for that belief. Consider the following case:

Taylor Swift Case: A popular music fan, Sara, comes to firmly believe that Taylor Swift likes her. Suppose that Sara formed this belief by trusting a bad source (e.g., a highly unreliable tabloid) or through some off-track causal process (e.g., being hypnotized to believe this, along with thousands of other Swifties, at a campus event last night). What should we conclude about this case? Is Sara’s belief rational?

In a case like this, the background story (a kind of bad etiology) seems to uncover a problematic process of belief formation in ways that ought to instill epistemic anxiety, uncertainty, and doubt—at least if one cares about truth and reliability, and isn’t merely interested in maintaining certain practices, like being a good Swiftie. In fact, sticking to one’s belief in a case like this, after one learns about its origins, might look like a paradigm instance of irrationality.

Now consider a more ordinary case of perception:

Perception Case: Another popular music fan, Anahita, comes to firmly believe that she is currently looking at Taylor Swift on stage. Suppose that Anahita formed this belief by relying on her visual apparatus combined with her background belief that she is currently at a Taylor Swift concert. Suppose, too, that Anahita recently learned about the evolution of human visual systems. What should we conclude about this case? Is Anahita’s belief rational?

In this latter case, no clear irrationality seems to be present—and if Anahita really is at the concert, she plausibly knows this. Learning about the origins of one’s belief changes nothing. One way of framing the debate over religious debunking arguments is to ask: does the situation of the religious believer more closely resemble the case of Sara or Anahita? This remains controversial. But for those who think the skeptical etiological pressure is on, here is a fairly common type of contemporary debunking challenge that first arose in the literature on evolution and morality (Kahane 2011) and which has since been applied to religion.

• Causal premise: S’s belief that p is explained by X.
• Epistemic premise: X is an off-track process.
• Conclusion: Therefore, S’s belief that p is unjustified.

Applied to morality, the evolutionary debunking argument can be stated as follows: given our evolutionary history, people would believe in certain moral ideas (e.g., you should care for your children more than strangers) whether or not there were any mind-independent moral facts (Street 2006). It is thus easy to see how evolution could lead people astray from objective truth. To consider an analogous debunking argument to belief in supernatural agents, let us simplify the causal premise by proposing just one cause of belief. As is often stated, since HADD is a “better-safe-than-sorry” mechanism, it produces many false positives. Maybe HADD does a decent job when it comes to detecting evolutionarily important beings in one’s physical environment (e.g., bears or high-status individuals like Taylor Swift). But it is far less likely to be accurate when it comes to detecting unseen agents with supernatural properties, which has significance for the epistemic premise.

While attractively concise, this version of the debunking argument is too quick. Setting aside the epistemic premise for now, the causal premise faces a hurdle: even if HADD is religiously foundational—which, recall, is controversial—it is unlikely to give a complete account of religious belief (Murray 2009: 171). For many, a more plausible debunking argument would thus factor in the range of causes of religion. One attempt to expand the causal premise in a more pluralistic direction claims that CSR can, without assuming atheism, pose real doubts about God and whether theistic belief is reliably formed (Goodnick 2016). Since the latter reliability challenge still operates within a by-product framework, however, future debunking arguments might further expand the causal premise to reflect hybrid accounts of religion.

Such an updated debunking argument might continue to scrutinize beliefs driven by EToM reasoning (e.g., “That car accident happened because I needed to learn that my life is fragile”), promiscuous teleology (which can lead children to think “Rocks are pointy so animals can scratch themselves”), or an attraction to MCI concepts. But it might, in addition, factor in other evolutionary causes of belief. For example, it might consider whether the doxastic dimensions of group cohesion—such as believing in order to belong or to thrive—are likely to be collectively reliable or to put us in touch with religious and moral reality, and not just survival. To be sure, theistic critics of debunking arguments might object by noting that a moral God would want moral religions to thrive, rendering their relative (evolutionarily) success somewhat expected under theism. But since religion doesn’t just promote prosocial tendencies and is often also associated with outgroup violence (Teehan 2010), conquest, and behaving nicely because one is being watched (Norenzayan 2013), this objection would need to be developed.

Of course, there is no guarantee that a beefed-up debunking challenge would succeed. But believers who think that (1) HADD + ToM + EToM + MCI + evolutionary causes go far in explaining religious belief; and who think that (2) most of the supernatural agents that have been affirmed by most people throughout history do not objectively exist, may be more vulnerable to a debunking worry. They may find “live” the skeptical suggestion that, on account of these causes, they would still believe largely as they do—even if no gods, God, or karmic realities existed. Or they may worry that their belief-forming methods are unreliable in some other sense.

2.2 Criticisms of Evolutionary Debunking Arguments

There are various ways to respond to debunking arguments. Some theists have endorsed a metaphysical reply, noting that since God is a necessary being—existing in all possible worlds—claims about what people would believe if God does not exist are ontically confused. As Michael Murray put it, “I, for example, don’t think there would be a universe if there were no God” (2009: 175). But this response arguably misconstrues the fundamentally epistemological nature of the challenge: epistemic possibilities can lead one to revise one’s metaphysics.

For many, a more promising line of response to debunking arguments scrutinizes their epistemological credentials. This approach claims that evolutionary debunking arguments tend to be formulated in terms that would be unacceptable in contemporary epistemology. Call this “Debunking Challenges Rest on Naive Epistemology” reply. For instance, one natural way of spelling out the epistemic premise in the original debunking argument above rests on what epistemologists call a sensitivity or truth-tracking condition for knowledge. Consider:

If p were false, S wouldn’t believe that p.

While truth-tracking or sensitivity theories held early promise, contemporary epistemologists tend to reject sensitivity as a requirement for knowledge (and one might add, rationality). One chief worry here concerns its apparently far-reaching skeptical implications (Greco 2007). For instance, take the belief that we live in a physical world. Even if this belief were false, say because we are all brains in vats or live in a compelling computer simulation, we’d still likely believe it to be true. Are we really now supposed to become external world skeptics? Most epistemologists will answer negatively. More generally, “You just believe that because” type worries have been argued to rest on implausible epistemological assumptions (R. White 2010). Since all of our cognitive faculties have natural origins, on a Darwinian framework, evolutionary debunking arguments in morality and religion are risky. If you allow them in the door, they could overgeneralize (Kahane 2011). Some even claim that mathematical beliefs could be in jeopardy if debunking challenges to moral realism are accepted (Clarke-Doane 2014). While some may think that religious beliefs have unique features, others insist that much of the epistemological and metaphysical messiness that characterizes moral and mathematical debunking arguments also presents itself in religious versions (Baker-Hytch 2022).

The above anti-skeptical strategy should be distinguished from a much bolder Moorean alternative, according to which the debunker cannot win the debate. For instance, in response to the parallel evolutionary challenge to morality, Thomas Nagel says,

Street holds that a Darwinian account is strongly supported by contemporary science, so she concludes that moral realism is false. I follow the same inference in the opposite direction: Since moral realism is true, a Darwinian account of the motives underlying moral judgment must be false, in spite of the scientific consensus in its favor. (2012: 105)

While a parallel Moorean reversal could technically be made in the religious case, it is unlikely to find favor among religious academics seeking to accommodate evolutionary frameworks and academics favoring Socratic methodologies in domains like religion. Indeed, for many, Moorean methodologies in this context will seem unjustifiably dogmatic.

There are other ways to challenge debunking arguments and other ways to formulate them. Defenders of debunking arguments sometimes frame their challenges by invoking more widely accepted epistemological principles like safety (roughly: S knows truth P only if S could not easily have falsely believed P)—though not everyone agrees that safety is a requirement on knowledge. Alternatively, some philosophers, drawing on background claims about the pluralism of god beliefs, have developed a “debunking argument from false beliefs”. According to this challenge, given their diverse outputs, CSR-style explanations support suspending judgment about the “class of god beliefs” (Braddock 2016).

In addition to the “Debunking Challenges Rest on Naive Epistemology” reply, the “Independent Religious Reasons” reply also remains fairly popular. Advocates of this approach claim that some religious believers, at least, can reasonably go on believing despite what CSR says because they possess independent grounds or reasons for their religious beliefs (Thurow 2013, 2023). These independent sources of support might take the form of natural theological arguments or testimony. Or they might come more directly from religious experiences (Clark & Barrett 2010). Whatever the source, they make it harder for a debunking argument to apply. (By analogy, if you truly think you’ve directly perceived Taylor Swift telling you that she likes you, or if you trusted a knower, then your belief may be epistemically in good shape, even if—in addition—you’ve fallen prey to tabloids or the methods of hypnotists before).

Unsurprisingly, not everyone thinks that religious beliefs do typically have sufficiently strong independent support to entirely neutralize etiological pressures. For one thing, setting aside whether natural theological arguments are strong enough to justify belief, some question whether they are truly independent of the causes described by CSR (De Cruz & De Smedt 2015). A related worry is not merely that independent considerations might cut in different directions (e.g., the problem of evil), it is that the science of religion might itself predict a resistance to debunking arguments. For instance, Josh Thurow denies that debunking arguments fully undermine religious belief. But he also acknowledges that if CSR predicts rationalization in how beliefs get maintained in the face of debunking challenges, or otherwise makes theistic arguments seem more credible than they are, awareness of these psychological facts could generate partial defeat or require a reduction in confidence (Thurow 2023). Similarly, other independence theorists—even if they think that many debunking arguments gain little from CSR—have acknowledged that some ordinary religious experiences may get undercut by CSR (Launonen 2024).

Perhaps the epistemological reality is more nuanced than either “full defeat” or “no problem at all” frameworks suggest. Whatever view one adopts, however, it is doubtful that debunking arguments will go away anytime soon.

2.3 A Puzzle About Coexistence Reasoning and Methodological Atheism

A related but distinct challenge concerns whether theological attempts to accommodate the science of religion have limits. As Peter van Inwagen puts it, when do “naturalistic explanations of a fact or phenomenon resist being incorporated into a larger, more comprehensive supernatural explanation[?]” (Van Inwagen 2009: 134). While Van Inwagen thinks that CSR may be providentially interpreted, he adds that not every natural explanation is like this. He offers the following story:

Suppose that a statue of the Virgin in an Italian church is observed to weep; or at any rate, that it is how it looks. It is eventually discovered, however, that the apparent tears are bat urine (it seems that some bats have made their home in the dim recesses of the church ceiling). This account of the tears is of course logically consistent with having a partly supernaturalistic explanation (maybe God wanted the statue to appear to be weeping and He so guided the bats that they took residence in just the right spot). Still, it resists being incorporated into a larger supernatural explanation—it strongly suggests that “there is nothing more to it” than ordinary causes and chance. (Van Inwagen 2009: 135)

We needn’t resolve complex debates about simplicity in the philosophy of science—nor about reliability and debunking in epistemology—to appreciate the problem here. Holding onto the miracle belief in this case would be “unreasonable, contrived, artificial, or desperate” (Van Inwagen 2009: 136). To be sure, Van Inwagen denies that most current scientific accounts of religion (in contrast to older ideas from Freud, Marx, and Feuerbach) resist accommodation. But his discussion invites a wider question: might people’s actual tendency to combine natural and supernatural explanations be more permissive—or more like the bat case—than Van Inwagen lets on? Investigation into this matter might engage empirical work in anthropology and psychology. For instance, Pascal Boyer discusses a certain community that, when encountering the roof of a mud house collapsing, explains the calamity both as termite erosion and in terms of witchcraft (Boyer 2001: 12). This real-world example, to clarify, is not meant to single out or disrespect any group, as though they are especially unique. The point is that coexistence reasoning looks like a highly human and cross-cultural tendency that extends to medical settings (Legare et al. 2012). Since this reasoning can appear highly fallible from a scientific perspective, more discussion about when coexistence reasoning is fitting, and when it isn’t, would be welcome.

Some of this discussion might intersect with larger questions about whether CSR endorses methodological atheism—and so aims to be metaphysically and causally complete when addressing why religion exists. Some popular statements about CSR can seem to encourage the idea that this field has inherently atheistic methods or aims. For instance, Jesse Bering reportedly said of this research area, “We’ve got God by the throat and I’m not going to stop until one of us is dead” (Reischel 2006). When combined with titles like Richard Dawkins’ “Viruses of the Mind” (Dawkins 1993) or Daniel Dennett’s Breaking the Spell (Dennett 2006), both of which liken religion to a mind virus, much of the general public might be forgiven for assuming that scientific theorizing about religion has ideological aims or at least bakes in atheological results.

Thankfully, from the standpoint of public trust in science, the reality is more nuanced and more metaphysically neutral. Many theistic scientists, including Justin Barrett, not only seek to incorporate CSR’s findings into their religious worldview; they further contribute to the theoretical and empirical literature (J. Barrett 2004). Just as evolutionary thinkers permit that fully natural processes like random mutation (Sober 2014) and embryological development (Lamoureux 2009) might still be guided by the divine, a parallel move is available to accommodate evolutionary accounts of religion: maybe the divine planned this particular pathway for religion to develop. (To be sure, many scientists and philosophers will find coexistence frameworks in all of these contexts highly unnecessary or evidentially unmotivated. But the current question is whether the relevant science strictly rules them out.) Even some of the best-known atheist voices deny that the science of religion is inherently atheistic. For instance, the spell that Dennett sought to break in his book is not religion itself, but the idea that religion cannot be studied scientifically. He isn’t declaring that all religion is false, at least not in this context; though his claims about miracles might complicate the picture a bit (Dennett 2006: 25). For most theorists in the field, arguably including Bering in most cases, the science of religion is a descriptive, bottom-up approach whose wider implications remain a distinct philosophical matter.

2.4 Consensus Gentium, Religious Diversity, and the Cognitive Underpinnings of Nature Spirits

Beyond raising questions about debunking or coexistence reasoning, scientific accounts of religion may carry other forms of philosophical significance and may bolster the case for or against certain conceptions of the divine. For instance, those who adopt a framework of universal cognitive trust, perhaps as an anti-skeptical starting point in epistemology, might think that CSR supports a broad consensus gentium or common assent argument—which, very roughly, deems the prominence of belief in God as evidence for God (Kelly 2011; Evans 2010; Braddock 2018). To be sure, talk of a “God-center” would be rejected by most scientists, as would the idea that only theistic belief is cognitively natural. But for the above philosophers, the scientific study of religion might provide a broad kind of support for the divine—a natural sign of divinity that is rooted in our broadly religious human constitution.

For other authors, CSR highlights evidential challenges for theism. For example, Alvin Goldman draws on CSR to both build a Bayesian challenge to consensus gentium arguments and to lend support to atheism (A. Goldman 2019). What’s more, Jason and Jon Marsh argue that scientific accounts of religion generate a new “explanatory challenge of religious diversity” for theism (Marsh & Marsh 2016). Very roughly, if a theistic God cares about the details of people’s religious beliefs—and not just a generic form of religiosity—why would God design human minds and environments such that so many competing religious traditions naturally arise and compete in the first place? (Theists with the right background beliefs about God, truth, and human flourishing might find this question deeply internally puzzling and some might further find it evidentially significant.) Setting aside notable religious diversity over the last ten thousand years or so, a distinct version of the “problem of natural nonbelief” (Marsh 2013) looks further back into the history of religion to raise a worry about divine hiddenness. Here an absence of theistic concepts and beliefs among early humans is said to support naturalism over theism, and also to challenge traditional theistic explanations of nonbelief. (This argument assumes, with most scientists and religion scholars, that broadly theistic beliefs and concepts arose only relatively recently in religious history, though for a reply to this view see Braddock 2023.)

Given how centered these discussions tend to be on theistic ideas, including perfect being theism and various Christian theological concepts, there is plenty of room to broaden the focus to other religious frameworks in light of CSR. Some of this work is already underway. For instance, some scholars claim that Islamic theology, including ideas from al-Ghazālī, can help to accommodate key concepts of CSR (Nakissa 2020). Additionally, a consensus gentium argument in favor of “nature spirits” has been advanced and has been argued to have unique advantages over rival arguments (T. Smith 2020). These works fit with recent calls for a more global philosophy of religion (Mizrahi 2020; Nagasawa & Zarepour 2024). When combined with the other arguments in this section, they also make it harder to maintain that scientific accounts of religion have limited theological significance (Jong, Kavanagh, & Visala 2015).

3. Evolutionary Approaches to the Philosophy of Religion and Natural Theology

3.1 Design Arguments, Divine Hiddenness, and Evil After Darwin

Evolutionary approaches to religion do not merely include scientific accounts of how religion developed. They also include broadly Darwinian approaches to the philosophy of religion. The idea that all life on earth is related—common descent—and has gradually changed over the last 3.5 billion years or so—through mechanisms like natural selection and genetic drift—wasn’t exactly predicted by most religious traditions. But whatever was or could have reasonably been predicted, the point is that evolutionary biology has raised key philosophical questions about religion. These questions tend to reflect Darwin’s own social and religious context and they include:

• Did Darwin, even more than Hume, undermine Paley’s biological argument from design?
• Can more recent design arguments escape evolutionary-type challenges?
• Does natural selection intensify the problem of natural evil or help to corroborate a dysteleological interpretation of nature?
• Does evolution intensify the problem of divine hiddenness for present humans?

In response to the first question, Darwin offers an affirmative answer. As he states in his autobiography,

The old argument from design in Nature, as given by Paley, which formerly seemed to me so conclusive, fails, now that the law of natural selection has been discovered.… There seems to be no more design in the variability of organic beings, and in the action of natural selection, than in the course which the wind blows. (Darwin 1887: 309)

William Paley’s argument from design helped to instill in Darwin a key explanatory challenge. How does one explain the emergence of functionally integrated and complex objects (like eyes) without appealing to intelligence and foresight? Given the success of Darwin’s reply, it is widely believed that biological design arguments, at least, have been undermined by evolutionary biology. This remains the clear consensus among philosophers and scientists whether the biological case for design is formulated in analogical terms, as an abductive argument, as a deductive argument, or as a likelihood argument (Sober 2008: Ch. 2; De Smedt & De Cruz 2015). To be sure, non-inferential or perception-based forms of design detection aren’t as vulnerable to Darwinian refutation (Ratzsch 2001) but nor do they count as public natural theology.

This does not mean that Paley lacks any contemporary defenders. Those in the intelligent design movement continue to claim that design (not necessarily supernatural) may still be detected in nature—for instance, in the allegedly “irreducibly complex” structures in the cell, in the Cambrian explosion, or in life’s origin (Monton 2009). While a complete treatment of these issues, including relevant sociological questions, is not possible here, one thing is clear: neither ID’s positive biological case for design detection, nor its negative attacks on evolution, have gained much traction in the academy (Miller 1999; Sober 2008: Ch. 2; McGrath 2011). In fact, even a well-known theistic philosopher who has had occasional “doubts about Darwin” says,

…the very existence of Darwin’s account—whether or not it is true—rendered all versions of the design argument considerably less cogent than they otherwise would have been if no one had ever thought of it. (van Inwagen 2003: 348).

For many, a more promising attempt to revive the design argument after Darwin locates teleology in physics and cosmology. Some claim that the apparent life-friendliness or fine-tuning of our universe and its physical constants supports a cosmic designer (Lewis & Barnes 2016). The fine-tuning argument is fully consistent with the claims of evolutionary biology, but some cosmologists maintain that a broadly evolutionary critique of the framework might still arise in cosmology. For instance, Lee Smolin proposes a theory of “cosmological natural selection”, where certain kinds of universes, including life-friendly ones, get selected for (Smolin 1997). A much more common strategy, however, resists talk of an accumulation of fitness in cosmological settings and simply focuses on whether a multiverse, through chance, predicts that some universes would be finely-tuned. Even if the answer is yes, some doubt that multiple universes would explain why our universe is finely-tuned (R. White 2000). While it is too early to expect broad agreement about these matters, thinkers as different as Luke Barnes, James Gates, John Hawthorne, Nancy Murphy, and Richard Dawkins agree that current design arguments in physics are superior to those in biology. (We are not discussing the simulation argument here, but this too might be construed as a design argument whose credentials are not automatically challenged by Darwin.)

Next to the design argument, the problem of evil is likely the most significant way in which evolutionary thought has interacted with natural theology and, one might add, natural atheology. One of the more forceful versions of the idea that natural selection intensifies the problem of evil is due to Paul Draper. One version of Draper’s comparative approach, which has taken different forms over the years, invites the reader to consider the following evidential pattern:

E: For a variety of biological and ecological reasons organisms compete for survival, with some having an advantage in the struggle for survival over others; as a result, many organisms, including many sentient beings, never flourish because they die before maturity, many others barely survive but languish for most or all of their lives, and those that reach maturity and flourish for much of their lives usually languish in old age; in the case of human beings and some nonhuman animals as well, languishing often involves intense or prolonged suffering. (2007: §5 [Other Internet Resources])

Draper is aware that E was affirmed long before the publication of the Origin of Species in 1859. But he argues that the (largely Darwinian) explanation for why E holds is itself more likely under metaphysical naturalism than under theism. His point here is thus not merely that under naturalism (where reality consists of a causally closed and morally indifferent universe) E would be comparatively unsurprising. It is that natural selection, which both predicts and explains E, is itself more likely if metaphysical naturalism is true than if perfect being theism is true. As he notes,

Given naturalism, we are justly confident in the truth of Darwinism, not because we know in any historical detail exactly how natural selection led to biological complexity, but rather because natural selection provides a way of explaining such complexity without having to appeal to the purposes of a supernatural designer. If theism is true, however, then natural selection is not needed to solve the problem of apparent teleological order in the living world. Theistic evolution could be Darwinian, but it could also proceed in a variety of other non-Darwinian ways. As long as a perfect God is guiding evolutionary change, natural selection is not crucial for the development of biological complexity. Thus, given theism, it would not be surprising at all if natural selection played no significant role in the development of such complexity. This means that, if E is to be expected on Darwinism, then that is a predictive success for naturalism, but not for theism. (2007: §6 [Other Internet Resources])

Some evolutionary biologists continue to accept evolutionary models of creation despite the world’s natural evil (Miller 1999; Lamoureux 2009). And some mathematical biologists and theologians maintain that evolution is less red, tooth, and nail than many assume, and generates important kinds of cooperation (Nowak & Coakley 2013). But for Draper, so long as E is more likely if evolution is blind, the comparative evidential challenge will go through. (For challenges to Draper’s framework, see Otte 2012 and Howard-Snyder 2017; for defenses of that framework, see Draper 2025.)

Other responses to the problem are on offer. Many concede the reality of a problem but offer a partial theological solution to weaken its force. These defenses include aesthetic considerations (Schneider 2020), an openness to afterlife for animals (Dougherty 2014), and other theological moves (Rosenberg et al. 2018). A more recent approach draws on C.S. Lewis to criticize a key assumption in the debate: namely, a world with more evils (e.g., because of evolutionary timescales) is always harder to justify than a world with fewer evils (Kojonen 2024: 392). For an example, one painful act (e.g., a nurse giving out a painful vaccine) is not made worse by further duplicate acts of the same sort (e.g., many nurses giving many people vaccines); indeed, the latter may be preferred. Whether this kind of reasoning applies to brutal contexts like E or to the choices of omnipotent agents remains open to debate. It is also worth noting that none of the above authors endorse controversial neo-Cartesian responses to evolutionary evil—which question whether animals have morally significant sentience—nor do they endorse the skeptical theist’s denial that humans (absent revelation) are in a position to grasp God’s reasons for allowing or even causing E.

The discovery of evolutionary biology has also produced a distinct evidential species of the problem of divine hiddenness (Marsh 2013). For many, belief in God is harder after Darwin. Whether on account of arguments like Draper’s, the loss of design evidence, irreligious experiences in nature, or a combination of these factors, so long as sufficiently non-resistant forms of nonbelief rooted in evolutionary considerations would have been predictable to God, a problem emerges. Why, if God exists and wants people to believe, would God have chosen an evolutionary means of creation? Why design the living world in ways that can seem compatible with naturalism? As Marsh puts it.

Prior to 150 years ago, people generally believed in some form of special creation. And yet these individuals, assuming the truth of theism, were presumably capable of properly relating to God…are we to suppose that we [present humans] need vastly more epistemic distance from the divine than, say, Medieval Europe, for whom God’s existence was largely taken for granted and for whom there wasn’t a credible naturalistic answer to the question of how complex life developed? (Marsh 2013: 368)

By contrast, the same patterns can seem far less surprising under naturalism—and this even though some people manage to be evolutionary theists today. Naturally, how successful this challenge is may be sensitive to how successful responses to other hiddenness arguments are. But it introduces a relatively neglected meta consideration, a kind of natural nonbelief in the present, into the evolution-religion dialogue.

3.2 The Epistemology of Deep Time, the Future of Faith, and a Reliability Challenge for Naturalism

Evolutionary considerations often put faith, and in particular theistic faith, on the hot seat. But evolutionary considerations have also been drawn on to challenge secular interpretations of nature, particularly in a subfield of analytic philosophy of religion that one might call “evolutionary religious epistemology”. For instance, in his book Where the Conflict Really Lies (Plantinga 2011), Alvin Plantinga updates his much-discussed evolutionary argument against naturalism (EAAN). The core proposal here is that, contrary to received wisdom in many biology and philosophy departments, it is really metaphysical naturalism, more than theism, that is in epistemological tension with evolution. While EAAN has gone through different iterations over the years, and connects up to complex debates about epiphenomenalism and mental content in the philosophy of mind, the basic idea has always been that Darwinian processes aren’t clearly truth biased. If evolutionary causes really operate at the level of adaptive behavior—and concern getting one’s largely selfish genes into the next generation—and if beliefs can be adaptive but false (and might not impact behavior in any case), then there is a question about the likelihood that one’s cognitive faculties would be mostly trustworthy assuming evolution is blind.

For Plantinga, the probability of generally reliable cognitive faculties, including in the realm of metaphysics and science, is highly sensitive to the underlying metaphysical framework. In an evolutionary world without design, this probability is deemed low (or at best “inscrutable” on some iterations of the argument). Naturalistic believers in evolution who recognize this thus face a global defeater for all of their beliefs, including their belief in naturalism—in a way that is a bit like finding out that one swallowed a pill that likely compromised all of one’s faculties. Given how controversial debunking arguments are, even when purely local (viz. focused on just one domain, like religion or morality), it is not surprising that Plantinga’s bolder and more global debunking strategy is also controversial (Beilby 2002). For a more recent defense of a global debunking argument in this vein see Moon 2023.

A final evolutionary approach to the philosophy of religion that takes a positive (albeit still critical) orientation toward religion is due to J.L. Schellenberg. In contrast to the vast majority of scientists and philosophers in the evolution-religion dialogue—who focus on the evolutionary past and theistic concepts—Schellenberg seeks a more revolutionary, future oriented, conception of religion that is non-theistic. According to his “evolutionary religion” (Schellenberg 2013) framework, attempts to theorize about religion and the deepest possible structures of reality should confront an important situational fact: we are at a relatively early stage in the vast potential of evolutionary time. Relative to the age of earth, our species has barely begun existing, let alone theorizing carefully about anything including religion. Religion is still evolving and the future of faith could look very different from today. Given this evolutionary epistemological fact, a bit more modesty in the science-religion dialogue is called for.

This does not entail complete skepticism. We know some things, including about science and religion. For Schellenberg—the chief defender of hiddenness arguments for atheism—all detailed religions of the past may be set aside, doxastically speaking. Still, once we rationally confront our immaturity as a species, and the epistemology of deep time, we cannot sensibly rule out more plausible and more stripped-down religious possibilities that we’ve barely begun to think about. In particular, we cannot rule out a core religious possibility that Schellenberg calls generic Ultimism. According to Schellenberg, this view of the divine

is not to be linked with any particular religious proposition about God or gods that may still have the mud of early evolution clinging to it but instead involves cognitively and conatively aligning oneself with the more general proposition….that what is deepest in reality (metaphysically ultimate) is also unsurpassably great (axiologically ultimate) and the source of an ultimate good (salvific). (Schellenberg 2009: xii).

Not only can the best parts of natural theology support this broader Ultimistic possibility. According to Schellenberg, the traditional problems associated with much religion (e.g., evil, hiddenness, disagreement, tensions with ethics or science or history) are far less compelling if the divine is not personal and if one’s faith commitments remain thin. Schellenberg’s proposal, to clarify, is not that we should believe that Ultimism is true: it’s premature to rule out secular views, and maybe nothing Ultimate exists. The idea is rather that Ultimism remains a live possibility worth imagining, and that epistemic modesty combined with what we know through reason permits interesting religious possibilities. This faith without belief framework is intended to have practical and theoretical significance. Provided that one’s faith is skeptical (and so nonbelieving rather than disbelieving), it could potentially put one in contact with the deepest truths, while grounding a non-dogmatic religious way of life. It can even incorporate certain practices from past traditions, albeit without their problematic doctrines. In short, maybe reason requires us to be religious skeptics, as Schellenberg will often say, but evolutionary reason also opens the door to an Ultimistic form of faith.

Future assessments of Schellenberg’s framework might explore connections with the philosophy of science, including whether unconceived alternatives in science support Schellenberg’s evolutionary framework and vice versa (Stanford 2006). Some might also investigate connections with debates about perennialism in religious studies, and further consider whether atheistic Ultimism must remain inconsistent with “naturalistic religion” (Steinhart 2016). Finally, more discussion about how generic formulations of Ultimism (even if well worth considering philosophically) would culturally compete with traditional religious rivals, given how our minds evolved, would be welcome (Marsh 2014).

3.3 The Contemporary Status of Non-Overlapping Magisteria (NOMA) and Other Models

The above discussion makes the question of how evolution and faith relate—all things considered—even more pressing, and arguably more difficult to answer. Indeed, given the sheer number of possibilities raised in this entry, one may wonder whether a single model of evolution and religion (let alone of science and religion) could be explanatorily adequate. In fact, even if we restricted our focus to how just one faith tradition interacts with evolution, a single model may still be out of reach.

Not everyone would be happy with such a conclusion. Nearly thirty years ago, Stephen J Gould famously denied the possibility of meaningful interaction between science and religion. As he put it in his essay, “Nonoverlapping Magisteria”:

The net of science covers the empirical universe: what is it made of (fact) and why does it work this way (theory). The net of religion extends over questions of moral meaning and value. These two magisteria do not overlap, nor do they encompass all inquiry (consider, for starters, the magisterium of art and the meaning of beauty). To cite the arch cliches, we get the age of rocks, and religion retains the rock of ages; we study how the heavens go, and they determine how to go to heaven. (Gould 1997: 16)

Gould’s attempt to separate religion from science has its social benefits. After all, evolution acceptance, although on the rise, continues to be low in various regions including the United States (Miller et al. 2024) and some Islamic countries (Dajani 2015). If widely adopted, NOMA might help to address these educational challenges by reducing the possibility of a clash between science and faith. At the same time, social considerations aren’t the only (or even main) considerations when addressing models of science and religion, such as Ian Barbour’s influential four-fold taxonomy: Conflict, Independence, Dialogue, and Integration (Barbour 1990).

Without taking a definitive stance here, the present discussion points to more nuanced possibilities than those typically found in popular treatments of these issues. In contrast to the language of full separation, conflict, or integration etc., different aspects of evolutionary thought may yield very different verdicts (whether critical, supportive, neutral, or a combination of these) depending on the particular religious claim under investigation (Cantor & Kenny 2001). At a minimum, defenders of Gould (not to mention the New Atheists, creationists, and evolutionary theists) have a burden to show that their favored approach can capture the various considerations introduced in this entry. This would require not only exploring the implications of evolution for natural theology and the problem of evil, but also the potential significance of the evolutionary science of religion for the challenges posed by religious diversity, Ultimism, divine hiddenness, debunking explanations, and co-existence reasoning.

Some philosophers, sensitive to this complexity, have introduced newer models such as the “Way of Aporia” (Sullivan 2014). Others may think that more nuanced versions of separation, conflict, dialogue, or integration could still work. However, many academics continue to invoke more simplistic versions of the classic models, in ways that downplay present evidential concerns. Similarly, historical questions—such as whether claims of warfare have been historically overblown (Hardin et al. 2018) or whether Darwinism originally functioned as a secular religion (Ruse 2017)—are still frequently given center stage when testing models. Yet for philosophers of religion and science, the most critical questions facing models are not historical: they concern the diverse evidential and epistemological relationships between different scientific and religious claims in the present.

To put the point another way, it may be that most areas of science lack any religious significance, making a version of Gould’s separationist view almost correct by default. But if the evolution of life and religion is a sufficiently important exception, and if its relationships with faith are sufficiently complex, this would be enough to challenge most defenders of classic models. It would have significance for well-known scientists, like Dawkins and Gould. It would equally pose challenges for many evolutionary theists, like Martin Nowak, when he claims that evolution should pose “as little problem for religion as [the concept of] gravity” (A. Powell 2007). Moreover, since we have only considered a limited range of religious ideas, a plurality of models may be needed.

Bibliography

• Atran, Scott, 2002, In Gods We Trust: The Evolutionary Landscape of Religion (Evolution and Cognition), Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780195178036.001.0001
• Baker, Mark and Dean Zimmerman, 2019, “On Perceiving God: Prospects for a Cognitive Science of Religious Experience”, in A. Goldman and McLaughlin 2019: 125–154 (ch. 5). doi:10.1093/oso/9780190639679.003.0006
• Baker-Hytch, Max, 2022, “Debunking Arguments in Parallel”, in Evolutionary Debunking Arguments: Ethics, Philosophy of Religion, Philosophy of Mathematics, Metaphysics, and Epistemology, Diego E. Machuca (ed.), New York: Routledge, 105–128 (ch. 6). doi:10.4324/9781003026419-8
• Barbour, Ian G., 1990, Religion in an Age of Science (The Gifford Lectures, 1989–1991), London: SCM Press.
• Barrett, Justin L., 2004, Why Would Anyone Believe in God? (Cognitive Science of Religion Series), Walnut Creek, CA: AltaMira Press.
• –––, 2007, “Cognitive Science of Religion: What Is It and Why Is It?”, Religion Compass, 1(6): 768–786. doi:10.1111/j.1749-8171.2007.00042.x
• –––, 2010, “The Relative Unnaturalness of Atheism: On Why Geertz and Markússon Are Both Right and Wrong”, Religion, 40(3): 169–172. doi:10.1016/j.religion.2009.11.002
• Barrett, N. F., 2010, “Toward an Alternative Evolutionary Theory of Religion: Looking Past Computational Evolutionary Psychology to a Wider Field of Possibilities”, Journal of the American Academy of Religion, 78(3): 583–621. doi:10.1093/jaarel/lfq019
• Baumard, Nicolas and Pascal Boyer, 2013, “Explaining Moral Religions”, Trends in Cognitive Sciences, 17(6): 272–280. doi:10.1016/j.tics.2013.04.003
• Beebe, James R. and Leigh Duffy, 2020, “The Memorability of Supernatural Concepts: Effects of Minimal Counterintuitiveness, Moral Valence, and Existential Anxiety on Recall”, The International Journal for the Psychology of Religion, 30(4): 322–341. doi:10.1080/10508619.2020.1750134
• Beheim, Bret, Quentin D. Atkinson, Joseph Bulbulia, Will Gervais, Russell D. Gray, Joseph Henrich, Martin Lang, M. Willis Monroe, Michael Muthukrishna, Ara Norenzayan, et al., 2021, “Treatment of Missing Data Determined Conclusions Regarding Moralizing Gods”, Nature, 595(7866): E29–E34. doi:10.1038/s41586-021-03655-4
• Beilby, James K. (ed.), 2002, Naturalism Defeated? Essays on Plantinga’s Evolutionary Argument against Naturalism, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
• Bering, Jesse M., 2002, “The Existential Theory of Mind”, Review of General Psychology, 6(1): 3–24. doi:10.1037/1089-2680.6.1.3
• Bering, Jesse M. and David F. Bjorklund, 2004, “The Natural Emergence of Reasoning About the Afterlife as a Developmental Regularity.”, Developmental Psychology, 40(2): 217–233. doi:10.1037/0012-1649.40.2.217
• Bering, Jesse M., Samantha Smith, Ana Stojanov, Jamin B. Halberstadt, and Ruth J. M. Hughes, 2022, “The ‘Ghost’ in the Lab: Believers’ and Non-Believers’ Implicit Responses to an Alleged Apparition”, The International Journal for the Psychology of Religion, 32(3): 214–231. doi:10.1080/10508619.2021.1975400
• Bloom, Paul, 2007, “Religion Is Natural”, Developmental Science, 10(1): 147–151. doi:10.1111/j.1467-7687.2007.00577.x
• Boyd, Robert and Peter J. Richerson, 1985, Culture and the Evolutionary Process, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Boyer, Pascal, 2001, Religion Explained: The Evolutionary Origins of Religious Thought, New York: Basic Books.
• Boyer, Pascal and Charles Ramble, 2001, “Cognitive Templates for Religious Concepts: Cross-Cultural Evidence for Recall of Counter-Intuitive Representations”, Cognitive Science, 25(4): 535–564.
• Braddock, Matthew, 2016, “Debunking Arguments and the Cognitive Science of Religion”, Theology and Science, 14(3): 268–287. doi:10.1080/14746700.2016.1191878
• –––, 2018, “An Evidential Argument for Theism from the Cognitive Science of Religion”, in New Developments in the Cognitive Science of Religion: The Rationality of Religious Belief (New Approaches to the Scientific Study of Religion 4), Hans Van Eyghen, Rik Peels, and Gijsbert Van Den Brink (eds), Cham: Springer International Publishing, 171–198. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-90239-5_10
• –––, 2023, “Natural Nonbelief in God: Prehistoric Humans, Divine Hiddenness, and Debunking”, in Evolutionary Debunking Arguments: Ethics, Philosophy of Religion, Philosophy of Mathematics, Metaphysics, and Epistemology (Routledge Studies in Contemporary Philosophy), Diego E. Machuca (ed.), New York: Routledge, 160–184 (ch. 8).
• Cantor, Geoffrey and Chris Kenny, 2001, “Barbour’s Fourfold Way: Problems with His Taxonomy of Science‐religion Relationships”, Zygon: Journal of Religion and Science, 36(4): 765–781. doi:10.1111/0591-2385.00395
• Cho, Francisca and Richard K. Squier, 2008, “‘He Blinded Me With Science’: Science Chauvinism in the Study of Religion”, Journal of the American Academy of Religion, 76(2): 420–448. doi:10.1093/jaarel/lfn001
• Clark, Kelly James and Justin L. Barrett, 2010, “Reformed Epistemology and the Cognitive Science of Religion”:, Faith and Philosophy, 27(2): 174–189. doi:10.5840/faithphil201027216
• Clarke‐Doane, Justin, 2014, “Moral Epistemology: The Mathematics Analogy”, Noûs, 48(2): 238–255. doi:10.1111/j.1468-0068.2012.00875.x
• Cohen, Emma, 2007, The Mind Possessed: The Cognition of Spirit Possession in an Afro-Brazilian Religious Tradition, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780195323351.001.0001
• Cohen, Emma, Jonathan A. Lanman, Harvey Whitehouse, and Robert N. McCauley, 2008, “Common Criticisms of the Cognitive Science of Religion—Answered”, Bulletin of the Council of Societies for the Study of Religion, 37(4): 112–115.
• Cook, Constance A., 2006, Death in Ancient China: The Tale of One Man’s Journey (China Studies 8), Leiden/Boston: Brill. doi:10.1163/9789047410638
• Coyne, Jerry A., 2002, “They Shall Have Their Rewards on Earth, Too: Review of Darwin’s Cathedral, by Davide Sloan Wilson”, The Times Literary Supplement, 1 November 2002 (issue 5196), p. 31.
• Dajani, Rana, 2015, “Why I Teach Evolution to Muslim Students”, Nature, 520(7548): 409–409. doi:10.1038/520409a
• Darwin, Charles, 1871, The Descent of Man, and Selection in Relation to Sex, London: John Murray. [Darwin 1871 available online]
• –––, 1872, The Expression of the Emotions in Man and Animals, London: John Murray.
• –––, 1887, The Life and Letters of Charles Darwin: Including an Autobiographical Chapter, volume 1, Francis Darwin (ed.), London: John Murray. [Darwin 1887 available online]
• Davis, Taylor, 2015, “Group Selection in the Evolution of Religion: Genetic Evolution or Cultural Evolution?” Journal of Cognition and Culture, 15(3–4): 235–253.
• Dawkins, Richard, 1993, “Viruses of the Mind”, in Dennett and His Critics: Demystifying Mind, Bo Dahlbom (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 13–27 (ch. 1).
• De Cruz, Helen and Johan de Smedt, 2015, A Natural History of Natural Theology: The Cognitive Science of Theology and Philosophy of Religion, Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press. doi:10.7551/mitpress/10219.001.0001
• Dennett, Daniel C., 2006, Breaking the Spell: Religion as a Natural Phenomenon, New York: Viking.
• De Waal, Frans B. M., 2013, The Bonobo and the Atheist: In Search of Humanism among the Primates, New York: W.W. Norton & Company.
• Dougherty, Trent, 2014, The Problem of Animal Pain: A Theodicy For All Creatures Great And Small, London: Palgrave Macmillan. doi:10.1057/9781137443175
• Draper, Paul, 2025, Atheism and the Problem of Evil, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/9780191939570.001.0001
• Duhaime, Erik P., 2015, “Is the Call to Prayer a Call to Cooperate? A Field Experiment on the Impact of Religious Salience on Prosocial Behavior”, Judgment and Decision Making, 10(6): 593–596. doi:10.1017/S1930297500007038
• Dunbar, R. I. M., 2003, “The Social Brain: Mind, Language, and Society in Evolutionary Perspective”, Annual Review of Anthropology, 32(1): 163–181. doi:10.1146/annurev.anthro.32.061002.093158
• –––, 2022, How Religion Evolved: And Why It Endures, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Evans, E. Margaret, 2000, “Beyond Scopes: Why Creationism Is Here to Stay,” in Imagining the Impossible: Magical, Scientific, and Religious Thinking in Children, Paul L. Harris, Carl N. Johnson, and Karl S. Rosengren (eds.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 305–331.
• Evans, C. Stephen, 2010, Natural Signs and Knowledge of God: A New Look at Theistic Arguments, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199217168.001.0001
• Farias, Miguel, Valerie Van Mulukom, Guy Kahane, Ute Kreplin, Anna Joyce, Pedro Soares, Lluis Oviedo, Mathilde Hernu, Karolina Rokita, Julian Savulescu, and Riikka Möttönen, 2017, “Supernatural Belief Is Not Modulated by Intuitive Thinking Style or Cognitive Inhibition”, Scientific Reports, 7(1): article 15100. doi:10.1038/s41598-017-14090-9
• Gervais, Will M., Maxine B. Najle, and Nava Caluori, 2021, “The Origins of Religious Disbelief: A Dual Inheritance Approach”, Social Psychological and Personality Science, 12(7): 1369–1379. doi:10.1177/1948550621994001
• Gervais, Will M., Dimitris Xygalatas, Ryan T. McKay, Michiel Van Elk, Emma E. Buchtel, Mark Aveyard, Sarah R. Schiavone, Ilan Dar-Nimrod, Annika M. Svedholm-Häkkinen, Tapani Riekki, et al., 2017, “Global Evidence of Extreme Intuitive Moral Prejudice against Atheists”, Nature Human Behaviour, 1(8): article 0151. doi:10.1038/s41562-017-0151
• Goldman, Alvin I., 2019, “God and Cognitive Science: A Bayesian Approach”, in A. Goldman and McLaughlin 2019: 155–180 (ch. 6). doi:10.1093/oso/9780190639679.003.0007
• Goldman, Alvin I. and Brian P. McLaughlin (eds), 2019, Metaphysics and Cognitive Science, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780190639679.001.0001
• Goldman, Michael A., 2004, “Review of The God Gene: How Faith Is Hardwired Into Our Genes, by Dean Hamer”, Nature Genetics, 36(12): 1241–1241. doi:10.1038/ng1204-1241
• Goodnick, Liz, 2016, “A De Jure Criticism of Theism”, Open Theology, 2(1): 23–33. doi:10.1515/opth-2016-0003
• Gould, Stephen Jay, 1997, “Nonoverlapping Magisteria”, Natural History, 106(2): 16–22.
• Grande, Lance, 2024, The Evolution of Religions: A History of Related Traditions, New York: Columbia University Press. doi:10.7312/gran21230
• Greco, John, 2007, “External World Skepticism”, Philosophy Compass, 2(4): 625–649. doi:10.1111/j.1747-9991.2007.00090.x
• Greenberg, Jeff, Sheldon Solomon, and Tom Pyszczynski, 1997, “Terror Management Theory of Self-Esteem and Cultural Worldviews: Empirical Assessments and Conceptual Refinements”, in Advances in Experimental Social Psychology 29, Mark Zanna (ed.), San Diego/London: Academic Press, 61–139. doi:10.1016/S0065-2601(08)60016-7
• Guthrie, Stewart, 1980, “A Cognitive Theory of Religion”, with comments and remarks by Joseph Agassi, Karin R. Andriolo, David Buchdahl, H. Byron Earhart, Moshe Greenberg, Ian Jarvie, Benson Saler, John Saliba, Kevin J. Sharpe, and Georges Tissot, Current Anthropology, 21(2): 181–203. doi:10.1086/202429
• –––, 1993, Faces in the Clouds: A New Theory of Religion, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780195069013.001.0001
• –––, 2016, “On Purzycki and Willard’s Critique”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 6(3): 254–256. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2015.1015047
• Haidt, Jonathan, 2012, The Righteous Mind: Why Good People Are Divided by Politics and Religion, New York: Pantheon Books.
• Hardin, Jeff, Ronald L. Numbers, and Ronald A. Binzley (eds), 2018, The Warfare between Science and Religion: The Idea That Wouldn’t Die, Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press.
• Hayat, Aalia A., Areej H. Meny, Ruth F. Millman, Nabila Salahuddin, Ricky Ahuja, and Waqas Sami, 2024, “The Intersection of Faith and Neurodiversity: Unraveling Religiosity in Autistic Adolescents—A Critical Review Analysis”, Cureus, 16(5): e61271. doi:10.7759/cureus.61271
• Henrich, Joseph, 2009, “The Evolution of Costly Displays, Cooperation and Religion”, Evolution and Human Behavior, 30(4): 244–260. doi:10.1016/j.evolhumbehav.2009.03.005
• Henrich, Joseph, Steven J. Heine, and Ara Norenzayan, 2010, “The Weirdest People in the World?”, Behavioral and Brain Sciences, 33(2–3): 61–83. doi:10.1017/S0140525X0999152X
• Henrich, Joseph and Robert Boyd, 2016, “How Evolved Psychological Mechanisms Empower Cultural Group Selection”, Behavioral and Brain Sciences, 39: e40. doi:10.1017/S0140525X15000138
• Howard-Snyder, Daniel, 2017, “The Evolutionary Argument for Atheism”, in Being, Freedom, and Method: Themes from the Philosophy of Peter van Inwagen, John A. Keller (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 241–262 (ch. 12). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198715702.003.0014
• Jong, Jonathan, Christopher Kavanagh, and Aku Visala, 2015, “Born Idolaters: The Limits of the Philosophical Implications of the Cognitive Science of Religion”, Neue Zeitschrift Für Systematische Theologie Und Religionsphilosophie, 57(2): 244–266. doi:10.1515/nzsth-2015-0012
• Jong, Jonathan, Robert Ross, Tristan Philip, Si-Hua Chang, Naomi Simons, and Jamin Halberstadt, 2018, “The Religious Correlates of Death Anxiety: A Systematic Review and Meta-Analysis”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 8(1): 4–20. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2016.1238844
• Jong, Jonathan and Aku Visala, 2014, “Evolutionary Debunking Arguments against Theism, Reconsidered”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 76(3): 243–258. doi:10.1007/s11153-014-9461-6
• Kahane, Guy, 2011, “Evolutionary Debunking Arguments”, Noûs, 45(1): 103–125. doi:10.1111/j.1468-0068.2010.00770.x
• Kelemen, Deborah, 2004, “Are Children ‘Intuitive Theists’?: Reasoning About Purpose and Design in Nature”, Psychological Science, 15(5): 295–301. doi:10.1111/j.0956-7976.2004.00672.x
• Kelly, Thomas, 2011, “Consensus Gentium: Reflections on the ‘Common Consent’ Argument for the Existence of God”, in Evidence and Religious Belief, Kelly James Clark and Raymond J. VanArragon (eds), Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 135–156 (ch. 8). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199603718.003.0009
• Kitcher, Philip, 2011, The Ethical Project, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. doi:10.4159/harvard.9780674063075
• Kojonen, Rope, 2024, “Why Evolution Does Not Make the Problem of Evil Worse”, Faith and Philosophy, 39(3): 388–406. doi:10.37977/faithphil.2022.39.3.3
• Korsgaard, Christine M., 2010, “Reflections on the Evolution of Morality”. The Amherst Lecture in Philosophy: Lecture 5, Harvard University, [Korsgaard 2010 available online]
• Kvandal, Halvor, 2023, “Why the Debunking Threat Won’t Go Away”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 94(3): 299–316. doi:10.1007/s11153-023-09882-1
• Laidlaw, James, 2016, “A Well-Disposed Social Anthropologist’s Problems with the ‘Cognitive Science of Religion’”, Anthropology of This Century, 16: article 5. [Laidlaw 2016 available online]
• Lamoureux, Denis O., 2009, “Evolutionary Creation: Moving Beyond the Evolution Versus Creation Debate”, Christian Higher Education, 9(1): 28–48. doi:10.1080/15363750903018231
• Launonen, Lari, 2024, “Hearing God Speak? Debunking Arguments and Everyday Religious Experiences”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 95(2): 187–203. doi:10.1007/s11153-023-09896-9
• Legare, Cristine H., E. Margaret Evans, Karl S. Rosengren, and Paul L. Harris, 2012, “The Coexistence of Natural and Supernatural Explanations Across Cultures and Development”, Child Development, 83(3): 779–793. doi:10.1111/j.1467-8624.2012.01743.x
• Lior, Yair and Justin Lane, 2022, “Introduction: Evolutionary Approaches to Religion”, in The Routledge Handbook of Evolutionary Approaches to Religion, Yair Lior and Justin Lane (eds), Abingdon/New York: Routledge, 1–12.
• Lewis, Geraint F. and Luke A. Barnes, 2016, A Fortunate Universe: Life in a Finely Tuned Cosmos, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9781316661413
• Maij, David L. R., Hein T. Van Schie, and Michiel Van Elk, 2019, “The Boundary Conditions of the Hypersensitive Agency Detection Device: An Empirical Investigation of Agency Detection in Threatening Situations”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 9(1): 23–51. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2017.1362662
• Marsh, Jason, 2013, “Darwin and the Problem of Natural Nonbelief”:, Monist, 96(3): 349–376. doi:10.5840/monist201396316
• –––, 2014, “Assessing the Third Way”, in The Roots of Religion: Exploring the Cognitive Science of Religion (Ashgate Science and Religion Series), Roger Trigg and Justin L. Barrett (eds), Farnham, Surrey: Ashgate, 127–148 (ch. 8).
• Marsh, Jason and Jon Marsh, 2016, “The Explanatory Challenge of Religious Diversity”, in Advances in Religion, Cognitive Science, and Experimental Philosophy (Advances in Experimental Philosophy), Helen De Cruz and Ryan Nichols (eds), London/New York: Bloomsbury Academic, 61–84 (ch. 4).
• McCauley, Robert N., 2011, Why Religion Is Natural and Science Is Not, New York: Oxford University Press.
• McCauley, Robert N. and E. Thomas Lawson, 2002, Bringing Ritual to Mind: Psychological Foundations of Cultural Forms, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511606410
• McGrath, Alister E., 2011, Darwinism and the Divine: Evolutionary Thought and Natural Theology, Chichester, UK/Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell. doi:10.1002/9781444392524
• Miller, Jon D., Belén Laspra, Carmelo Polino, Glenn Branch, Robert T. Pennock, and Mark S. Ackerman, 2024, “The Acceptance of Evolution: A Developmental View of Generation X in the United States,” Public Understanding of Science, 33(7): 818–837. 
• Miller, Kenneth R., 1999, Finding Darwin’s God: A Scientist’s Search for Common Ground between God and Evolution, New York: Cliff Street Books.
• Miyatake, Shinichi and Michio Higuchi, 2017, “Does religious priming increase the prosocial behaviour of a Japanese sample in an anonymous economic game?” Asian Journal of Social Psychology, 20(1): 54–59.
• Mizrahi, Moti, 2020, “If analytic philosophy of religion is sick, can it be cured?” Religious Studies, 56(4): 558–577. 
• Monton, Bradley John, 2009, Seeking God in Science: An Atheist Defends Intelligent Design, Peterborough, ON/Buffalo, NY: Broadview Press.
• Moon, Andrew, 2023, “Global Debunking Arguments,” in Evolutionary Debunking Arguments: Ethics, Philosophy of Religion, Philosophy of Mathematics, Metaphysics, and Epistemology (Routledge Studies in Contemporary Philosophy), Diego E. Machuca (ed.), New York: Routledge, 304–332 (ch. 14).
• Murray, Michael J., 2009, “Scientific Explanations of Religion and the Justification of Religious Belief”, in Schloss and Murray 2009: 168–178 (ch.8).
• Nagasawa, Yujin and Mohammad Saleh Zarepour (eds), 2024, Global Dialogues in the Philosophy of Religion: From Religious Experience to the Afterlife, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780192865496.001.0001
• Nagel, Thomas, 2012, Mind and Cosmos: Why the Materialist Neo-Darwinian Conception of Nature Is Almost Certainly False, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199919758.001.0001
• Nakissa, Aria, 2020, “The Cognitive Science of Religion and Islamic Theology: An Analysis Based on the Works of al-Ghazālī”, Journal of the American Academy of Religion, 88(4): 1087–1120. doi:10.1093/jaarel/lfaa059
• Nichols, Ryan, Mathieu Charbonneau, Azita Chellappoo, Taylor Davis, Miriam Haidle, Erik O. Kimbrough, Henrike Moll, Richard Moore, Thom Scott-Phillips, Benjamin Grant Purzycki, and Jose Segovia-Martin, 2024, “Cultural Evolution: A Review of Theoretical Challenges”, Evolutionary Human Sciences, 6: e12. doi:10.1017/ehs.2024.2
• Norenzayan, Ara, 2013, Big Gods: How Religion Transformed Cooperation and Conflict, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• –––, 2015, “Big Questions about Big Gods : Response and Discussion”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 5(4): 327–342. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2014.928359
• Norenzayan, Ara, Will M. Gervais, and Kali H. Trzesniewski, 2012, “Mentalizing Deficits Constrain Belief in a Personal God”, PLoS ONE, 7(5): e36880. doi:10.1371/journal.pone.0036880
• Nowak, Martin A. and Sarah Coakley (eds), 2013, Evolution, Games, and God: The Principle of Cooperation, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
• Otte, Richard, 2012, “Theory Comparison in Science and Religion”, in Reason, Metaphysics, and Mind: New Essays on the Philosophy of Alvin Plantinga, Kelly James Clark and Michael Rea (eds), Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 86–99.
• Piazza, Jared, Jesse M. Bering, and Gordon Ingram, 2011, “‘Princess Alice Is Watching You’: Children’s Belief in an Invisible Person Inhibits Cheating”, Journal of Experimental Child Psychology, 109(3): 311–320. doi:10.1016/j.jecp.2011.02.003
• Plantinga, Alvin, 2009, “Games Scientists Play”, in Schloss and Murray 2009: 139–167 (ch. 7).
• –––, 2011, Where the Conflict Really Lies: Science, Religion, and Naturalism, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199812097.001.0001
• Powell, Alvin, 2007, “Can Science, Religion Coexist in Peace?”, Harvard Gazette, 15 March 2007. [Powell 2007 available online]
• Powell, Russell and Steve Clarke, 2012, “Religion as an Evolutionary Byproduct: A Critique of the Standard Model”, The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 63(3): 457–486. doi:10.1093/bjps/axr035
• Purzycki, Benjamin Grant and Aiyana K. Willard, 2016, “MCI Theory: A Critical Discussion”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 6(3): 207–248. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2015.1024915
• Pyysiäinen, Ilkka, 2003, “Buddhism, Religion, and the Concept of ‘God’”, Numen, 50(2): 147–171. doi:10.1163/156852703321506141
• Ratzsch, Delvin Lee, 2001, Nature, Design, and Science: The Status of Design in Natural Science (SUNY Series in Philosophy and Biology), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
• Reischel, Julia, 2006, “The God Fossil: An Interview with Jesse Bering”, Broward Palm Beach New Times, 8 March 2006. [Reischel 2006 available online]
• Rosenberg, Stanley P., Michael Burdett, Michael Lloyd, and Benno van den Toren (eds), 2018, Finding Ourselves after Darwin: Conversations on the Image of God, Original Sin, and the Problem of Evil, Grand Rapids, MI: Baker Academic.
• Ruse, Michael, 2017, Darwinism as Religion: What Literature Tells Us about Evolution, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780190241025.001.0001
• Schellenberg, J. L., 2009, The Will to Imagine: A Justification of Skeptical Religion, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press. doi:10.7591/9780801459269
• –––, 2013, Evolutionary Religion, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199673766.001.0001
• Schloss, Jeffrey P. and Michael J. Murray, 2011, “Evolutionary Accounts of Belief in Supernatural Punishment: A Critical Review”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 1(1): 46–99. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2011.558707
• Schloss, Jeffrey and Michael J. Murray (eds), 2009, The Believing Primate: Scientific, Philosophical, and Theological Reflections on the Origin of Religion, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199557028.001.0001
• Schneider, John R., 2020, Animal Suffering and the Darwinian Problem of Evil, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/9781108767439
• Schnell, Alexandra K. and Nicola S. Clayton, 2022, “Evolutionary Origins of Complex Cognition”, in Evolution of Learning and Memory Mechanisms, Mark A. Krause, Karen L. Hollis, and Mauricio R. Papini (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 317–338 (ch. 18). doi:10.1017/9781108768450.022
• Shariff, Azim F. and Ara Norenzayan, 2007, “God Is Watching You: Priming God Concepts Increases Prosocial Behavior in an Anonymous Economic Game”, Psychological Science, 18(9): 803–809. doi:10.1111/j.1467-9280.2007.01983.x
• Shaver, John H., Radim Chvaja, Laure Spake, Anushé Hassan, Jainaba Badjie, Andrew M. Prentice, Carla Cerami, Rebecca Sear, Mary K. Shenk, and Richard Sosis, 2024, “Religious Involvement Is Associated With Higher Fertility and Lower Maternal Investment, but More Alloparental Support Among Gambian Mothers”, American Journal of Human Biology, 36(12): e24144. doi:10.1002/ajhb.24144
• Slingerland, Edward, 2013, “Body and Mind in Early China: An Integrated Humanities-Science Approach”, Journal of the American Academy of Religion, 81(1): 6–55. doi:10.1093/jaarel/lfs094
• Slone, D. Jason, 2004, Theological Incorrectness: Why Religious People Believe What They Shouldn’t, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/0195169263.001.0001
• Smith, Barbara Herrnstein, 2009, Natural Reflections: Human Cognition at the Nexus of Science and Religion (Terry Lectures Series), New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
• Smith, Tiddy, 2020, “The Common Consent Argument for the Existence of Nature Spirits”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 98(2): 334–348. doi:10.1080/00048402.2019.1621912
• Smolin, Lee, 1997, The Life of the Cosmos, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Sober, Elliott, 2008, Evidence and Evolution: The Logic behind the Science, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511806285
• –––, 2009, “Absence of Evidence and Evidence of Absence: Evidential Transitivity in Connection with Fossils, Fishing, Fine-Tuning, and Firing Squads”, Philosophical Studies, 143(1): 63–90. doi:10.1007/s11098-008-9315-0
• –––, 2014, “Evolutionary Theory, Causal Completeness, and Theism: The Case of ‘Guided’ Mutation”, in Evolutionary Biology: Conceptual, Ethical, and Religious Issues, R. Paul Thompson and Denis Walsh (eds), New York: Cambridge University Press, 31–44 (ch. 2). doi:10.1017/CBO9781139208796.004
• Sosis, Richard and Eric R. Bressler, 2003, “Cooperation and Commune Longevity: A Test of the Costly Signaling Theory of Religion”, Cross-Cultural Research, 37(2): 211–239. doi:10.1177/1069397103037002003
• Stanford, P. Kyle, 2006, Exceeding Our Grasp: Science, History, and the Problem of Unconceived Alternatives, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/0195174089.001.0001
• Steinhart, Eric, 2016, “On Religious Naturalism”, in Alternative Concepts of God: Essays on the Metaphysics of the Divine, Andrei Buckareff and Yujin Nagasawa (eds), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 274–294 (ch.15). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198722250.003.0016
• Stout, Dietrich, Erin Hecht, Nada Khreisheh, Bruce Bradley, and Thierry Chaminade, 2015, “Cognitive Demands of Lower Paleolithic Toolmaking”, Nuno Bicho (ed.), PLoS ONE, 10(4): e0121804. doi:10.1371/journal.pone.0121804
• Street, Sharon, 2006, “A Darwinian Dilemma for Realist Theories of Value”, Philosophical Studies, 127(1): 109–166. doi:10.1007/s11098-005-1726-6
• Sullivan, Meghan, 2014, “Uneasy Grace”, First Things, 242(April): article 1. [Sullivan 2014 available online]
• Swan, Thomas, Jesse Bering, Ruth Hughes, and Jamin Halberstadt, 2023, “The Role of Implicit and Explicit Beliefs in Grave‐Good Practices: Evidence for Intuitive Afterlife Reasoning”, Cognitive Science, 47(4): e13263. doi:10.1111/cogs.13263
• Swan, Thomas and Jamin Halberstadt, 2019, “The Mickey Mouse Problem: Distinguishing Religious and Fictional Counterintuitive Agents”, Valerio Capraro (ed.), PLoS ONE, 14(8): e0220886. doi:10.1371/journal.pone.0220886
• Taves, Ann, 2009, Religious Experience Reconsidered: A Building Block Approach to the Study of Religion and Other Special Things, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Teehan, John, 2010, In the Name of God: The Evolutionary Origins of Religious Ethics and Violence (Blackwell Public Philosophy 9), Chichester, UK/Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell. doi:10.1002/9781444320695
• Thagard, Paul, 2005, “The Emotional Coherence of Religion,” Journal of Cognition and Culture, 5(1–2): 58–74.
• Thurow, Joshua C., 2013, “Does Cognitive Science Show Belief in God to Be Irrational? The Epistemic Consequences of the Cognitive Science of Religion”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 74(1): 77–98. doi:10.1007/s11153-011-9300-y
• –––, 2023, “Debunking Arguments and Religious Belief”, in The Cambridge Handbook of Religious Epistemology, Jonathan Fuqua, John Greco, and Tyler McNabb (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 290–304. doi:10.1017/9781009047180.023
• Turchin, Peter, Harvey Whitehouse, Sergey Gavrilets, Daniel Hoyer, Pieter François, James S. Bennett, Kevin C. Feeney, Peter Peregrine, Gary Feinman, Andrey Korotayev, et al., 2022, “Disentangling the Evolutionary Drivers of Social Complexity: A Comprehensive Test of Hypotheses”, Science Advances, 8(25): eabn3517. doi:10.1126/sciadv.abn3517
• Turchin, Peter, Harvey Whitehouse, Jennifer Larson, Enrico Cioni, Jenny Reddish, Daniel Hoyer, Patrick E. Savage, R. Alan Covey, John Baines, Mark Altaweel, et al., 2023, “Big Gods and Big Science: Further Reflections on Theory, Data, and Analysis”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 13(2): 218–231. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2022.2065354
• Vail, Kenneth E., Zachary K. Rothschild, Dave R. Weise, Sheldon Solomon, Tom Pyszczynski, and Jeff Greenberg, 2010, “A Terror Management Analysis of the Psychological Functions of Religion”, Personality and Social Psychology Review, 14(1): 84–94. doi:10.1177/1088868309351165
• Van Inwagen, Peter, 2003, “The Compatibility of Darwinism and Design”, in God and Design: The Teleological Argument and Modern Science, Neil A. Manson (ed.), London/New York: Routledge, 347–361 (ch. 19).
• –––, 2009, “Explaining Belief in the Supernatural: Some Thoughts on Paul Bloom’s ‘Religious Belief as an Evolutionary Accident’”, in Schloss and Murray 2009: 128–138 (ch. 6).
• Van Leeuwen, Neil, 2023, Religion as Make-Believe: A Theory of Belief, Imagination, and Group Identity, Cambridge, MA/London: Harvard University Press.
• Van Leeuwen, Neil and Michiel Van Elk, 2019, “Seeking the Supernatural: The Interactive Religious Experience Model”, Religion, Brain & Behavior, 9(3): 221–251. doi:10.1080/2153599X.2018.1453529
• White, Claire, 2021, An Introduction to the Cognitive Science of Religion: Connecting Evolution, Brain, Cognition, and Culture, London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781351010979
• White, Claire, Maya Marin, and Daniel M. T. Fessler, 2022, “The Dead May Kill You: Do Ancestor Spirit Beliefs Promote Cooperation in Traditional Small-Scale Societies?”, Journal of Cognition and Culture, 22(3–4): 294–323. doi:10.1163/15685373-12340135
• White, Roger, 2000, “Fine‐Tuning and Multiple Universes”, Noûs, 34(2): 260–276. doi:10.1111/0029-4624.00210
• –––, 2010, “You Just Believe That Because…”, Philosophical Perspectives, 24(1): 573–615. doi:10.1111/j.1520-8583.2010.00204.x
• Whitehouse, Harvey, 2004, Modes of Religiosity: A Cognitive Theory of Religious Transmission (Cognitive Science of Religion Series), Walnut Creek, CA: AltaMira Press.
• Whitehouse, Harvey, Pieter François, Patrick E. Savage, Thomas E. Currie, Kevin C. Feeney, Enrico Cioni, Rosalind Purcell, Robert M. Ross, Jennifer Larson, John Baines, et al., 2021, “Retraction Note: Complex Societies Precede Moralizing Gods throughout World History”, Nature, 595(7866): 320–320. doi:10.1038/s41586-021-03656-3
• Wilkinson, Darryl, 2023, “Animism and Cognitive Science of Religion: A Critical Perspective”, in Animism and Philosophy of Religion (Palgrave Frontiers in Philosophy of Religion), Tiddy Smith (ed.), Cham: Springer International Publishing, 23–43. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-94170-3_2
• Wilson, David Sloan, 2002, Darwin’s Cathedral: Evolution, Religion, and the Nature of Society, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Wilson, David Sloan and William Scott Green, 2011, “Evolutionary Religious Studies: A Beginner’s Guide”, in Creating Consilience: Integrating the Sciences and the Humanities (Common Sense, Reasoning, and Rationality), Edward Slingerland and Mark Collard (eds), New York: Oxford University Press, 224–242 (ch. 12). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199794393.003.0013
• Xygalatas, Dimitris, Panagiotis Mitkidis, Ronald Fischer, Paul Reddish, Joshua Skewes, Armin W. Geertz, Andreas Roepstorff, and Joseph Bulbulia, 2013, “Extreme Rituals Promote Prosociality”, Psychological Science, 24(8): 1602–1605. doi:10.1177/0956797612472910
• Yaden, David B., Cassondra L. Batz-Barbarich, Vincent Ng, Hoda Vaziri, Jessica N. Gladstone, James O. Pawelski, and Louis Tay, 2022, “A Meta-Analysis of Religion/Spirituality and Life Satisfaction”, Journal of Happiness Studies, 23(8): 4147–4163. doi:10.1007/s10902-022-00558-7
• Zhu, Liqi, 2017, “What Happens After Death?”, in Religious Cognition in China: “Homo Religiosus” and the Dragon (New Approaches to the Scientific Study of Religion 2), Ryan G. Hornbeck, Justin L. Barrett, and Madeleine Kang (eds), Cham: Springer International Publishing, 151–158. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-62954-4_10

Academic Tools

	How to cite this entry.
	Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
	Look up topics and thinkers related to this entry at the Internet Philosophy Ontology Project (InPhO).
	Enhanced bibliography for this entry at PhilPapers, with links to its database.

Other Internet Resources

• Branch, Glenn, 2025, “Vast Majority of Americans Accept Human Evolution, New Survey Finds”, National Center for Science Education (NCSE), 28 February 2025.
• Draper, Paul, 2007, “Natural Selection and the Problem of Evil”, in God or Blind Nature? Philosophers Debate the Evidence, Paul Draper (ed.), Internet Infidels. [Draper 2007 available online]
• Grain, Kerrie, 2019, “The Common Consent Argument”, The Philosophers’ Magazine Archive, 1 September 2019.
• Lamoureux, Denis, “Science & Religion Web Lectures”, last update: 13 March 2021.
• “Evolution in Hinduism and Islam - The Existence of God - GCSE Religious Studies Revision - CCEA”, BBC Bitesize, Accessed: 9 December 2025.
• Videos
  • The Metaphysics of Teleology (dir.), 2021, Helen De Cruz – The Role of Intuitive Teleology in Reasoning about Biology (runtime: 54:06).
  • Barrett, Justin (dir.), 2024, Why Children Are Born Believers | Dr. Justin Barrett Explains the Born Believer Thesis (runtime: 23:39).
  • Thoughtology (dir.), 2019, Episode 13, Paul Draper, On Arguments for Atheism (runtime: 1:18:46).
  • Nonzero (dir.), 2018, Science Saturday: The Science and Psychology of Disasters | Jesse Bering & Maggie Koerth-Baker (runtime: 41:18).

Related Entries

Darwinism | evolution: concept before Darwin | religion: and science

Acknowledgments

I am grateful to others members of the Cognitive Science of Religion and Philosophy Workshop, held at Rutgers University in March of 2022, for discussions that helped to inform which topics and figures to include in this entry. I am also grateful to Paul Draper for helpful advice.