Religious Diversity (Pluralism)

First published Tue May 25, 2004; substantive revision Fri Feb 21, 2025

In many, if not most, areas of thought, significant differences of opinion exist among individuals who seem to be equally knowledgeable and sincere. Such diversity of opinion, though, is nowhere more evident than in the area of religious thought. On almost every religious issue, individuals who seem to have equal access to the relevant information and be equally truth-seeking hold significantly diverse, often incompatible beliefs.

Religious diversity of this sort can be fruitfully explored in many ways —for instance, from psychological, anthropological, or historical perspectives. The current discussion, however, will concern itself primarily some key issues surrounding religious diversity with which philosophers are most concerned at present. Specifically, our discussion will focus primarily on the following questions: How pervasive is religious diversity? Does the reality of such diversity require a response? Can a person who acknowledges religious diversity remain justified in claiming just one perspective to be correct? Can acknowledged religious diversity lead to religious tolerance? Can it justifiably be claimed that only one religion offers a path into the eternal presence of God? How should religious diversity be approached in public education? The answers to such questions are not simply academic; they have an increasingly practical impact on how we treat others, both personally and corporately.

The main goal of this discussion, it is important to note, is not to support a given stance on these issues. It is to clarify the issues and explore differing perspectives.

1. The Focus and Scope of the Discussion

Some prominent philosophers of religion are critical of the fact that the main focus of most philosophical discussions of religion, including discussions of religious diversity, is on theistic rather than non-theistic religions. John Schellenberg, for instance, has recently argued that “philosophy of religion should incorporate nontheistic conceptions of God in the context of the much larger set of topics that philosophers of religion should be investigating” (Schellenberg 2024, 34). While I’m sensitive to this concern, the focus of this discussion will remain, as it currently does for the majority of analytic philosophers of religion, on theistic religions. Monotheistic religions such as Judaism, Christianity, and Islam agree that there is a sole God, while polytheistic religions such as Taoism, Japanese Shinto, and Chinese folk religion hold that there are multiple deities (gods). Much of what follows applies to any theistic religion. The main focus, however, will be on the diversity issues that arise predominately in those religions that believe in a sole personal Supreme Being (God).

Even in relation to theistic religions, Schellenberg and others are concerned with the continuing prominence and influence of classical Christianity. To counter this, Schellenberg argues, “we need new work to broaden what today is called Christian philosophy into something that might credibly be called the philosophy of Christianity, by rigorously developing both arguments favouring classical Christian doctrine and arguments opposing it” as by doing so “we may succeed in unsettling the current consensus, awakening many from their dogmatic slumbers, and thus change the Christian climate of our field sufficiently to allow a great many new ideas about religion to be exposed and receive the attention they deserve” (Schellenberg 2024, 40). While the general arguments and concepts discussed below are not primarily focused on Christianity, the majority of the clarifying examples come from Christian (and to a lesser extent Muslim) sources.

Victoria Harrison maintains that we need a more global approach to the philosophy of religion. For this to occur, she argues, we need more than simply “expanding [philosophy of religion’s] traditional disciplinary scope or broadening its range of questions.” It will require that we have philosophers “conversant in more than one philosophical tradition” as this will provide a “platform for deep and authentic engagement in philosophical inquiry that crosses traditional religious and philosophical boundaries” (Harrison 2020, 20). While thre is clear value to a more global approach to the philosophy of religion in general and to religious diversity in particular, the discussion that follows focuses primarily, but not solely, on the key diversity questions currently under discussion in Western analytic philosophy of religion.

Mikel Burley fears that current philosophy of religion focuses too narrowly on general abstract concepts of the divine at the expense of downplaying “the particularities of historically and geographically distinct conceptions of God” in actual lived religions (Burley 2024, 98). While there is a valid distinction between focusing on the specific perspectives of various actual religions on issues and focusing on issues that are relevant to many actual religious perspectives, with examples from specific religions, the focus of this discussion is on the latter.

Finally, although there is obviously widespread diversity of thought among monotheistic religions (theistic systems) on such core issues as God’s nature and character, the relationship between divine control and human freedom, the extent to which God unilaterally intervenes in our world, and how God would have us live, it is becoming increasingly recognized that widespread diversity of thought on all such issues also exists just as clearly, and in exactly the same sense, within basic theistic systems. For example, within Christianity, believers differ significantly on the nature of God. Some see God as all-controlling, others as self-limiting, and still others as incapable of unilaterally controlling any aspect of reality. Some believe God to have infallible knowledge only of all that has occurred or is occurring; others claim God also has knowledge of all that will actually occur, while those who believe God possesses middle knowledge add that God knows all that would actually occur in any possible context. Some believe the moral principles stipulated by God for correct human behavior flow from God’s nature or character and thus that such principles determine God’s behavior, while others believe that God acts in accordance with a different set of moral rules than the moral rules given to humans: that for God what is right is simply whatever God does. Some believe that only those who have consciously “given their lives to Christ” will spend eternity in God’s presence. Others believe that many who have never even heard the name of Jesus will enter God’s presence, while others do not even believe subjective immortality (a conscious afterlife) to be a reality.

Muslims also differ significantly among themselves on these same divine attributes, the autonomy of the individual when interpreting the Qur’an, how best to apply core Islamic values to modern life, and the status of women (Aijaz 2015). We find equally pervasive, significant intra-system diversity in Hinduism (Burley 2024) and Judaism (Shatz 2011).

It is also important to note that the perspective of a variant of a given religion on an issue (for example, the perspective of conservative Christians on God’s power and human freedom or the role of women) is often more closely aligned with the perspective of variants of differing religions on that issue (for example, the perspectives of conservative Muslims or conservative Jews on human freedom or the role of women) than with the perspective of other variants within the same religion (Basinger 2023, 6).

Both inter-religious and intra-religious diversity will receive attention in what follows.

2. Responses to Religious Diversity

Philosophical/theological responses to religious diversity are normally divided into three categories: religious exclusivism, religious inclusivism, and religious pluralism. However, there is not always agreement on the meaning of these categorizing terms. For our purposes, they will be defined as follows.

Individuals are religious exclusivists when they believe that their perspective on some disputed inter-theistic truth claim—for example, that Allah is the true God—or some disputed intra-theistic truth claim—for example, that the Christian God cannot control free human choice—is the truth or at least closer to the truth than any other competing religious perspective on this issue.[1] But even here, there is an important distinction to be made. As Guy Axtell rightly points out, one can be a “particularist exclusivist” who holds that only one of a number of perspectives on a given issue can be uniquely true and no one can justifiably maintain otherwise or a “mutualist exclusivist” who holds that while it can justifiably be maintained that only one perspective on a given issue is uniquely true, those holding differing perspectives can also justifiably claim that these perspectives are uniquely true (Axtell 2020). While Axtell, himself, does not believe mutualist exclusivism to be coherent, others such as Dirk-Martin Grube maintain not only that mutual exclusivism —couching discussions of exclusivism in terms of justified belief rather than bivalent truth—is coherent but also productive for inter-religious dialog (Grube 2019).

Individuals are religious inclusivists in the most general sense when they hold to the primacy of one religion but the validity of other religions. That is, inclusivists maintain that while their own religious perspectives are the fullest (most complete and accurate) understanding of ultimate reality, the perspectives of other religions contain a partially complete and accurate understanding of ultimate reality, including genuine, albeit incomplete, experiences of the divine. However, as will be discussed in Section 6, while all inclusivists agree that those who are not adherents to the one fully true religion can attain salvation, some maintain that only the one true religion can offer a valid path to eternal presence with God (Pinnock 1992) while others do not (Rahner 1966).

Individuals are religious pluralists when they deny the primacy of any one religion. Those sometimes labeled philosophical (or metaphysical or unitary) religious pluralists maintain that there is an ultimate reality and that various religions offer incomplete understandings of this reality. Accordingly, the religious perspectives of more than one basic theistic system or variant thereof can justifiably be considered equally close to the truth (Hick 2004). A key goal of these pluralists is to identify those aspects of this ultimate reality to which the various religions imperfectly point (Hick 2004). Those sometimes labeled radical religious pluralists maintain that differing religions are ultimately irreducibly diverse and, thus, reject the attempt to identify a unified ultimate reality or shared ethical framework and instead encourage a focus on the differing aspects rather than the shared commonality of the various religions (Heim 1995; Runzo 2011).

3. Religious Diversity and Epistemic Obligation

No philosopher denies that the awareness (realization) of seeming religious diversity does at times have an impact on exclusivists—from causing minor uneasiness to significantly reducing their level of confidence in the truth of certain beliefs to precipitating belief abandonment. This is simply an empirical claim about psychological states and behaviors (Alston 1988, 442–446; Plantinga 2000, 189).

How should, though, exclusivists coming to an awareness of religious diversity—the awareness that seemingly sincere, knowledgeable individuals differ with them on issues of religious significance—respond to the reality of such diversity? How should, for instance, the devout Hindu or Christian who comes to realize that those of other religions who seem as knowledgeable and devout hold incompatible religious perspectives on the nature of the divine respond? Or how should a Christian who believes the Bible clearly portrays a God with total control over all aspects of reality respond to the realization that other seemingly sincere, devout, “Bible-believing” Christians see the Bible as clearly portraying a God who has chosen not to control what occurs in those contexts in which humans have been granted meaningful moral freedom? Can exclusivists justifiably disregard such diversity, or do exclusivists have an obligation to attempt to resolve such epistemic conflicts – engage in belief assessment (or reassessment) with openness to possible revision? Would it at least be a good idea to do so?

Before discussing these questions, we must note two challenges to any form of epistemic obligation in this context. First, there are religious individuals (and groups) who believe it is inappropriate to subject religious beliefs to rational assessment of any sort. Certain individuals (sometimes called fideists) have argued, for instance, that religious beliefs are not of a type properly subjected to rational assessment and/or that assessing such beliefs demonstrates a lack of faith (Peterson et al. 2013, 65–69). However, few philosophers currently hold this position. Most maintain that exclusivists have at least the right to assess their beliefs in the face of religious diversity.

Second, we must consider the argument, put forth most forcefully by Alvin Plantinga, that the discussion of any form of epistemic obligation faced by exclusivists in response to seeming peer conflict on religious issues is based on a faulty premise: that the exclusivist must acknowledge that peer conflict of the type in question actually exists.

Plantinga acknowledges that if proponents of a specific religious perspective have no reason to doubt that those with whom they disagree really are on equal epistemic footing, then they are under a prima facie obligation to attempt to resolve the conflict. However, Plantinga denies that Christian exclusivists need ever acknowledge that they are facing true epistemic parity—need ever admit that they actually are differing with true epistemic peers. Although Christian exclusivists, we are told, may grant that those with whom they disagree have not violated any epistemic duty and may know of no arguments that would convince others of their wrongness while maintaining their rightness, exclusivists are likely to believe that they have in some way been epistemically favored. They might believe, for instance, that they have been graced by “the Internal Witness of the Holy Spirit; or perhaps [they] think the Holy Spirit preserves the Christian church from serious error, at least with respect to the fundamentals of Christian belief; or perhaps [they think] that [they have] been converted by divine grace, so that [they] now see what was once obscure to [them]—a blessing not so far bestowed upon the dissenters” (Plantinga 1997, 296).

Moreover, if any beliefs of this type are true, Plantinga contends, then Christian exclusivists are probably in a better epistemic position, than those who reject the exclusivistic beliefs in question. Therefore, since it cannot be demonstrated that Christian belief of this sort is very likely false, Christian believers remain justified in maintaining that the proponents of other religious perspectives are not actually on an equal epistemic footing. The same, Plantinga acknowledges, might well be true for exclusivists in other religious belief systems (Plantinga 1997, 296).[2]

The strength of this line of reasoning depends in part on the debatable question of who shoulders the burden of proof in the face of religious diversity. Those siding with Plantinga argue in essence that unless exclusivists must acknowledge on epistemic grounds that are (or should be) accepted by all rational people that those holding incompatible beliefs are actually on equal footing, exclusivists can justifiably deny that this is so and thus need not engage in belief assessment (Kim 2011). Dissenters argue that exclusivists are the ones who shoulder the burden of proof. Unless it can be demonstrated on epistemic grounds that are (or should be) accepted by all rational people that proponents of the competing perspectives are not actually on equal epistemic footing, exclusivists must consider their challengers on equal epistemic footing and are thus obligated to engage in belief assessment (Basinger 2002, 26–27). Or, to state this important distinction another way, Plantinga contends that we need not acknowledge that those with whom we disagree are actually on equal epistemic footing unless it can be demonstrated objectively that they are equally knowledgeable and sincere, while his critics maintain that we must acknowledge that those with whom we disagree are on equal epistemic footing unless we have an objective means of demonstrating that we are in fact more knowledgeable and/or sincere than they. Most philosophers of religion side with the critics in this case and thus assume that actual peer conflict cannot justifiably be denied (Stenmark 2024; Byrne 2011, 30).

Assuming the reality of peer conflict, some claim that exclusivists encountering peer disputes on religious issues are required (fully obligated) to attempt to resolve such epistemic conflicts. The contention here, it must be emphasized, is not that such resolution is always possible or that exclusivists must necessarily give up their beliefs if no resolution is forthcoming. Discussion concerning those issues is yet to come. The claim, rather, is only that exclusivists are obligated at the very least to assess the evidence for and against the beliefs in question and try to “get a sense of the appeal and of the concern of those who advocate them” (McKim 2001, 146).

Other philosophers support qualified forms of obligation in the face of peer conflict. Dirk-Martin Grube, for example, states that exclusivists like Plantinga tend to focus on “the question of whether we are justified to make exclusivist truth claims in religion but overlook the question of how we should make those claims” (Grube 2024, 111). Exclusivists, he maintains, can justifiably claim that they are entitled to hold their beliefs—can fend off defeaters. However, such exclusivists are often guilty of being epistemically overconfident rather than epistemically humble. When faced with cognitive ambiguity (peer conflict in relation to religious beliefs), exclusivists should be open to the possibility that their judgment is mistaken and therefore be open to humbly engaging in “robust dialogue” with those with whom they disagree (Grube 2024, 121–22). The goal of such dialogue, he notes elsewhere, is not to convert the other or even necessarily identify areas of mutual agreement, although agreement of this sort may well occur in some cases. The goal is to engage in a “meaningful exchange” that will give exclusivists (and their challengers) a basis for reflecting more seriously on their own perspectives (Grube 2019, 183).

Mikael Stenmark affirms a more qualified sense of obligation in the face of peer conflict. He maintains that “when we discover that other intelligent, well-informed, and honest people around us do not share but even deny some of our most fundamental religious or secular beliefs, we [must] . . . actually take into consideration the possibility that we may be wrong” (Stenmark 2024, 48). However, the principle of epistemic conservatism dictates that we should “initially assume that what we find ourselves believing is true until a good reason arises for us to question whether we may have made a mistake” (Stenmark 2024, 46). Given this principle, he maintains, exclusivists have no overarching epistemic duty (obligation) to always assess their current beliefs in the face of acknowledged peer conflict, even if they must acknowledge they may be wrong. It is only when exclusivists, themselves, find other perspectives worthy of consideration that they have an epistemic obligation to consider such perspectives. Given, though, that exclusivists must acknowledge that they could be mistaken – that there is a “non-negligible risk” that they are wrong – exclusivists do have a reason (although not an obligation) to consider the perspectives of others in relation to significant issues (Stenmark 2024, 53).

Jerome Gellman offers what can be viewed as a stronger version of Stenmark’s position. The focus of Gellman’s challenge centers on what he identifies as rock bottom beliefs. Such beliefs, as Gellman defines them, are the epistemic givens in a religious belief system—the assumed, foundational truths upon which all else is built. Gellman grants that if a religious belief affirmed by an exclusivist is not rock bottom (is not a foundational assumption), then it may well be subject to obligatory belief assessment in the face of religious diversity. However, he argues, since belief assessment only makes sense when one isn’t certain that the belief in question is true, and since rock bottom religious beliefs are among the foundational truths—the basic, assumed truths—in an exclusivist’s epistemic system, no assessment is necessary. Rather, when exclusivists encounter a challenge to such a belief—for example, a challenge to their rock bottom belief in God’s ultimate control over all earthly affairs—they can, utilizing the G. E. Moore switch, justifiably maintain that because their rock bottom belief is true, the competing belief can justifiably be rejected (Gellman 1993, 345–364; Gellman 1998, 229–235).

Furthermore, Gellman adds that even if we grant that rock bottom beliefs are at times open to belief assessment, exclusivists need not engage in such assessment in the face of religious diversity unless they find that the awareness of such diversity is causing them to lose significant confidence in their own perspective. In the absence of this type of internal conflict, they “may rationally invoke [their] unreflective religious belief to defeat opposing religious claims, without having to consider the question any further” (Gellman 2000, 403).

It would seem, though, that even those who are sympathetic to Gellman’s general line of reasoning would want to limit its scope. Many religious beliefs held by exclusivists have practical consequences. That is, exclusivist beliefs are not isolated cognitive assumptions; they motivate behavior. For instance, there are many theists worldwide who not only still believe that men have some sort of God-given, inherent authority over women, or that certain ethnic groups have God-given superiority, or that certain sexual orientations are perversions of God’s ideal, or that humans have God-given authority over the rest of nature, or that God desires heretics to be silenced, they also act on these beliefs. However, it seems safe to assume that most exclusivists, including Gellman, believe that some of these actions are morally wrong and ought to be stopped to the extent possible. In such cases, it is difficult to imagine many exclusivists maintaining that those who hold the beliefs on which these acts are based have no need to reassess these beliefs unless they personally feel a need to do so. It seems, rather, that most exclusivists would want those holding such beliefs to at the very least engage in significant belief reassessment, even if they don’t at present personally feel a need to do so.

Finally, Jennifer Jensen offers a different form of qualified obligation to assess religious beliefs in the face of peer conflict (Jensen 2024). Jensen grants that there are many weighty, long-standing unresolved disagreements on foundational religious issues—for example, on whether God exists, and if so how God is involved in earthly affairs—with respect to which we have no reason to deny that those on both sides are epistemic peers—to deny that they are equally sincere, qualified, and knowledgeable. Moreover, Jensen acknowledges that exclusivists must always consider alleged defeaters to their religious beliefs—claims that there are objective, non-question-begging criteria in relation to which it can be demonstrated that a given religious belief is false or cannot justifiably be affirmed. However, in the absence of such defeaters, the strength of any obligation to assess disputed beliefs, we are told, depends on the similarity of the belief systems of the interlocutors with respect to the beliefs in question.

Our beliefs, Jensen points out, do not exist in isolation. Our belief systems (noetic structures) are composed of properly basic (core, control) beliefs and beliefs that are layered upon these basic beliefs. All of our religious beliefs except our core religious beliefs are grounded in (are based upon) a set of other more deeply ingressed (layered) beliefs. Moreover, the closer a disputed belief is to our core beliefs, the greater the impact on our belief system as a whole would be if it were abandoned or even held with significantly less confidence.

Accordingly, assuming that there are no defeaters to a challenged religious belief and given that all religious beliefs except properly basic beliefs are grounded in (are based upon) a set of other more deeply ingressed beliefs, exclusivists are rationally justified in retaining a challenged belief if giving up the belief would require them to abandon their (1) properly basic beliefs, (2) any beliefs that are more closely connected to these core beliefs than the belief being challenged, or (3) those beliefs that are held with a greater degree of confidence than the belief being challenged.

What follows for the question of epistemic obligation in the face of peer conflict, we are told, depends on the extent to which exclusivists and their dissenters share the relevant set of undefeated beliefs. The rational response to epistemic peer conflict for exclusivists is to proportion the degree to which they are obligated to give weight to the opinion of peer critics to the “degree to which [they] and [their] interlocutor share the relevant beliefs”—to the extent that their noetic structures overlap (Jensen 2024, 364). More specifically, the greater the extent to which a challenger shares the set of layered beliefs on which the challenged belief is based, the greater the obligation to consider the challenge. It also follows, though, that it is rational for exclusivists to give no weight to disagreements if they “have good reason to believe that the relevant beliefs are not shared (or not shared in the same way) between [them] and [those] with whom [they] disagree” (Jensen 2024, 368).

This, of course, as Jensen acknowledges, leaves open the question of how one determines, or the practicality of trying to determine, the extent to which those holding differing beliefs on an issue share overlapping belief structures. Jensen’s approach, though, does exemplify a growing acknowledgment of the role that non-objective criteria can play in assessing the rationality of beliefs, which will be discussed in greater detail in Section 4.

The conclusion of this section briefly notes the relevance of current discussions around the extent to which belief assessment that results in belief retention, modification, or rejection is actually under our control.

When considering the extent to which the acknowledgment of diverse perspectives on religious issues carries with it an epistemic obligation to assess one’s belief about those issues, there is often the explicit or implicit assumption that such assessment is fully or primarily a rational (cognitive) exercise. A person who is obligated or chooses to assess challenged beliefs is to consider all the relevant evidence in relation to an accepted method for determining justified belief and make a rational determination to retain, modify, or give up the belief in question. This is even so when the valid role of non-objective criteria for belief assessment is acknowledged. We still often find in place a model of belief assessment that is primarily cognitive (based on conscious rational considerations).

However, to what extent is this rational assessment model accurate, especially in relation to strongly held, deeply engrained beliefs (including religious beliefs) that are close to the core (foundation) of our belief systems? Social psychologists continue to maintain that such deeply engrained beliefs are often quite resistant to “neutral,” objective assessment. Whether this initial inability to assess such beliefs in an objective fashion is primarily the result of the manner in which the brain functions, unconscious early childhood belief formation, and/or the unquestioned acquisition of beliefs from respected adults, what does not seem open to debate is that we all have person-specific beliefs related to deeply held values, cultural norms, and/ or religious doctrines that are very resistant to change, even in the face of seemingly strong contrary evidence (Haidt 2012; Mercer & Sperber 2011; Tappin, van der Leer, & McKay 2017).

More specifically, it appears to be the case that when confronted with criticisms of, or counter-evidence to, deeply engrained beliefs that have emotional and/or cultural anchoring in our sense of self or the “world” in which we exist, our initial conscious (or unconscious) response is not to welcome this information and consider how it impacts these beliefs. Rather, our default response is to avoid the evidence, discredit the source, reinterpret the evidence, and/or reframe the belief to absorb the counter-evidence without rejecting or even significantly modifying the beliefs in question (Kahneman 2011). This default desire to retain beliefs of this type in the face of seeming counter-evidence may be a possible explanation for the fact so few facing such counter-evidence actually give up or modify the beliefs in question when told that rationality requires that they need to do so based on the evidence at hand.[3]

It does appear, though, that this default tendency toward nonfalsifiabilty can be minimized when consciously acknowledged and that belief modification can and most often does occur when individuals face an internally generated, as opposed to an externally imposed, sense of cognitive dissonance caused by seeming counter-evidence to their beliefs. To the extent that this is true, it seems that those philosophers (or others) who maintain there is some epistemic obligation to assess religious beliefs in the face of peer challenge and are, in addition, interested in the actualization of this obligation must do more than simply declare to those facing peer conflict that they have this obligation. They need to consider how this obligation can best be shared in a way that will maximize the likelihood that those facing diversity will experience the internal cognitive dissonance that often serves as the precursor to meaningful belief assessment and modification.

4. Religious Diversity and Justified Belief

Some philosophers/theologians assume that belief assessment, when conducted properly, can often resolve epistemic peer conflict (Byrne 2011, 31; Aijaz 2017). What if we assume, however, that while the consideration of criteria such as self-consistency and comprehensiveness can rule out certain options, there exists no set of criteria that will allow us to resolve most religious epistemic disputes (whether between proponents of different religions or proponents of different variants of the same religion) in a neutral, nonquestion-begging fashion (Peterson et al. 2013, 69–74)? In what epistemic position does this then place the exclusivist?

It is important that we clarify further the question being asked. Responses to seeming epistemic peer disagreement generally fall into one of four categories: (1) a steadfast response where individuals retain their perspectives on the disputed contention with the same degree of confidence, (2) some form of conciliatory response where individuals retain their perspectives but with reduced confidence and/or modify their perspective on the disputed contention, (3) some form of suspension of belief response where individuals have determined that they have no good reason to favor their perspectives over the perspectives of those with whom they disagree, and (4) some form of defeatist response where individuals relinquish their perspectives.

While interesting, we are not here concerned with the empirical question of how many philosophers fall into each camp when facing peer conflict. Nor will we be considering alleged correlations between, for instance, a conciliatory response and virtues such as intellectual humility and open-mindedness or a steadfast response and vices such as intellectual arrogance or bias, although recent work in this area has been done (Beebe & Matheson 2023). We are concerned with what it is “rational for the disagreeing parties to believe upon discovering their disagreement” (Beebe & Matheson 2023, 428). Or rephrased as a question for exclusivists, to what extent, if any, is it reasonable for exclusivists to retain their exclusivistic beliefs when it is acknowledged that epistemic peers disagree?[4]

The answer, as some see it, is that exclusivists can no longer justifiably maintain that their exclusivistic beliefs are true. John Schellenberg, for example, argues that because no more than one among a set of incompatible truth claims can be true, disputants in a debate over such claims are justified in continuing to maintain that their claim is true only if they possess nonquestion-begging justification — justification based on assumptions and lines of reasoning acceptable to both parties — for believing the incompatible claim of any competitor to be false. However, since no disputant in religious conflicts “has justification for supposing the others’ claims false,” disputants cannot be justified “in holding [their] own claim to be true” (Schellenberg 2000, 213). David Silver comes to a similar conclusion: “[Exclusivists] should provide independent evidence for the claim that they have a special source of religious knowledge ... or they should relinquish their exclusivist religious beliefs” (Silver 2001, 11).

Others have suggested that in the face of unresolved epistemic peer conflict, the (or a) rational course of action is to suspend judgment. Richard Feldman has argued, for instance, that in those cases of acknowledged epistemic peer conflict where we have no good reason for believing that those disagreeing with us are “making some kind of mistake or failing to see some truth . . . the right thing for both [sides] is to suspend judgment” (Feldman 2007, 212)[5].

Those who promote a conciliatory response don’t go this far. Specifically, they don’t maintain that exclusivists are required to abandon or suspend judgment on their beliefs in the face of unresolved epistemic peer disagreement. Proponents of what is often labeled the “Equal Weight View” maintain that in the face of unresolved epistemic peer conflict, both exclusivists and those holding differing perspectives should adjust their confidence levels to the point where those on both sides acknowledge that they and their epistemic challengers have equally compelling evidence that they are right (Elga 2007). Proponents of what is normally labeled “Strong Conciliationism” do not require that exclusivists grant equal credence to the positions of their epistemic peer critics but do maintain that exclusivists are required to hold their beliefs with significantly less confidence (Christensen 2007, 2020). Thomas Kelly, an influential critic of this position, argues that “when faced with a peer who disagrees, knowing how one is rationally required to respond will typically require an extremely substantive judgment about one’s overall epistemic situation, as opposed to the straightforward application of a general norm that dictates agnosticism in all such cases,” as the strong conciliationist holds (Kelly 2013, 52).

Those who fall into the camp of what can be labeled “Weak Conciliationism” do not argue that exclusivists need to hold their beliefs with significantly less confidence in the face of unresolved peer disagreement but do acknowledge that exclusivists must, or at least be willing to, hold their exclusive religious beliefs more tentatively—with somewhat less confidence—(Quinn 2005a). This reduction in confidence (tentativeness), Robert McKim tells us, has potential value in that it can lead to deep tolerance: the allowance “that those with whom you disagree are people whom it is worthwhile to approach with rational arguments” (McKim 2001, 178) And personal tolerance of this sort, we are told, may well lead to a more tolerant and open society that will permit and even encourage a diversity of opinion on all issues, including opinions on religious matters. [Whether this is in fact the case is considered in detail in Section 5]

William Alston is a leading representative of those who maintain that the exclusivist is justified in remaining steadfast in the face of peer conflict. His perspective is based on what he sees as a crucial distinction between two types of epistemic disputes: those in which “it is clear what would constitute non-circular grounds for supposing one of the contestants to be superior to the others” and those in which it is not. In the former case—in those cases in which there is a commonly accepted “procedure for settling disputes”—it is rational, he acknowledges, for individuals to engage in serious belief assessment that could result in belief modification or rejection (Alston 1988, 442–443).

However, as Alston sees it, there exists no such common ground for settling basic epistemic disputes over religious truth claims, and this, he contends, alters the situation drastically. It still remains true, he grants, that the reality of religious diversity diminishes justification. But the fact that “we are at a loss to specify [common ground]” means, he argues, that with respect to those religious perspectives that are self-consistent, it is not “irrational for one to remain an exclusivist”—not irrational for proponents of any religious perspective to continue to hold that their perspective is true. That is, as Alston sees it, given the absence of common ground for resolving disputes, the proponent of any self-consistent religious perspective can justifiably continue to believe this perspective to be true “despite not being able to show that it is epistemically superior to the competition” (Alston 1988, 443–446). Stated differently yet, Alston grants that objective evidence is necessary for justified belief when the debated issue is one for which such evidence is available. However, when objective evidence is not available—as is the case for most important religious disputes—it cannot be required for justified belief.

In fact, at one point he goes even further. Because there exists at present no neutral ground for adjudicating religious epistemic conflicts, it is not only the case, Alston argues, that exclusivists are justified (rational) in continuing to consider their own perspective superior. Since we do not even know in most cases what a non-circular reason for demonstrating superiority would look like, the “only rational course” for exclusivists “is to sit tight” with the beliefs “which [have] served so well in guiding [their] activity in the world.” Or, to generalize this point, Alston speaks for those who maintain that, given the absence of common ground for adjudicating disputes concerning self-consistent religious perspectives, it is not rational for exclusivists to stop maintaining that their system is superior (Alston 1988, 444).

Philip Quinn offers a noteworthy weak conciliatory response to Alston’s position. While he agrees with Alston that in the face of diversity, exclusivists may well be justified in continuing to “sit tight”—in continuing to maintain that their religious perspective is true—he denies that this is the only rational course of action available (Quinn 2000, 235–246). The basis for this position is his distinction between a pre-Kantian and a Kantian understanding of religious belief. To have a pre-Kantian understanding of religious belief is to assume that we have (or at least can have) access to the truth as it really is. It is to believe, for instance, that we do (or at least can in principle) know what God is really like. To have a Kantian understanding of religious belief is to assume that although there is a literal noumenal reality, our understanding of this reality (and thus our truth claims about this reality) will of necessity be relative to the cultural/social/psychological lenses through which our conceptualization of this noumenal reality is processed. It is to believe, for instance, that although there is a divine reality about which we can make truth claims, our understanding of (and thus our truth claims about) this divine reality will necessarily to some extent be conditioned by the ways in which our environment (our culture in the broadest sense) has shaped our categories of thought (Quinn 2000, 241–242).

Alston, Quinn contends, is essentially working off of a pre-Kantian model of religious belief when he encourages religious exclusivists to sit tight in the face of peer conflict since, in the absence of any objective basis for determining which perspective is right, the exclusivist has no sufficient reason not to do so. Quinn does not deny that this pre-Kantian approach is justifiable and thus does not deny that someone who follows Alston’s advice to sit tight is rational in doing so. However, Quinn believes that “it should not be taken for granted that any of the [contending perspectives] in its present form is correct.” Hence, he believes it is equally justifiable for an exclusivist to adopt a Kantian approach to religious belief. Specifically, he believes it is equally justifiable for an exclusivist to assume that whatever any of us can know about the truth of the matter will never be a description of religious reality that is free of significant cultural/social/psychological conditioning. Accordingly, it is also rational, he maintains, for exclusivists encountering diverse truth claims to “seek a more inclusivist or pluralistic understanding of their own faith” by modifying their beliefs to bring them “into line with such an understanding” (Quinn 2000, 242).

In short, as Quinn sees it, those who hold a position such as Alston’s have left us, at least implicitly, with a false dilemma: either we find common ground on which we can objectively determine which religious perspective is the truth or we sit tight with what we have. However, Quinn holds that once we realize it is perfectly reasonable for a person to assume that the proponent of no religious perspective has (or even could have) an accurate understanding of divine reality as it really is, another rational alternative appears. We then see that it is also perfectly rational for people to begin to revise their own phenomenological perspective on the truth in a way that will allow for greater overlap with the phenomenological perspectives of those with whom they disagree.

The approach to conflicting religious perspectives Quinn outlines has in fact become increasingly prominent in some exclusivistic circles. Consider, for example, the ongoing debate among conservative Christians over how God brought the rest of reality into existence. Some still claim the Bible clearly teaches that God created the “heavens and the earth” in six twenty-four-hour periods about ten thousand years ago. Others continue to maintain that the fact that “a day is to the Lord as a thousand years” (Psalms 90:4) means that while God is directly responsible for what the Bible says was created each “day,” it is most reasonable to believe that the time frame for each instance of creative activity could well have been millions, or even billions, of years. And then some still hold that God’s direct creative activity consisted primarily of orchestrating the “Big Bang.” However, more recently, many conservative Christians have taken a more Kantian approach. Based on their assumption that we may well not have access, even through Scripture, to exactly how God was involved in the creative process, they have modified what is to be considered essential to Christianity on this issue. Rather than affirming any of the specific explanations of how God created all else, they affirm a more general contention compatible with each of these specific explanations: that God is in some manner directly responsible for the existence of all else. They have, in Quinn’s terms, thinned their core theologies in a way that reconciles the divergent perspectives. [We will see below that this emphasis on working toward common belief is sometimes cited as a way to minimize differing perspectives on the eternal destiny of humans (Section 6) and as a way to approach diversity of thought on controversial issues in education (Section 7).]

Most realize, though, that moving toward a thinner theology can only resolve the epistemic tension produced by religious diversity to a certain extent. Let’s assume that it is perfectly reasonable, and possibly even preferable, for exclusivists to thin their theologies in an attempt to minimize that set of core beliefs that must be affirmed to remain proponents of the specific theological perspectives in question. To be an exclusivist—even a strongly Kantian exclusivist—is still to believe that one’s religious perspectives on some religious beliefs are superior in the sense that they are in some important way closer to the truth than are the competing perspectives of others. Accordingly, while thinning their theology may be a rational choice that can minimize conflict for exclusivists to some extent, few deny that a certain amount of epistemic conflict will remain.

Finally, an increasing number of philosophers are at least acknowledging a different, more pragmatic approach to addressing conflicting perspectives on religious issues. This approach, often labeled “pragmatic encroachment,” is based on the distinction between (1) personal pragmatic considerations—internal states such as psychological comfort, professional interests, or moral commitments—and (2) objective public evidence—evidence available to all persons involved in the dispute (Fantl & McGrath 2007). Proponents of this approach maintain that while it is important to consider all objective evidence when assessing beliefs in the face of peer conflict, it is also rational (justifiable) to consider personal pragmatic factors when making one’s determinations.

Some philosophers acknowledge this distinction but maintain that epistemic rationality in the face of diversity of thought requires adherence to objective considerations, apart from pragmatic factors (Feldman 2007; Christensen 2020). Others, following in the spirit of William James, are more sympathetic to allowing justifiable responses to such diversity to be based in part on personal pragmatic (practical) considerations to which only each participant has access. Anastasia Scrutton maintains, for example, that when facing religious epistemic conflicts, pragmatic “considerations such as what is at stake are epistemically significant [in that] they can raise or lessen the extent to which your belief is justified or the amount of knowledge you have” (Scrutton 2016, 347). Mikael Stenmark agrees, noting that in situations in which the evidence (that is, the epistemic reasons) are approximately equal, pragmatic reasons can justifiably play an important and at times decisive role (Stenmark 2024, 59).

However, for exclusivists (or anyone) to justify the retention of their beliefs even in part on pragmatic or other subjective factors will seem to some just another way of saying that those with whom exclusivists disagree are not fully their epistemic peers in the sense that they don’t share full access to all the relevant data. While this is not, in and of itself, a non-question begging reason to reject non-objective considerations, to grant that one need not acknowledge that one’s critic is an epistemic peer does challenge the assumption of acknowledged peer conflict on which most current philosophical discussions of disputes over religious beliefs are based.

5. Religious Diversity and Religious Tolerance

Religious intolerance, defined as the practice of keeping others from acting in accordance with their religious beliefs, is not new. However, there is justifiable concern worldwide over the increasing amount, and increasingly violent nature, of such behavior. Accordingly, there is understandably a continuing interest in fostering religiously tolerant environments in which individuals with differing religious perspectives can practice their faiths unencumbered at international, national, and local levels. However, will acknowledged religious diversity lead to tolerance? Moreover, even if it does, is tolerance sufficient to achieve positive, productive interaction among adherents to different faith perspectives? Or do we need some level of religious understanding to achieve this end?

For our purposes, to be tolerant of those with different religious perspectives is to allow them to hold and practice their beliefs free from interference or harassment. To have understanding is to learn about and comprehend the practices and beliefs of those with differing religious perspectives.

We will focus first on the question of whether the acknowledgment of, and subsequent reflection on, religious diversity might lead to greater religious tolerance. While many philosophers continue to emphasize the importance of religious tolerance in the face of diversity, Philip Quinn’s argument supporting the claim that acknowledged diversity can foster tolerance is a good starting point for considering whether it is reasonable to believe this might occur (Quinn 2001, 2002, 2005a). Quinn maintains that (1) serious reflection on the undeniable reality of religious diversity will necessarily weaken people’s justification for believing that their religious perspective is superior to the perspectives of others and that (2) this weakened justification can, and hopefully will for some, lead to greater religious tolerance—will, for example, lead to a more accepting, less confrontational attitude toward those with differing religious perspectives.

Both contentions have been challenged. Considering first Quinn’s claim that reflection on the acknowledged reality of religious diversity reduces individuals’ justified confidence in the superiority of their position, we have already seen in our discussion of religious diversity and epistemic obligation (Section 3) that some philosophers maintain that exclusivists need not grant that their competitors are actually on an equal epistemic footing and are, thus, justified in continuing to maintain that their perspective is superior without further reflection. Moreover, we saw in our discussion of religious diversity and justified belief (Section 4) that some philosophers agree with Alston that exclusivists can grant that those with whom they differ on religious beliefs are epistemic peers while justifiably continuing to hold their beliefs with the same degree of confidence.

Quinn’s second contention—that weakened justification in the superiority of a perspective has the promising potential for fostering religious tolerance—has also been challenged. For instance, William Hasker questions whether Quinn’s challenge to those who hold firmly to the superiority of their religious perspectives—that the reality of religious diversity requires that they hold their perspectives less firmly—will have the effect Quinn intended. It was Quinn’s hope that those challenged in this fashion would “soften” their exclusivistic convictions and thus be less likely to engage in intolerant behavior. However, might not just the opposite occur? Might not those told that the reality of religious diversity reduces their justified confidence in their beliefs feel threatened and thus, in an attempt to “stand up for the truths” they still firmly believe, become even more intolerant of those with other perspectives (Hasker 2008)? Others will agree with Bassam Al-Mannai that at least at the national and international levels, “the presence of diversity, whether religious or ethnic, has little to do with tolerance. It’s rather the case that the racist ideologies followed by absolute leaders cause friction to occur” (Al-Mannai 2006, 87).

Even if we assume that acknowledged religious diversity will lead to religious tolerance—a more peaceful coexistence—is that sufficient? Dirk-Martin Grube argues that whatever the value of tolerance in the political realm, tolerance “underdetermines a robust interreligious dialogue” since if I simply “tolerate the religious Other, I do not learn from her. Nor do I consider her beliefs to be a reason to reflect on my own beliefs in a self-critical fashion” (Grube 2019, 187). It is only if we move to a level of understanding that we will engage in the type of interreligious dialog that will lead to fruitful, respectful interaction.

Several well-known commentators on the relationship between religious tolerance and understanding, including Martha Nussbaum (Nussbaum 2012), Karen Armstrong (Armstrong 2010, 2014), and Tariq Modood (Modood 2013), are even more specific. They agree that tolerance alone is insufficient since it often lacks meaningful engagement among those holding diverse perspectives on religious issues. It is moving to the level of understanding that has the potential to reduce ignorance, dispel stereotypes, and foster mutual respect, which in turn has the potential to lead to cohesive communities where members respect and support one another.[6]

However, as was noted in the discussion of epistemic obligation in Section 3, it appears to be the case that when confronted with criticisms of, or counter-evidence to, deeply engrained beliefs that have emotional and/or cultural anchoring, one aspect of our default epistemic response is to discredit the source—to challenge the knowledge, motives, and/or character of those with whom we disagree. To the extent this is true, moving from tolerating those with whom we disagree to a form of understanding that includes respect for their beliefs and practices will be more difficult than it might appear would be the case.

6. Religious Diversity and the Eternal Destiny of Humankind

Historically there is one specific “diversity issue” with which many philosophers of religion have been concerned: the question of the eternal destiny of humankind, that is, the question of who can spend eternity in God’s presence—who can obtain salvation.[7]

Those who are salvific religious exclusivists on this question claim that only those who have met the necessary conditions set forth by one religious perspective can spend eternity in God’s presence.[8] Adherents of other religious perspectives, it is acknowledged, can affirm truth related to some or many issues. However, with respect to the question of salvation (one’s eternal destiny), a person must come to understand and adhere to the unique way offered in one religion. Or, to be more specific, as salvific exclusivists see it, the criteria for salvation specified by the one correct religious perspective are both epistemologically necessary in the sense that those seeking salvation must be aware of these conditions for salvation and ontologically necessary in the sense that these conditions must really be met (Peterson et al. 2013, 322).

Within Christianity, these conditions often include acknowledging (confessing) that one’s sinful nature has caused a separation from God, acknowledging that this separation can only be repaired through the atoning work of Christ, and then asking God to forgive these sins and, based on this act, to be reinstated into a personal relationship with God both now and through eternity. Within Islam, these conditions often include absolute belief in the oneness of Allah, acceptance of the Prophet Muhammad as the final messenger from Allah, acceptance of the truth of and living in accordance with the Quran, and adherence to the additional pillars of Islam. Since salvific exclusivism, in general, requires a conscious understanding of these necessary conditions and a conscious decision to either accept or reject what is required for salvation, exclusivists face questions about (1) the eternal destiny of children (or adults) who die before (or without) having the capacity to accept or reject what is necessary for salvation and (2) the eternal destiny of those who through no fault of their own never became aware of what was necessary for salvation and, therefore, were not able to accept or reject what is required.

There are at least two basic types of salvific exclusivists. Predestinarian exclusivists hold that for those who are aware of the necessary conditions for salvation, God has for God’s reasons predetermined who will be saved and who will not—that is, has predetermined how they will freely (with compatiblistic freedom) respond to what they know is necessary for salvation. The majority of Christian predestinarians hold that those who will never become aware of the necessary conditions for salvation have not been predestined to be saved and thus will spend eternity apart from God (Piper 2010; Henry 1991). Some Muslim predestinarians agree (Aijaz 2024, 12–13).

Predestinarian salvific exclusivists differ on the eternal destiny of those who die in childhood. Those Christians in the Augustinian tradition maintain that all will spend eternity apart from God; those in the Roman Catholic tradition tie salvation for children who die to the sacrament of baptism; and those in the Reformed tradition maintain either that only the deceased children of believers are allowed to enter heaven or that some or all of these children may be predestined to spend eternity with God. Muslim predestinarian salvific exclusivists also differ on this question.

Universal access exclusivists hold that all will have the opportunity to understand what is necessary to attain salvation and freely make (with indeterministic freedom) the decision to confess their sins and ask God to reinstate them into a personal relationship with God now and for eternity. Most universal access exclusivists (both Christian and Muslim) maintain that God’s justice and mercy require that children (or adults) who die before (or without) having the opportunity to hear and respond to what is necessary for salvation will spend eternity in God’s presence. Proponents of this view differ on the question of the eternal destiny of those who, through no fault of their own, die without having become aware of what is necessary for salvation. Some Christian universal exclusivists maintain, for example, that while many humans do not have access to knowledge of Christ, all humans do have access to the existence of God as a divine being through experiencing God’s creation and will be judged on the basis of how they respond to this knowledge. This is also a common belief in mainstream Sunni Muslim thought (Aijaz 2024, 11). Other Christian universal exclusivists ground their response on the concept of divine middle knowledge—the belief in this case that God knows counterfactually for each individual how that individual would freely respond if presented with the gospel. William Craig maintains, for instance, that since God is just, “God in His providence has so arranged the world that anyone who would receive Christ has the opportunity to do so” (Craig 1989, 185). Another middle knowledge option is to argue that God counterfactually knows for every person who will never actually hear the necessary conditions for salvation how that person would have responded if this individual had become aware of these conditions and judges the person accordingly (Lake 1975, 43). Still other Christian universal exclusivists maintain that all who die without becoming aware of these conditions will have the opportunity in some manner to understand and respond to these conditions after death (Walls 2015). Finally, some Christian and Muslim universal exclusivists admit they do not know exactly how God will judge those who were never aware of the requirements for salvation but believe that a just and merciful God will treat all in this category fairly (Stott & Edwards 1988; Rahman 1980).

Salvific inclusivists agree with salvific exclusivists that the actual basis on which a person can be reconciled and spend eternity with God is only found in one religion. For example, Christian inclusivists agree that humans can only be reconciled with God because of the atoning act of Christ. Muslim exclusivists emphasize that Allah is the ultimate arbiter of salvation, and no one has eternal life except through His will and mercy.

However, salvific inclusivists do not maintain “that only the believers or practitioners of [the one true religion] during their earthly lives, will be redeemed” (Benton 2020). Salvific inclusivists allow that some adherents of other religions can be saved because of the provisions of the one true religion, even if the individuals in question haven’t made the personal commitments normally stipulated as necessary to appropriate these salvific provisions. Stated in philosophical language, as inclusivists see it, particular salvific events may be ontologically necessary for salvation in the sense that salvation cannot occur without them but not epistemically necessary in the sense that one need not know about or act upon them to be saved or liberated (Moser 2011; Peterson et al. 2013, 334).

For example, Christian inclusivists maintain that Christians need not be aware of the atoning act of Christ, confess one’s sins, and ask for forgiveness to become reconciled to Christ and spend eternity in God’s presence. Muslim inclusivists don’t insist that a person must believe in the oneness of Allah, accept the Prophet Muhammad as the final messenger from Allah, accept the truth of and live in accordance with the Quran, and adhere to the additional pillars of Islam to spend eternity in Paradise.

With respect to the question of whether religions other than the one true religion can offer pathways to salvation, those sometimes labeled restrictive salvific inclusivists hold that while an individual need not be aware of the one true pathway for reconciliation to utilize this pathway to access reconciliation, no other religion offers a sufficient pathway to access this salvific reconciliation (Pinnock 1992). Most salvific inclusivists, however, are non-restrictive (sometimes referred to as pluralistic) inclusivists on this question in that they hold that while salvation (reconciliation with God) is only possible because of the pathway for reconciliation found in one religion, other religions may serve as imperfect but sufficient pathways to access salvific reconciliation with God (D’Costa 2022). For instance, a non-restrictive salvific inclusivistic Muslim would hold that following the Christian path to salvation may serve as an imperfect but sufficient pathway to eternal reconciliation with God and vice versa. In the words of Muslim inclusivist V.A. Mohamad Ashrof, there are deep roots in the Islamic tradition that “distinguish ‘Islam’ (capital ‘I’)—the historical, institutionalized faith revealed to Muhammad—and ‘islam’ (small ‘i’)—the universal, primordial faith of submission to God’s will that transcends specific religious traditions” and “this distinction allows inclusivists to assert that non-Muslims, through their respective beliefs, may also submit to God’s will and, thus, attain salvation” (Ashrof 2024).

Probably the best-known Christian proponent of non-restrictive inclusivism is Karl Rahner. Christianity, he argues, cannot recognize any other religion as providing the source of salvation, and Christianity is the normative and most complete path to salvation. However, other religions can serve as imperfect means through which individuals can encounter God’s grace and respond to the divine will. Just as adherents to pre-Christian Judaism were able, through the redemptive acts of Jesus of which they were not aware, to enter God’s presence, so, too, is it possible for adherents of other religions to enter God’s presence, even though they do not acknowledge the necessary redemptive acts of Jesus Christ that makes this possible (Peterson et al. 2013, 334–335). Since God is love and desires everyone to be saved, God can apply the results of Jesus’s atoning death and resurrection to everyone, even to those who have never heard of Jesus and his death or have never acknowledged his lordship. Rahner used the term “anonymous Christian” for non-Christians who unknowingly appropriate the salvific work of Christ.

All salvific inclusivists, like some exclusivists, maintain that children and those adults without the capacity to understand the true path to salvation will when they die be in God’s presence eternally due to God’s justice and mercy. With respect to those who have the capacity to follow the true path but die without knowledge of this true path, inclusivists differ on the conditions “anonymous Christians” must meet to receive salvific grace. Some, like Rahner, maintain all have some innate knowledge of God and the freedom to establish a relationship with God and, therefore, that the eternal destiny of those in this category is dependent on the extent to which they sincerely seek truth and respond to their inner moral conscience—on the extent to which they commit as much as they know of themselves to as much as they know of God through, or even apart from, a religion other than Christianity. Other inclusivists are not as specific, maintaining only that, because God is just, there will surely be some adherents of other religions or no religion at all who will be in God’s presence because they have met some set of divine conditions they have it within their power to meet. All agree, though that these “anonymous Christians” are the recipients of divine grace.

But what of those who have become aware of what is required for reconciliation with God in the true path to salvation but have not done what is necessary for such reconciliation —for example, what of those who become aware of the opportunity for reconciliation with God through Christ’s atoning act or the conditions for salvation in Islam but choose not to do what is required for such reconciliation. While all exclusivists clearly hold that these individuals will not receive salvific reconciliation, the inclusivistic response to those who are aware of the true path to salvation but do not choose to follow it is more complicated. Some make a distinction between willful and circumstantial rejection. They maintain that while willful, informed rejections of this true path might well prohibit salvific reconciliation with God (Erickson, 1983), the fact that someone has chosen not to follow the path to salvific reconciliation of which this person is seemingly aware doesn’t mean that this person truly understands what this path is, based on cultural, historical, or psychological barriers, and thus doesn’t mean that this person will not spend eternity with God. That is a judgment only a just but merciful God can make.

Morteza Mutahhari is a proponent of Muslim salvific inclusivism who makes this distinction. He maintains that non-Muslims are at a disadvantage because it is the Islamic Divine Law that leads people to God. Those who fully understand this law (Islam) but choose not to accept the truth will be damned. However, in accordance with Islamic jurisprudence, God will be merciful to those who seek the truth but from whom, through no fault of their own, the reality of Islam remains hidden. Such people cannot be called unbelievers; they are rather “dispositional Muslims” since it is possible to possess the requisite spirit of submission without being Muslim in name. These individuals will receive the divine grace necessary to achieve salvation from Hell (Mutahhari 2006; see also Legenhausen 1997 [1999]).

Salvific pluralists, however, find such reasoning no more convincing than that offered by salvific exclusivists. Inclusivists are right, pluralists grant, to say that individuals need not necessarily know of or fulfill certain requirements specified in a given religion to attain salvation. However, salvific inclusivists, like salvific exclusivists, are wrong to argue that salvation is, itself, possible only because of certain conditions or events described in the one true religion. There is no one true religion and, therefore, no single path to eternal existence with God. Stated differently, there are multiple valid paths to salvation, with no single religious tradition holding exclusive or privileged access to it; people from different faiths can achieve salvation fully within their own traditions.

It’s important to note that to be a salvific pluralist does not prohibit an individual from identifying with or worshipping within a given religious tradition – for example, Christianity or Islam. Nor does it prohibit an individual from identifying strands of thought within a given religious tradition that support pluralism – see Yaser Ellethy (2022) for a good example of this within Islam. To be a salvific pluralist requires only that one believes that no one religious tradition has privileged access to salvation but rather that the paths to salvation within various religious traditions, including those traditions that one might not happen to identify with, are of equal salvific efficacy.

The best-known and most influential variation of salvific pluralism is unitary pluralism, which holds that all religions “are, or can be, equal and valid paths to the one divine reality” (D’Costa 2022, Section 3), a divine reality that is characterized in different ways in various religions. A more recent but significant form of salvific pluralism is pluriform pluralism, which holds that there is no single divine reality underlying all religious traditions but, rather, multiple, distinct paths to different divine realities in various religions. Stated differently, pluriform salvific pluralism holds that different religions may be accessing different divine realities or “gods” through their practices, implying a plurality of divine realities rather than a single one (D’Costa 2022).

John Hick is the most influential proponent of unitary salvific pluralism. Hick has never denied that the major world religions—Christianity, Hinduism, Buddhism, Islam—make conflicting truth claims. In fact, he believes that “the differences of belief between (and within) the traditions are legion” and has often discussed these conflicts in great detail (Hick 1983, 487). His basic pluralistic claim, rather, is that such differences are best seen as differing ways in which differing cultures have conceived of and experienced the one ultimate divine Reality. Each major religious perspective “constitutes a valid context of salvation/liberation; but none constitutes the one and only such context” (Hick 1984, 229, 231).

Hick’s main argument for his position is what he sees as the reality of transformation parity. An efficacious salvific process changes lives in the sense that it begins to turn people from thinking about, and acting only to enhance, their own personal well-being to viewing themselves as responsible participants in a much greater, more expansive reality. And all the evidence we have, Hick maintains, shows that many religions are equally transformational, given any general standard for positive transformation we might want to consider (Hick 2004, chapter 3).

There continues to be debate, however, over whether there is an objective basis for claiming that the same basic personal transformation actually does occur within various religions—over whether there is real transformational parity. Also, it appears that individuals making a “secular” (non-religious) commitment to some goal, value, or metaphysical perspective—be it a concern for the environment, world hunger, or emotional health—often have their lives transformed in ways quite similar to the ways in which the lives of religious believers are transformed. If this is so, however, then might it not be that the religious transformational parity we observe is simply a subset of the general transformational parity we find among individuals who commit themselves to any perspective on life that centers reality outside of self, and thus that it is just as plausible to assume that all religious transformational parity is the result of some form of internal conceptual realignment rather than the result of some form of connection with an external divine reality (Clark 1997)?

Hick also argues that a credible religious hypothesis must account for the fact, of which “we have become irreversibly aware in the present century, as the result of anthropological, sociological, and psychological studies and the work of philosophy of language,” that there is no one universal and invariable pattern for the interpretation of human experience, but rather a range of significantly different patterns or conceptual schemes “which have developed within the major cultural streams.” When considered in this light, a “pluralistic theory becomes inevitable” (Hick 1984, 232).

While no one denies that culture shapes reality to some extent, it can again be argued, as noted in Sections 3 and 4, that when comparing the plausibility of specific beliefs, we must consider not only these specific beliefs themselves but also the basic background beliefs in which they are embedded. Thus, even if we grant that a pluralistic response to the obvious shaping power of culture is preferable to any exclusivistic response when such shaping power is considered in isolation, it is not clear that exclusivists must acknowledge that Hick’s hypothesis is so strong that it renders implausible the whole set of basic background beliefs out of which the exclusivist’s response to the profound shaping influence of culture on religious belief arises. It appears, rather, that exclusivists can justifiably reject Hick’s contention that a pluralistic cultural/religious interpretation of reality must inevitably be considered superior.

Others have questioned why Hick has selected only the paths offered by the world’s “great religions” as ways to salvation? For Hick, the answer lies in the fact that, unlike “Satanism, Nazism, the Order of the Solar Temple, etc.,” the world’s great religions offer paths that lead us away from “hatred, misery, aggression, unkindness, impatience, violence, and lack of self-control” to love, joy, peace, patience, kindness, goodness, faithfulness, gentleness, and self-control (Hick 1997b, 164). Some, though, see this sort of ethical standard for acceptable salvific perspectives to be as arbitrary as the standard for acceptable paths to salvation set forth by exclusivists or inclusivists (Meeker 2003). In fact, some have questioned whether, given this rather specific ethical criterion for assessing the salvific adequacy of religions, Hick’s perspective should actually be considered pluralistic at all.

Pluriform salvific pluralist Mark Heim also argues that unitary pluralists such as Hick are really inclusivists in disguise in that they advocate only one path to salvation— for example, the transformation from self-centeredness to reality-centeredness—and thus, in essence, deny that diverse religions have real, fundamental salvific differences. A better, more honest salvific pluralism, we are told, is to acknowledge that each religion has its own path to salvation that may be either similar to or different from that of other religions. That is, a more honest pluralistic perspective is to deny that the seemingly different salvific paths offered by various religious traditions are all just culturally distinct manifestations of the same fundamental path and maintain instead that salvific paths of various religions remain incompatible, but equally valid ways to achieve salvation (Heim 1995).

Other pluriform pluralists include theologian Raimon Panikkar, whose concept of “cosmotheandric reality” (the interconnectedness of the divine, human, and cosmic dimensions of reality) supports differing understandings of how to access and understand the divine in various religious traditions without assuming that all these paths to the divine ultimately lead to one divine reality (Panikkar 1973, 1987).

Some might argue, though, that while this variation of pluralism does seem to do justice to the concern raised in Section 1 that philosophy of religion ought to focus more on the distinctions found in various religions rather than trying to highlight only that which they have in common, pluriform pluralism’s focus on the equal validity of paths to the divine that affirm seemingly inconsistent understandings of divine reality—e.g., incompatible claims about the nature of self in an afterlife—make it difficult to address questions about the ultimate nature of reality in a non-relativistic manner.

Others wonder whether this seeming disagreement between unitary and pluriform pluralists is in one key sense primarily a difference in focus. Pluriform pluralists like Heim can appear to be bypassing the question of whether there is some sort of final, ultimate eschatological salvific state that the proponents of various religious perspectives will all experience, emphasizing rather that many distinct religious paths can liberate people (produce salvation) here and now (Peterson et al. 2013, 333). Unitary pluralists like Hick, on the other hand, seem most concerned with the nature of the final eschatological state all will experience while not denying that there exist in this world differing ways that remain distinct to access this ultimate salvific experience.

7. Religious Diversity in Public Education

Public education in Western culture has always been to some extent a “melting pot.”[9] However, the increasing number of students with non-Western cultural values and religious traditions is causing public school educators to grapple in new and sometimes uncomfortable ways with the challenges such diversity poses. Some of these challenges are practical—e.g., should Muslim girls be allowed to wear hijabs, should schools designate only Christian religious holy days as school holidays, and how should educators respond to political efforts to favor one religion? The focus of this section, however, will be a pedagogical question of growing interest in the philosophy of education: How ought the increasing religious diversity to which students are exposed affect public school curricula?

Assuming the separation of church and state, it can initially appear non-problematic to stipulate guidelines for addressing religion in the public school classroom. Educators should encourage “student awareness of religions, but not acceptance of a particular religion; studying about religion, but not practicing religion; exposing students to a diversity of religious views, but not imposing any particular view; and educating students about all religions, but not promoting or denigrating religion” (Moore 2010, 1). However, as we will see, educators sometimes differ on the application of these distinctions to specific pedagogical questions.

Most public school educators do agree that increasing student understanding of diverse religious perspectives can have significant positive social outcomes. It is often argued, for instance, that helping students better understand the increasing diversity, including religious diversity, they face will better prepare them to live in a peaceful, productive, less prejudicial environment with those with differing cultural and/or religious values (Kunzman 2006; Rosenblith, 2017). In fact, some have gone so far as to say such understanding “is necessary for effective and engaged citizenship in an interconnected and diverse nation and world” (College, Career, and Civic Life 2013, 92).

Many educators, however, want to go further. It is also important, they maintain, for students to clarify their feelings about other religions and their followers. Specifically, they want to foster a more empathetic understanding of other religious perspectives, an understanding that encourages students to appreciate other religions from the perspective of an adherent of that religion (Kunzman 2006;Tinklenberg, 2020).

While few challenge this as a valid goal, there is, though, continuing controversy over one common method by which educators sometimes attempt to engender this type of empathy in students. As some see it, an impactful way to help develop an empathetic understanding of other religions is to have students directly experience these religions in some way—for instance, have students visit a local mosque or have a representative from a Hindu Temple share with students in a class.

Not surprisingly, while no one denies that these forms of direct experience might broaden a student’s empathetic understanding of a religion, concerns have been raised. First, some believe that having students experience a religion, even as “observers,” can test the limits of the separation of church and state. While the intent of having students attend a mosque or having a Buddhist talk with students is seldom to “promote” a religion, the line between “exposure” and intended or unintended promotion (or even proselytization), they maintain, is a fine one. This is especially the case given the widely varying communication skills and deeply embedded values and preconceptions of the teacher and/or the representatives of a given religion with whom students might interact. Second, there is a continuing ethical concern that to experience a religion as an observer might in some cases trivialize or demean the religion in question. Some Native Americans, for instance, continue to be concerned with the desire of “outsiders” to seek an understanding of their religion(s) by watching or experiencing sacred ceremonies since such observation, they believe, can trivialize these ceremonies (Kasprisin 2003, 422; Taliman 1993).

Is it justifiable for the public school educator to go even further than disseminating accurate information and attempting to engender an empathetic understanding of other religions? Is it justifiable to attempt to bring it about that all students affirm a core set of “appropriate” beliefs about other religions and their adherents?

It is clearly the case that almost all public school educators currently do attempt to bring it about that students hold certain beliefs related to pervasive human characteristics, such as race, gender, and disabling conditions. Students are encouraged, for instance, to continue to believe, or come to believe, that engaging in intolerant or discriminatory behavior is wrong and that they should affirm, or come to affirm, the inherent worth and rights of the disabled, those of other racial/ethnic backgrounds, etc. Therefore, if the desire is simply to also encourage students to believe it wrong to treat those of other religions in intolerant or discriminatory ways and to believe it right to accept those of other religions as persons with equal inherent value, few will object.

However, need teachers stop there? Might there not be other beliefs about religions and their adherents that public school educators can justifiably attempt to bring about that all students accept? We can extrapolate from the work on religious diversity by Robert Wuthnow to introduce two beliefs that some might propose fit into this category. As Wuthnow sees it, the most appropriate response to the increasing religious diversity we face in the United States is what he labels “reflective pluralism” (Wuthnow 2005, 286–307). To engage in this sort of reflection, he tells us, is not simply to become better informed, or to strive to “live peacefully with those with whom one disagrees” (be tolerant), or even to attempt to develop an empathetic understanding of diverse religions. It is at the very least (1) to recognize that since all of our beliefs, including our religious beliefs, depend on a point of view “shaped by the culture in which we live,” we should not regard our “own position[s] as inherently superior” and (2) to promote “a principled willingness to compromise” in the sense that we must be willing to move out of our social and emotional comfort levels “in order to arrive at a workable relationship with another person” (Wuthnow 2005, 292).

The benefit of this form of engagement, we are told, is not only that it can minimize the likelihood of the sorts of “religious tensions, conflicts, and violence [that] have been so much a part of human history” (Wuthnow 2005, 293). Such reflective engagement also allows us to focus on “the shared concerns for basic human dignity” found in the teachings of many of the world’s religions, which can furnish a basis for inter-religious cooperation to combat social ills and meet basic social needs (Wuthnow 2005, 294).

It is important to note that Wuthnow does not explicitly claim or deny that encouraging students in a public school setting to become reflective pluralists would be appropriate. However, he not only highlights two increasingly popular pluralistic claims about religion—(1) that the beliefs of many religions are equally valid expressions of faith, expressions that adherents of these religions should be allowed or even encouraged to maintain and (2) that religious believers of all faiths should identify and focus on what these religions have in common—he highlights what such pluralists often note as the main benefits of widespread affirmation of these beliefs: a reduction in violent religious conflicts and an increase in socially beneficial inter-religious cooperation. These outcomes are clearly quite compatible with what we have seen to be a key reason why public-school educators want to increase student understanding of other religions—namely, their desire to better prepare students to live in a peaceful, productive manner in social contexts that will increasingly be characterized by religious diversity. Accordingly, since it seems reasonable to believe that widespread acceptance of the validity of diverse religious perspectives and increased focus on the commonalities in diverse religions might well result in more peaceful, mutually beneficial interaction among followers of diverse religions, the question of whether public school teachers can justifiably attempt to bring it about that students affirm the beliefs in question appears worthy of exploration.

Let’s first consider the contention that many religions contain equally valid expressions of faith. Even if we accept the debatable assumption that this is true, it will understandably not be clear to many that public school teachers could justifiably attempt to bring it about that their students believed this to be so. The problem is that various religions affirm conflicting doctrinal beliefs on significant issues. For example, while conservative Christians maintain that one must affirm certain beliefs about the saving power of Christ to spend eternity in God’s presence, conservative Muslims strongly deny this. Orthodox Christians and Muslims are taught not only that the sacred scriptures of other religions contain false beliefs; they are often encouraged to try to convert those of other religions to their religious perspective. And while many Muslims, Christians, and Jews believe in a personal supernatural creator and personal immortality, some Buddhists deny both. In short, the problem here, as stated by Stephen Prothero, is that “one of the most common misconceptions about the world’s religions is that they plumb the same depths, ask the same questions. They do not” (Prothero 2010, 24). If this is so, it appears that educators can justifiably attempt to convince students that all religions are equally valid expressions of faith only if educators can justifiably attempt to convince conservative proponents of some of these religions that some of their core doctrinal beliefs need to be modified or rejected. However, attempting to do this in a public school setting will be seen by many as violating the prohibition against both restricting the free exercise of religion and promoting a given religion (Basinger 2011).

Might it not, though, at least be justifiable for a public school educator to encourage students to respect the right of adherents to other religions to retain their current religious beliefs? If we interpret this as asking whether an educator can justifiably encourage students to not attempt to prohibit adherents to other religions from expressing and acting in accordance with their beliefs, a positive response is noncontroversial since this is only to say once again that educators should encourage students to be tolerant of others. However, to encourage respect for the religious beliefs of others often carries with it the explicit or implicit assumption that it is inappropriate, if not unethical, to attempt to convince adherents of one religion to convert to another. For a public-school educator to attempt to convince all students that it is wrong to proselytize will again be seen by some as placing this educator in the legally and morally questionable position of attempting to convince some students to reject or modify what for them is a very fundamental, core religious belief.

Perhaps, however, there is a different, less controversial option for those educators who want to do more than simply encourage tolerance of expression and empathetic understanding. Is it not at least justifiable for the public school teacher to attempt to point out the important common values affirmed by most of the world’s major religions, values that we can all accept and should all desire to see lived out? Is it not justifiable for an educator to point out, for instance, that most of the world’s major religions prohibit such things as killing, lying, stealing, dehumanizing racism, and sexual exploitation, and that these same religions encourage such things as helping those in need and treating adherents of other religions with respect? To do so, it has been argued, would not simply be of value within the classroom or community. Since religious convictions clearly influence social, political, and economic activity on a global scale, emphasizing the shared common values of religions has the potential to facilitate better global relationships. And to encourage such relationships is surely an appropriate goal of public education (Haynes 2007; Shingleton 2008).

Some concerns have been raised even here. First, the values of various religions are embedded in various cultures, and there are often differing cultural understandings of these values – for example, differing understandings of what it means for humans to have personal social or political freedom, what it means to care for those in need, etc. In other words, we must be aware that in some cases seeming commonality in values may be in name only (Prothero 2010). Second, some argue that this approach can lead to a superficial, homogenized understanding of religions that can prevent students from respecting the distinctiveness of each religious tradition and thus failing to fully appreciate the unique contributions each has made (Skrefsrud 2023; Ilosvay 2016). Finally, some will see any focus on “positive commonalities” as yet another thinly veiled inappropriate attempt to encourage students to modify or water down their current religious beliefs in ways that make such beliefs more accommodating of other religious perspectives. Still others, though, will not see these concerns as reasons not to expose students to the “positive commonalities” in various religions but, rather, as cautionary factors to keep in mind when doing so.

8. Conclusion

As we have seen, discussions of religious diversity do not lend themselves to easy answers. The issues are many, the arguments complex, and the responses varied. It would be hard, though, to overstate the practical significance of this topic. While some (many) issues that philosophers discuss have practical implications for how we view ourselves and treat others, none is more relevant today than the question of religious diversity. Religious convictions have not only motivated impassioned behavior in the past—behavior that has affected significantly the lives of many—such convictions clearly continue to do so today. So ongoing philosophical discussions of religious diversity that clarify issues and assess varying perspectives have the potential to be of great practical value.

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Other Important Works

  • Ahmad, Saiyad F., and Ahmad, Saiyad S., 2004, God, Islam, and the Skeptic Mind: A Study on Faith, Religious Diversity, Ethics, and the Problem of Evil, 2nd edition, Berlin: Blue Nile Publishing.
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  • Baker-Hytch, Mathew, 2014, “Religious Diversity and Epistemic Luck”, International Journal for Philosophyof Religion, 76: 171–191.
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  • Christenson, David, 2009, “Disagreement as Evidence: The Epistemology of Controversy”, Philosophy Compass, 5: 756 –767.
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  • Dastmalchian, Amir, 2013, “The Epistemology of Religious Diversity in Contemporary Philosophy of Religion”, Philosophy Compass, 8: 298–308.
  • De Cruz, Helen, 2019, Religious Disagreement (Cambridge Elements Philosophy of Religion), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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  • Kraft, James, 2006, “Philip Quinn’s Contribution to the Epistemic Challenge of Religious Diversity”, Religious Studies, 42: 453–465.
  • –––, 2011, The Epistemology of Religious Disagreement: A Better Understanding, London: Palgrave Macmillan, chapter 4.
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