George Santayana

First published Mon Feb 11, 2002; substantive revision Mon Sep 23, 2024

Philosopher, poet, literary and cultural critic, George Santayana is a principal figure in Classical American Philosophy. His naturalism and emphasis on creative imagination were harbingers of important intellectual turns on both sides of the Atlantic. He was a naturalist before naturalism grew popular; he appreciated multiple perfections before multiculturalism became an issue; he thought of philosophy as literature before it became a theme in American and European scholarly circles; and he managed to naturalize Platonism, update Aristotle, fight off idealisms, and provide a striking and sensitive account of the spiritual life without being a religious believer. His Hispanic heritage, shaded by his sense of being an outsider in America, captures many qualities of American life missed by insiders, and presents views equal to Tocqueville in quality and importance. Beyond philosophy, only Emerson may match his literary production. As a public figure, he appeared on the front cover of Time (3 February 1936), and his autobiography (Persons and Places, 1944) and only novel (The Last Puritan, 1936) were the best-selling books in the United States as Book-of-the-Month Club selections. The novel was nominated for a Pulitzer Prize, and Edmund Wilson ranked Persons and Places among the few first-rate autobiographies, comparing it favorably to Yeats’s memoirs, The Education of Henry Adams, and Proust’s Remembrance of Things Past. Remarkably, Santayana achieved this stature in American thought without being an American citizen. He proudly retained his Spanish citizenship throughout his life. Yet, as he readily admitted, it is as an American that his philosophical and literary corpuses are to be judged. Using contemporary classifications, Santayana is the first and foremost Hispanic-American philosopher.

1. Biography

Santayana’s heritage is rooted in the Spanish diplomatic society with its stress on high education and familiarity with the world community. He was born in Madrid, Spain, on 16 December 1863. His father, Agustín Santayana, was born in 1812. The father studied law and practiced for a short time before entering the colonial service for posting to the Philippines. While studying law, Agustín served an apprenticeship to a professional painter of the school of Goya and a number of his paintings remain in the private possession of the family. He translated four Senecan tragedies into Spanish, wrote an unpublished book about the island of Mindanao, had an extensive library, and made three trips around the world. In 1845, he became the governor of Batang, a small island in the Philippines. He took over the governorship from the recently deceased José Borrás y Bofarull, who was the father of Josefina Borrás, later to become Agustín’s wife in 1861 and the mother of George Santayana. His mother, Josefina Sturgis (formerly Josefina Borrás y Carbonell), was born in Scotland and was the daughter of a Spanish diplomat. Previously she married George Sturgis (d. 1857), a Boston merchant, whose early death left her alone with children in Manila. There were five children from this first marriage, three of whom survived infancy. She promised her first husband to raise the children in Boston where she moved her family. During a holiday in Spain, Josefina met Agustín again, and they were married in 1861. He was fifty years of age and she was probably thirty-five. In 1863, Santayana was christened Jorge Agustín Nicolás Ruiz de Santayana y Borrás. His half sister, Susan, insisted that he be called “George,” after her Boston father. Santayana, in turn, always referred to his sister in the Spanish, “Susana.”

1863–1886. Santayana lived eight years in Spain, forty years in Boston, and forty years in Europe. In his autobiography, Persons and Places, Santayana divides his life into three phases. The background (1863–1886) encompasses his childhood in Spain through his undergraduate years at Harvard. The second period (1886–1912) is that of the Harvard graduate student and professor with a trans-Atlantic penchant for traveling to Europe. The third period (1912–1952) is the retired professor writing and traveling in Europe and eventually establishing Rome as his home.

The family moved from Madrid to Ávila where Santayana spent his boyhood. In 1869, Santayana’s mother left Spain in order to raise the Sturgis children in Boston, keeping her pledge to her first husband. In 1872, his father realized the opportunities for his son were better in Boston, and he moved there with his son. Finding Boston inhospitable, puritanical, and cold, the father returned alone to Ávila within a few months. The separation between father and mother was permanent. In 1888 Agustín wrote to Josefina: “When we were married I felt as if it were written that I should be reunited with you, yielding to the force of destiny. Strange marriage, this of ours! So you say, and so it is in fact. I love you very much, and you too have cared for me, yet we do not live together” (Persons and Places, 9).

Until his father’s death (1893), Santayana regularly corresponded with his father and he visited him after Santayana’s first year at Harvard College. In Boston, Santayana’s family spoke only Spanish in their home. Santayana first attended Mrs. Welchman’s Kindergarten to learn English from the younger children, then he was a student at the Boston Latin School, and he completed his B.A. and Ph.D. at Harvard College (1882–1889), including eighteen months of study in Germany on a Walker Fellowship. His undergraduate years at Harvard reveal an energetic student with an active social life. He was a member of eleven organizations including The Lampoon (largely as a cartoonist), the Harvard Monthly (a founding member), the Philosophical Club (President), and the Hasty Pudding.

Some scholars conclude that Santayana was an active homosexual based on allusions in Santayana’s early poetry (McCormick, 49–52) and Santayana’s association with known homosexual and bisexual friends. Santayana provides no clear indication of his sexual preferences, and he never married. Attraction to both women and men seems apparent in his undergraduate and graduate correspondence. The one documented comment about his homosexuality occurs when he was sixty-five. After a discussion of A. E. Housman’s poetry and homosexuality, Santayana remarked, “I think I must have been that way in my Harvard days — although I was unconscious of it at the time” (Cory, Santayana: The Later Years, 40). Because of Santayana’s well-known frankness, many scholars consider Santayana a latent homosexual based on this evidence.

1886–1912. Santayana received his Ph.D. from Harvard in 1889 and became a faculty member at Harvard University (1889–1912) and eventually a central figure in the era now called Classical American Philosophy. He was a highly respected and popular teacher, and his students included poets (Conrad Aiken, T. S. Eliot, Robert Frost, Wallace Stevens), journalists and writers (Walter Lippmann, Max Eastman, Van Wyck Brooks), professors (Samuel Eliot Morison, Harry Austryn Wolfson), a Supreme Court Justice (Felix Frankfurter), many diplomats (including his friend Bronson Cutting), and a university president (James B. Conant). He retired from Harvard in 1912 at the age of forty-eight and lived the remainder of his life in England and Europe, never returning to the U.S. and rejecting academic posts offered at a number of universities, including Harvard, Columbia, and Cambridge.

Santayana cherished academic life for its freedom to pursue intellectual interests and curiosity, but he found that many aspects of being a professor infringed on that freedom. Faculty meetings and university committees seemed primarily to be partisan heat over false issues, so he rarely attended them. The general corporate and businesslike adaptation of universities was increasingly less conducive to intellectual development and growth. He expressed concern about the evolving Harvard goal of producing muscular intellectuals to lead America as statesmen in business and government. Were not delight and celebration also a central aspect of education? He wrote to a friend in 1892, expressing the hope that his academic life would be “resolutely unconventional” and noted that he could only be a professor per accidens, saying that “I would rather beg than be one essentially” (GS to H. W. Abbot, Stoughton Hall, Harvard, 15 February 1892. Columbia).

In 1893, Santayana experienced a metanoia, a change of heart. Gradually he altered his style of life from that of an active student turned professor to one focused on the imaginative celebration of life. In doing so, he began planning for his early retirement, finding university life increasingly less conducive to intellectual pursuits and delight in living. Three events preceded his metanoia: the unexpected death of a young student, witnessing his father’s death, and the marriage of his sister Susana. Santayana’s reflections on these events led to the ancient wisdom that acceptance of the tragic leads to a lyrical release. “Cultivate imagination, love it, give it endless forms, but do not let it deceive you. Enjoy the world, travel over it, and learn its ways, but do not let it hold you … . To possess things and persons in idea is the only pure good to be got out of them; to possess them physically or legally is a burden and a snare (Persons and Places, 427–28).”

Increasingly, naturalism and the lyrical cry of human imagination became the focal points of Santayana’s life and thought. Pragmatism, as developed by Peirce and James, was an undercurrent in his naturalism, particularly as an approach to how we ascertain knowledge, but there are aspects of his naturalism more aligned with European and Greek thought that presage developments in the late twentieth century. His naturalism had its historical roots primarily in Aristotle and Spinoza and its contemporary background in James’s pragmatism and Royce’s idealism. His focus on and celebration of creative imagination in all human endeavors (particularly in art, philosophy, religion, literature, and science) is one of Santayana’s major contributions to American thought. This focus, along with his Spanish heritage, Catholic upbringing, and European suspicion of American industry, set him apart in the Harvard Yard.

Santayana’s strong interest in literature and aesthetics is evident throughout this early period, but by 1904, his attention turned almost fully to philosophical pursuits. During this period his publications include: Lotze’s System of Philosophy (dissertation), Sonnets and Other Verses (1894), The Sense of Beauty (1896), Lucifer: A Theological Tragedy (1899), Interpretations of Poetry and Religion (1900), A Hermit of Carmel, and Other Poems (1901), The Life of Reason (five books, 1905–1906), Three Philosophical Poets: Lucretius, Dante, and Goethe (1910).

In May 1911, Santayana formally announced his long-planned retirement from Harvard. President Lowell asked him to reconsider. By now Santayana was a highly recognized philosopher, cultural critic, poet, and teacher, and his desire to be free from academic confinement was also well known. Lowell indicated he was open to any arrangement that provided Santayana the time he desired for writing and for travel in Europe. Initially Santayana agreed to alternate years in Europe and the U.S., but in 1912, his resolve to retire overtook his sense of obligation to Harvard. The year before his retirement, he had presented at least six lectures at a variety of universities including Berkeley, Wisconsin, Columbia, and Williams. His books were selling well and his publishers were asking for more. Two major universities were courting him. At forty-eight, he left Harvard to become a full-time writer and to escape the academic professionalism that nurtured a university overgrown with “thistles of trivial and narrow scholarship.”

1912–1952. As Santayana sailed for Europe, his mother died, apparently of Alzheimer’s disease. Always attentive to his family, Santayana visited her weekly, then daily, during his last years at Harvard. Knowing his mother’s death was imminent, he arranged for Josephine, his half sister, to live in Spain with Susana, who previously had married a well-to-do Ávilan. An inheritance of $10,000 from his mother, coupled with his steady income from publications and his early planning, made retirement easier. He arranged for his half brother, Robert, to manage his finances with the agreement that upon Santayana’s death, Robert or his heirs would receive the bulk of Santayana’s estate. Hence, in January 1912, at age forty-eight, Santayana was free from the constraints of university regimen and expectations and, more importantly, free to write, to travel, and to choose his residence and country.

Santayana’s book publications after leaving Harvard is remarkable: Winds of Doctrine (1913), Egotism in German Philosophy (1915), Character and Opinion in the United States (1920), Soliloquies in England and Later Soliloquies (1922), Scepticism and Animal Faith (1923), Dialogues in Limbo (1926), Platonism and the Spiritual Life (1927), the four books of The Realms of Being (1927, 1930, 1938, 1940), The Genteel Tradition at Bay (1931), Some Turns of Thought in Modern Philosophy (1933), The Last Puritan (1935), Persons and Places (1944), The Middle Span (1945), The Idea of Christ in the Gospels (1946), Dominations and Powers (1951), and My Host the World (1953, posthumous).

Harvard attempted to bring him back to the United States, offering him several professorships beginning in 1917. As late as 1929, he was offered the Norton Chair in Poetry, one of Harvard’s most respected chairs. In 1931, he received an invitation from Brown University, and Harvard later asked him to accept the William James Lecturer in Philosophy, a newly established honorary post. But Santayana never returned to Harvard or to America. Believing that the academic life was not a place for him to cultivate intellectual achievement or scholarly work, Santayana also refused academic appointments both at Oxford University and Cambridge University.

At first, Santayana planned to reside in Europe, and after numerous exploratory trips to several cities, he decided on Paris. However, while he was in England, World War I broke out and he was unable to return to the mainland. First, he lived in London and then primarily at Oxford and Cambridge. After the war, he was more of a traveling scholar, and his principal locales included Paris, Madrid, Ávila, the Riviera, Florence, and Rome. By the late 1920s, he settled principally in Rome, and during the summers, he often retreated to Cortina d’Ampezzo in Northern Italy to write and to escape the heat. Because of his success as a writer, he assisted friends and scholars when they found themselves in need of financial support. For example, when Bertrand Russell was unable to find a teaching post in the U.S. or England because of his views regarding pacifism and marriage, Santayana displayed a characteristic generosity in his plan to make an anonymous gift to Bertrand Russell of the $25,000 royalty earnings from The Last Puritan, at the rate of $5,000 per year, in the letter to George Sturgis (15 July 1937). Despite the fact that he and Russell disagreed radically both politically and philosophically, his memory of their earlier friendship and his regard for Russell’s genius moved him to compassion for Russell’s financial plight.

The rise of Mussolini in the 1930s initially seemed positive to Santayana. He viewed the Italian civil society as chaotic and thought Mussolini might bring order where needed. But Santayana soon noted the rise of a tyrant. Trying to leave Italy by train for Switzerland, he was not permitted to cross the border because he did not have the proper papers. With most of his funds coming from the United States and England, his case was complicated by his Spanish citizenship and his age. He returned to Rome, and on 14 October 1941 he entered the Clinica della Piccola Compagna di Maria, a hospital-clinic run by a Catholic order of nuns, where he lived until his death eleven years later. This arrangement was not unusual. The hospital periodically received distinguished guests and cared for them in an assisted-living environment. Santayana died of cancer on 26 September 1952.

Santayana asked that he be buried in unconsecrated ground, affirming his naturalism to the end. However, the only such cemetery ground in Rome was reserved for criminals. The Spanish Consulate at Rome would not permit Santayana to be buried in such a place and provided the “Panteon de la Obra Pia espanola” in the Campo Verano cemetery as a suitable burial ground, turning it into a memorial for the lifelong Spanish citizen. At the graveside, Daniel Cory read lines from Santayana’s “The Poet’s Testament,” a poem affirming his naturalistic outlook:

I give back to the earth what the earth gave,
All to the furrow, nothing to the grave.
The candle’s out, the spirit’s vigil spent;
Sight may not follow where the vision went.

In the United States, Wallace Stevens commemorated his teacher in “To an Old Philosopher in Rome.”

Total grandeur of a total edifice,
Chosen by an inquisitor of structures
For himself. He stops upon this threshold,
As if the design of all his words takes form
And frame from thinking and is realized.

2. Philosophy, Literature, and Culture

Throughout his life, Santayana’s literary achievements are evident. As an eight-year-old Spaniard, he wrote Un matrimonio (A Married Couple), describing the trip of a newly married couple that meets the Queen of Spain. Later in Boston, he wrote a poetic parody of The Aeneid; “A Short History of the Class of ‘82”; and “Lines on Leaving the Bedford St. Schoolhouse.” His first book, Sonnets and Other Verses (1894), is a book of poems, not philosophy. And, until the turn of the century, much of his intellectual life was directed to the writing of verse and drama. He was a principal figure in making modernism possible but was not a modernist in poetry or literature. His naturalism and emphasis on constructive imagination influenced both T. S. Eliot and Wallace Stevens. Eliot’s notion of the “objective correlative” is drawn from Santayana, and Stevens follows Santayana in his refined naturalism by incorporating both Platonism and Christianity without any nostalgia for God or dogma.

Santayana was among the leaders in transforming the American literary canon, dislodging the dominant Longfellow, Lowell, Whittier, Holmes, Bryant canon. Santayana’s essay “The Genteel Tradition in American Philosophy” (presented to the Philosophical Union of the University of California in 1911) greatly affected Van Wyck Brooks’s America’s Coming-of-Age, a book that set the tone for modernism. Brooks drew on Santayana’s essay, adapting Santayana’s idea of two Americas to fit his notion of an America split between highbrow and lowbrow culture.

By the turn of the century, Santayana’s interests largely centered on his philosophical inquiries, and although he never abandoned writing poetry, he no longer considered it his central work. Even so, some of his most moving poetry came later and was inspired by the trench warfare and casualties of World War I: “A Premonition: Cambridge, October, 1913”; “The Undergraduate Killed in Battle: Oxford, 1915”; “Sonnet: Oxford, 1916”; and “The Darkest Hour: Oxford, 1917.” Throughout his life, even near death, he recited and translated long fragments of Horace, Racine, Leopardi, and others.

The relationships between literature, art, religion and philosophy are prominent themes throughout Santayana’s writings. The Sense of Beauty (1896) is a primary source for the study of aesthetics. Philip Blair Rice wrote in the foreword to the 1955 Modern Library edition: “To say that aesthetic theory in America reached maturity with The Sense of Beauty is in no way an overstatement. Only John Dewey’s Art as Experience has competed with it in the esteem of philosophical students of aesthetics and has approached its suggestiveness for artists, critics and the public which takes a thoughtful interest in the arts.” Santayana’s groundbreaking approach to aesthetics is emphasized in Arthur Danto’s “Introduction” to the 1988 critical edition. Danto writes that Santayana brings “beauty down to earth” by treating it as a subject for science and giving it a central role in human conduct, in contrast to the preceding intellectualist tradition of aesthetics. “The exaltation of emotion and the naturalization of beauty — especially of beauty — imply a revolutionary impulse for a book it takes a certain violent act of historical imagination to recover” (Sense of Beauty, xxviii). This naturalistic approach to aesthetics is expanded in his philosophical explication of art found in The Life of Reason: Reason in Art (1905).

In 1900, Santayana’s Interpretations of Poetry and Religion develops his view that religion and poetry are expressive celebrations of life. Each in its own right is of great value, but if either is mistaken for science, the art of life is lost along with the beauty of poetry and religion. Science provides explanations of natural phenomena, but poetry and religion are festive celebrations of human life born of consciousness generated from the interaction of one’s psyche (the natural structure and heritable traits of one’s physical body) and the physical environment. As expressions of human values, poetry and religion are identical in origin. Understanding the naturalistic base for poetry and religion and valuing their expressive character enable one to appreciate them without being hoodwinked: “poetry loses its frivolity and ceases to demoralise, while religion surrenders its illusions and ceases to deceive” (172). Interestingly, his father expressed similar views in his letters to his son, providing the genesis of his son’s reflections, and this conclusion is expressed as late as the 1946 publication of The Idea of Christ in the Gospels where Santayana presents the idea of Christ as poetic and imaginative, contrasted with attempts at historical, factual accounts of the Christ figure. The impact of Santayana’s view was significant, and Henry James (after reading Interpretations of Poetry and Religion) wrote that he would “crawl across London” if need be to meet Santayana.

Three Philosophical Poets (1910) was the first volume of the Harvard Studies in Comparative Literature. Santayana employs a naturalistic account of poetry and philosophy, attempting to combine comparative structures with as few embedded parochial assumptions as possible while making explicit our material boundness to particular worlds and perspectives. His analyses of Lucretius, Dante, and Goethe are described by one biographer as “a classical work and one of the few written in America to be genuinely comparative in conception and execution, for its absence of national bias and its intellectual, linguistic, and aesthetic range” (McCormick, 193).

Initially, Santayana appears optimistic about the youthful America. In his Berkeley lecture, “The Genteel Tradition in American Philosophy,” he declared “the American Will inhabits the sky-scraper; the American Intellect inhabits the colonial mansion.” (“The Genteel Tradition in American Philosophy,” Triton Edition, vol. VII. P. 129.) European transcendentalism and Calvinism are the American intellectual traditions, but they no longer suit the American drive for success in industry, business, and football. Hence, the youthful willfulness of the country has outrun the old wits, but there remains a chance for wisdom and energy to be coupled in a future coherent and rich tradition, and he sees the beginnings of such a tradition in James’s pragmatism.

Within a decade, he is less optimistic. Character and Opinion in the United States (1920) is his valediction to America. It includes frank, intellectual portraits of his Harvard colleagues and of American culture. From his residence in Cambridge, he praises the English emphasis on social cooperation and personal integrity and contrasts them with America where “You must wave, you must cheer, you must push with the irresistible crowd; otherwise you will feel like a traitor, a soulless outcast, a deserted ship high and dry on the shore … . This national faith and morality are vague in idea, but inexorable in spirit; they are the gospel of work and the belief in progress. By them, in a country where all men are free, every man finds that what most matters has been settled beforehand” (211).

Santayana’s standing as a literary figure reached its zenith with the publication of The Last Puritan (1936). The Last Puritan is Santayana’s only novel, and it was an international success. It was compared positively with Goethe’s Wilhelm Meister, Pater’s Marius, and Mann’s The Magic Mountain. Its provenance lies in the 1890s when Santayana began a series of sketches on college life that, broadened through his experience and travel, resulted in The Last Puritan. Essentially, it is about the life and early death of an American youth, Oliver Alden, who is sadly restricted by his Puritanism. Santayana draws a sharp contrast with the European Mario, who delights in all matters without a narrow moralism. Mario is a carefree, naturally gifted and likeable young man who by American standards appears too focused on the peripheral aspects of life: travel, opera, love affairs, and architecture. And the American perspective is embodied in the tragic hero, Oliver Alden, who is the last Puritan. He does what is right, based on his duties to his family, school, and friends. Life is a slow, powerful flow of tasks and responsibilities. He is intelligent and knows there is more than obligation, and he senses his guilt at not being able to achieve the natural abundant life, but knowing this only nourishes his Puritanism and causes him to feel guilty about being guilty. In a charming scene in the novel, Oliver introduces Mario to Professor Santayana at Harvard. Oliver is a dedicated student and football player, thoroughly a first rate American taking matters seriously and doing his best. After only a short visit with the Professor, Mario, it is decided by Santayana, does not need to take a course from the Professor. Mario already has the natural, instinctual approach of a cultivated person. Oliver, on the other hand, knows he must work to achieve his goal, which will be only a succession of goals, and ends tragically. Santayana’s Hispanic and Catholic background play a central role in his critique of American life: too bound by past traditions and obligations that are not understood or rooted in one’s own culture.

The fear that Santayana’s autobiography would be lost or destroyed during World War II, led Scribner’s, the publisher, to conspire with the U.S. Department of State, the Vatican, and the Spanish government to bring the manuscript of the first part (Persons and Places) out of Rome sub rosa, despite the Italian government’s refusal to allow any mail to the U.S. The manuscript for the second part (The Middle Span, 1945) also was conveyed surreptitiously to New York. The third part (My Host the World, 1953) was published after Santayana’s death. His autobiography provides the basis for understanding the development of his philosophy

3. Development of Santayana’s Philosophy

In his autobiography, Persons and Places, Santayana describes the development of his thought as a movement from the idealisms of boyhood to the intellectual materialism of a traveling student, and finally to the complete, naturalistic outlook of the adult Santayana. He emphasizes the continuity of his life and beliefs, contrasting what may appear to be disparate views with the overall unity of his thought: “The more I change the more I am the same person” (Persons and Places, 159).

As a young man of the nineteenth century, he was influenced by the idealism of the age and of his age, but he claims to have always been a realist or naturalist at heart.

But those ideal universes in my head did not produce any firm convictions or actual duties. They had nothing to do with the wretched poverty-stricken real world in which I was condemned to live. That the real was rotten and only the imaginary at all interesting seemed to me axiomatic. That was too sweeping; yet allowing for the rash generalisations of youth, it is still what I think. My philosophy has never changed. (Persons and Places, 167)

Hence he notes, that in spite “of my religious and other day-dreams, I was at bottom a young realist; I knew I was dreaming, and so was awake. A sure proof of this was that I was never anxious about what those dreams would have involved if they had been true. I never had the least touch of superstition” (Persons and Places, 167). Santayana cites poems, “To the Moon” and “To the Host,” written when he was fifteen or sixteen, as revealing this early realism, and he quotes from memory one stanza of “At the Church Door” where the realistic sentiment is the same (Persons and Places, 169).

By the time he was a traveling student seeing the world in Germany, England, and Spain his “intellectual materialism” was firmly established with little change in his religious affections.

From the boy dreaming awake in the church of the Immaculate Conception, to the travelling student seeing the world in Germany, England, and Spain there had been no great change in sentiment.

I was still “at the church door”. Yet in belief, in the clarification of my philosophy, I had taken an important step. I no longer wavered between alternative views of the world, to be put on or taken off like alternative plays at the theatre. I now saw that there was only one possible play, the actual history of nature and of mankind, although there might well be ghosts among the characters and soliloquies among the speeches. Religions, all religions, and idealistic philosophies, all idealistic philosophies, were the soliloquies and the ghosts. They might be eloquent and profound. Like Hamlet’s soliloquy they might be excellent reflective criticisms of the play as a whole. Nevertheless they were only parts of it, and their value as criticisms lay entirely in their fidelity to the facts, and to the sentiments which those facts aroused in the critic. (Persons and Places, 169)

The full statement and development of his materialism did not occur until later in his life. It was certainly in place by the time of Scepticism and Animal Faith (1923) but not fully so at the time of The Life of Reason (1905). The influence of the Harvard philosophers, particularly James and Royce is evident in Santayana’s thought, but he was hardly a mere follower and often advanced his philosophy more along European and Greek lines rather than the American tradition, which he thought was both too derivative and too tied to the advancement of business and capitalism.

The move from Harvard marked not only a geographical shift but a philosophical one as well. Henry Levinson in Santayana, Pragmatism, and the Spiritual Life provides a well-balanced account of this gradual but distinctive move from the Harvard philosophical mentality. Leaving Harvard also meant that Santayana abandoned the view of a philosopher as a public, philosophical statesman and of language as being representative. This philosophical turn placed makes him a forerunner of many issues in the next two centuries. Removing himself, literally and philosophically, from the American scene, Santayana increasingly came to believe that the “brimstone” sensibility of pragmatism was wrong-headed (Character and Opinion in the United States, 53). A major aspect of this sensibility was the view that philosophers must be engaged fundamentally in social and cultural policy formulation, and if they are not, they are not pulling their civic weight. In this fashion, Santayana believes the pragmatists came to belie “the genuinely expressive, poetic, meditative, and festive character of their vocation” (Levinson,165). A condition that James took seriously in his “On a Certain Blindness in Human Beings,” suggesting that the world of practical responsibility fosters a blindness to multiplural ways of living that can only be escaped by catching sight of “the world of impersonal worths as such” — “only your mystic, your dreamer, or your insolent loafer or tramp can afford so sympathetic an occupation” (James, Talks to Teachers on Psychology and to Students on Some of Life’s Ideals, 141). Interestingly, America’s imperialistic actions toward the Philippines during the Spanish-American War sparked James’ remarks; this was a war that had a much deeper ancestral and historical aspect for Santayana and led to his poem, “Young Sammy’s First Wild Oats.” Whether connected or not, Santayana later came to identify himself as an intellectual vagabond or tramp, not isolated in the specific perspectives of an ideology, hosted by the world, and devoted to spiritual disciplines that “appear irresponsible to philosophers hoping to command representative or some otherwise privileged authority at the center of society” (Levinson, 167).

Building on his naturalism, institutional pragmatism, social realism, and poetic religion, Santayana on leaving Harvard moves even farther from the role of philosophical statesman by removing the representative authority of language from the quest for a comprehensive synthesis, by narrowing the line between literature and philosophy (as he had earlier done between religion and poetry), and by wrestling more with the influence of James than of Emerson. Santayana’s stay in Oxford during the Great War led to his famous counter to Wilson’s war to end all wars: “Only the dead have seen the end of war.” (Soliloquies in England and Later Soliloquies, 102)

Santayana’s message is clear: The epistemological project that Russell’s Problems epitomizes is diseased. The renewed quest to establish unmediated Knowledge of Reality simply leads to “intellectual cramp” (Soliloquies, 216). Philosophy has itself become spiritually disordered by blinding its practitioners from their traditional and proper task, which is to celebrate the good life. If the spiritual disciplines of philosophy are to thrive, philosophers have to take off the bandages of epistemology and metaphysics altogether, accept the finite and fallible status of their knowledge claims, and get on with confessing their belief in the things that make life worth living (Levinson, 204).

Leaving Harvard and America enabled Santayana to develop his naturalism.

4. Naturalism

Scepticism and Animal Faith (1923) introduces Santayana’s mature naturalism. In summary, he maintains that knowledge and belief are not the result of reasoning. They are inescapable beliefs essential for action. Epistemological foundationalism is a futile approach to knowledge. A more promising approach is to discern the underlying belief structures assumed in animal action and imposed by natural circumstances. The foundations for this approach are rooted in Aristotle’s concept of activity and the pragmatic approach to action and knowledge. Explanations of natural events are the proper purview of scientists, while explications of the meaning and value of action may be the proper sphere of historians and philosophers. Even so, both scientific explanations and philosophical explications are based in the natural world. Meaning and value are generated by the interaction of our physical makeup, which Santayana calls “psyche,” and our material environment.

Santayana’s critique of epistemological foundationalism is as unique as his heritage. With Spanish irony, he structures his argument after Descartes’ Meditations but arrives at an anti-foundationalist conclusion. Drawing attention to what is given in an instant of awareness (the smallest conceivable moment of consciousness), he maintains that any knowledge or recognition found in such an instant would have to be characterized by a concept (or “essence” to use Santayana’s term). Concepts cannot be limited to particular instances; rather the particular object is seen as an instance of the concept (essence). Thus, pursuing doubt to its ultimate end, one is confined by the “solipsism of the present moment.” That is, in a single instant of awareness there can be no knowledge or belief, since both require concepts not bounded by a moment of awareness. Hence, the ultimate end of doubt, an instance of awareness, is empty. It is the vacant awareness of a given without a basis for belief, knowledge or action. Santayana concludes that if one attempts to find the bedrock of certainty, one may rest his claim only after he has, at least theoretically, recognized that knowledge is composed of instances of awareness that in themselves do not contain the prerequisites for knowledge, e.g., concepts, universals, or essences. That both skepticism and proofs against skepticism lead nowhere is precisely Santayana’s point.

Philosophy must begin in medias res (in the middle of things), in action itself, where there is an instinctive and arational belief in the natural world: “animal faith.” For Santayana, animal faith is the arational basis for any knowledge claims. It is the nether world of biological order operating through our physical, non-conscious being generating beliefs that are “radically incapable of proof” (Scepticism, 35).

In rising out of passive intuition, I pass, by a vital constitutional necessity, to belief in discourse, in experience, in substance, in truth and in spirit. All these objects may conceivably be illusory. Belief in them however, is not grounded on a prior probability, but all judgements of probability are grounded on them. They express a rational instinct or instinctive reason, the waxing faith of an animal living in a world which he can observe and sometimes remodel. (Scepticism, 308–309)

He describes these prejudices as “animal” in an effort to emphasize our biological base and community. This emphasis is similar to Wittgenstein’s reference to convictions that are beyond being justified or unjustified as “something animal” (On Certainty 359). Ours is a long-standing primitive credulity, and our most basic beliefs are those of an animal creed: “that there is a world, that there is a future, that things sought can be found, and things seen can be eaten” (Scepticism 180).

Santayana (like Hume, Wittgenstein, and Strawson) holds there are certain inevitable beliefs; they are inescapable given nature and our individual physical history. And like Wittgenstein, he maintains that these beliefs are various and variable. They are determined by the interplay between environment and psyche, i.e., between our natural conditions and the inherited, physical “organisation of the animal” (the psyche). That we now inescapably believe in external objects and the general reliability of inductive reasoning, for example, is a result of physical history and the natural conditions of our world and ourselves. Since these beliefs are relative to our physical histories, if our history and biological order had been different, our natural beliefs would also be different.

The environment determines the occasions on which intuitions arise, the psyche — the inherited organisation of the animal — determines their form, and ancient conditions of life on Earth no doubt determined which psyches should arise and prosper; and probably many forms of intuition, unthinkable to man, express the facts and the rhythms of nature to other animal minds (Scepticism, 88).

By displacing privileged mentalistic accounts with his pragmatic naturalism, Santayana challenges then prevailing structures in both American and English philosophies.

Santayana explicates the primary distinguishable characteristics of our knowledge in his four-book Realms of Being. Believing that philosophical terminology should have historical roots, Santayana employed classical terminology for these characteristics: matter, essence, spirit, and truth. And although these terms are central to many philosophical traditions, he views his work as “a revision of the categories of common sense, faithful in spirit to orthodox human tradition, and endeavouring only to clarify those categories and disentangle the confusions that inevitably arise …” (Realms 826).

Within Santayana’s naturalism, the origins of all events in the world are arbitrary, temporal, and contingent. Matter (by whatever name it is called) is the principle of existence. It is “often untoward, and an occasion of imperfection or conflict in things.” (Realm of Matter, v) Hence, a “sour moralist” may consider it evil, but, according to Santayana, if one takes a wider view “matter would seem a good … because it is the principle of existence: it is all things in their potentiality and therefore the condition of all their excellence or possible perfection.” (Realm of Matter, v) Matter is the non-discursive, natural foundation for all that is. In itself, it is neither good nor evil but may be perceived as such when viewed from the vested interest of animal life. Latent animal interests convert matter’s non-discernible, neutral face to a smile or frown. But “moral values cannot preside over nature.” (Realm of Matter, 134) Principled values are the products of natural forces: “The germination, definition, and prevalence of any good must be grounded in nature herself, not in human eloquence.” (Realm of Matter, 131) From the point of view of origins, therefore, the realm of matter is the matrix and the source of everything: it is nature, the sphere of genesis, the universal mother.

“Essence” is Santayana’s term for concepts and meanings. He draws on Aristotle’s notion of essence but removes all capacities for producing effects. An essence is a universal, an object of thought, not a material force. However, consciousness of an essence is generated by the interaction of a psyche and the material environment. Hence, matter remains as the origin of existence and the arena of action, and the realm of essence encompasses all possible thought.

“Truth,” if some disinterested observer could ascertain it, would constitute all the essences that genuinely characterize the natural world and all activities within it. Since all living beings have natural interests and preferences, no such knowledge of truth can exist. All conscious beings must ascertain belief about truth based on the success of actions that sustain life and permit periods of delight and joy.

Santayana uses the term “spirit” to mean consciousness or awareness. As early as 19 April 1909, Santayana wrote to his sister that he was writing a brand new system of philosophy to be called “The realms of Being” — “not the mineral vegetable and animal, but something far more metaphysical, namely Essence, Matter, and Consciousness. It will not be a long book, but very technical.” When the book was published in the 1930s, he had added his notion of truth and substituted “spirit” for “consciousness.” From his perspective, the substitution did not alter the meaning of consciousness but rather captured an entire tradition of philosophical and religious inquiry as well as borrowed associated ideas from eastern religions. But to the consternation of traditional views, many found the identity of spirit with consciousness a troublesome idea. And so they should, for with this identity Santayana removes the spiritual from the field of agency as well as from being an alternative way of living. Santayana’s approach is therefore in direct contrast with those who think of spirit as causing action or as fostering a particular lifestyle. Following the tracks of Aristotle, he makes the spiritual life one form of culminating experiences arising from fulfilling activity.

Awareness evolved through the natural development of the physical world, and he demurs to scientific accounts for explanations of that development. Almost poetically, he sees spirit as emerging in moments of harmony between the psyche and the environment. Such harmony is temporary, and the disorganized natural forces permit spirit to arise “only spasmodically, to suffer and to fail. For just as the birth of spirit is joyous, because some nascent harmony evokes it, so the rending or smothering of that harmony, if not sudden, imposes useless struggles and suffering” (Birth of Reason, 53). Accepting the world’s insecure equilibrium enables one to celebrate the birth of spirit. Reasoning, particularly reasoning associated with action, is a signal of the nascent activities of the psyche working to harmonize its actions with the environment, and if successful, reason permits individual and social organization to prosper while spirit leads to the delight of imagination and artistry.

Some commentators characterize Santayana as an epiphenomenalist, and there are some commonalities, specifically the view that spirit is not efficacious. But there also are considerable differences. Santayana does not characterize his view as one-way interactionism, primarily because he does not think of spirit as an object to be acted upon. Spirit is rather a distinguishable aspect of thought, generated in activity, and may be viewed more as a relational property. Santayana sometimes speaks of spirit and essence as supervening on material events. But lacking the distinctions of contemporary philosophy, it is difficult to characterize Santayana’s philosophy of mind accurately. His view of consciousness is more celebrational, as opposed to being a burden or eliciting action. Spirit is “precisely the voice of order in nature, the music, as full of light as of motion, of joy as of peace, that comes with an even partial and momentary perfection in some vital rhythm” (Birth of Reason, 53).

Santayana’s account of spirit and essence may lead one to wonder how Santayana can be included as a pragmatist, and this classification is accurate only if one includes an extended notion of pragmatic naturalism. For Santayana, explanations of human life, including reason and spirit, lie within the sciences. The nature of truth simply is correspondence with what is, but since humans, nor any other conscious being, are able to see beyond the determinant limits of their nature and environment, pragmatism becomes the test of truth rather than correspondence. In short, the nature of truth is correspondence while the test of truth is pragmatic. If an explanation continues to bear fruit over the long run, then it is accepted as truth until it is replaced by a better explanation. In this, Santayana’s account of pragmatic truth is more closely aligned with Peirce’s conception than that of James or Dewey, including a tripartite account of knowledge consisting of the subject, symbol, and object. Pragmatism is properly focused on scientific inquiry and explanations, and it is severely limited, even useless, in spiritual and aesthetic matters. Pragmatism is rooted in animal life, the need to know the world in a way that fosters successful action. If all life were constituted only by successful or unsuccessful activities, one’s fated circumstances would govern. But consciousness makes liberation possible and brings delight and festivity in material circumstances.

Santayana’s anti-foundationalism, non-reductive materialism, and pragmatic naturalism coupled with his emphasis on the spiritual life and his view of philosophy as literature anticipated many developments in philosophy and literary criticism that occurred in the latter half of the twentieth century, and these served as a challenge to the more humanistic naturalisms of John Dewey and other American naturalists. These views also provide the foundation for his view of ethics, political philosophy, and the spiritual life.

5. Ethics, Politics, and the Spiritual Life

Santayana’s moral philosophy is based on his naturalism. Most commentators classify Santayana as an extreme moral relativist who maintains that all individual moral perspectives have equal standing and are based on the heritable traits and environmental circumstances of individuals. This naturalistic approach applies to all living organisms. Nature does not establish a moral hierarchy of goods between animal populations nor between individual animals. However, this same moral relativism is also the basis for Santayana’s claim that the good of individual animals is clear and is subject to naturalistic or biological investigation.

Two tenets of his ethics are (1) the forms of the good are diverse, and (2) the good of each animal is definite and final. The moral terrain of animals, viewed from a neutral perspective, places all animal interests and goods as equal. Each good stems from heritable physical traits and is shaped by adaptations to the environment. Concluding that the “forms of the good are divergent,” Santayana holds that the good for each animal may differ, depending on the nature of the psyche and the circumstances, and may be different for an individual animal in different times and environments. There is no one good for all, or even for an individual.

Seen as a whole, animal goods are not logically or morally ordered, they are natural, morally neutral forces. But no living being can observe all interests with such neutrality. Situated in a particular place and time with heritable traits, all living beings have interests originating from their physiology and physical environment. For Santayana, one may reasonably note that a neutral observer could view all moral perspectives as equal, but such a view must be balanced by the understanding that no animal stands on neutral ground. There is a polarity between the ideal neutral, objective understanding of behavior on the one hand and the committed and vested interest of particular living beings on the other hand. One may recognize that every animal good has its own standing, and one may respect that ideal, but “the right of alien natures to pursue their proper aims can never abolish our right to pursue ours” (Persons and Places, 179).

Santayana’s second moral insight is that for each animal the good is definite and final. There are specific goods for each animal depending on the specific heritable traits and interests of the psyche and on the specific circumstances of the environment. Self-knowledge, then, is the distinguishing moral mark. The extent to which one knows one’s interests, their complexity and centrality, will determine whether one can achieve a good life, provided the environment is accommodating. Santayana’s philosophy rests on his naturalism and on his humane and sympathetic appreciation for the excellence of each life. But from the perspective of autobiography, Santayana’s clear notion of self-knowledge, in the sense of the Greeks, is his most distinguishing mark. For Santayana, “integrity or self-definition is and remains first and fundamental in morals …” (Persons and Places 170).

Self-knowledge requires a critical appreciation of one’s culture and physical inheritance, and the ability to shape one’s life in streams of conflicting goods within oneself and within one’s community. Although this position is common to many considerations of political philosophy, Santayana’s approach to politics was much more conservative than that normally associated with the founders of American pragmatism, such as James and Dewey.

Santayana’s political conservatism is founded on his naturalism and his emphasis on self-realization and spirituality. He is concerned that liberal democracy may not provide a consistent basis for individual freedom and spirituality. The twin fears of private anarchy and public uniformity are the grounds for his criticisms of democracy, and his account of social justice focuses on the individual rather than the society. Santayana’s inattentiveness to social inequality is perhaps understandable in the context of his naturalism where the final cause is the “authority of things.” His basic contention that individual suffering is the worse feature of human life, not social inequality, causes him to focus more on the natural dilemmas of the individual rather than on social action. Coupling this argument with the view that all institutions, including governments, are inextricably rooted in their culture and background perhaps makes it understandable that he would not readily see how particular views of social inequality could be transferred readily from one culture to another. In addition, Santayana’s European and particularly Spanish background influenced his attitudes toward social action. His repeated “Latin” perspective caused him to look with considerable suspicion toward forcing Anglo-Saxon outlooks on other cultures. Yet, in individual matters he was remarkably forthcoming as when he provided financial support to numerous friends, often of quite different philosophical, literary, and political persuasions than his own.

Within the natural order every living entity stands on the same natural ground bathing equally in the impartial light of nature. No one can claim a central place above others. But each entity also has an embodied set of values, and the art of life is to structure one’s environment in such a fashion as to best realize those embodied values, i.e., to place in harmony the natural forces of one’s life and one’s environment.

American democracy has an exacting challenge. Lacking the time to live in the mind, Americans use quantity as a justification for lack of quality in their achievements. Quantity is potentially infinite and assures unrivaled busy-ness, but is it worth it? No, according to Santayana, if self-realization is the goal of individual life. Of course, circumstances make it difficult, perhaps impossible, for some individuals to order their lives reasonably and attain the practical wisdom to achieve individual happiness. America’s economic success would appear to make this possible for many, but to succeed Americans must abandon servility to mechanism and economics. What is needed is a life made free by a recovery of the capacity to have a vision of the good life (Persons and Places, xxxiv). According to Santayana, the fanatic is a person who has lost sight of their goals and redoubled their efforts. To supplant this busy, blind, relentlessly quantitative existence, we must regain sight of our goals. Individual life should be structured in light of those goals.

Santayana’s focus is on the individual, and the role of the state is to protect and to enable the individual to flourish. The goal is not something far off to be worked toward. It is not a task to be accomplished and then supplanted by another task, as is often the case with American enterprise does. Rather it is the celebration of life in its festivities. It is Aristotle’s practical wisdom: structuring individual life as it is, living it joyfully, and assuring that one’s commitments are conducive to the delights of the intellect and consistent with the demands of the time and tradition. It is the exercise of one’s free choice, shaping one’s life through material well-being, but doing so to appreciate the poetic, dramatic quality of our own existence. To rush through life and die without the joy of living, that is the tragedy of American life.

For some, though perhaps not for many, the spiritual life will be an organizing good. The cultural background for the spiritual life is the religious life, primarily as found within the Catholic Church and informed by the late nineteenth century and early twentieth century accounts of Eastern religions. But Santayana is not interested in an historical or doctrinal explication of the elements of traditional religion, rather the philosophical task is to discern the elements giving rise to such traditional views, and, in his own case, to explicate the aspects of these origins without the dogmatism of traditional religious belief.

Introducing the concept of a spiritual life led some to see an inherent conflict between Santayana’s life of reason and the spiritual life. In a letter to Milton Karl Munitz (23 July 1939), Santayana explains the different perspectives of the life of reason and the spiritual life:

I admit gladly that religion (= the “Spiritual life”) is a natural interest, to be collated within the life of reason with every other interest; but it is an interest in the ultimate, an adjustment to life, death, science, and politics; and though cultivated specially by certain minds at certain hours, it has no moral or natural claim to predominance. The races and ages in which it is absent will inevitably regard it as unnecessary and obstructive, because they tend to arrange their moral economy without religion at all. Those to whom religion is absorbing (e.g., the Indians) will on the contrary think a moral economy inferior in which no place and no influence is given to the monition of ultimate facts. I think you would not find my two voices inharmonious (I agree that they are different in pitch) if you did not live in America in the XXth century when the “dominance of the foreground” is so pronounced. The dominance of the distance or background would impose a different synthesis. (Works, v. 5, book 6, 254)

If the spiritual life was considered a dominating or guiding influence in structuring one’s life, the way Santayana views reason, then one would be forced to choose between the life of reason and the life of the spirit as a monk or a nun must choose between the life of the world and that of the religious order. But for Santayana, no such conflict exists; spirituality is not choosing a way of living over an extended period of time. Indeed, any effort to choose such a life would be short lived, since the spiritual life is a life of receptivity to all that comes in the moment while suspending animal interests. Suspending one’s specific natural interests, such as eating or sleeping, for any extended period would be both detrimental and tragic.

Consciousness essentially is only awareness, an attention to what is given, rather than being an instrument in reshaping the world. Consciousness, emerging late in the evolutionary pathway, is a flowering of happy circumstances that celebrates what is given, and when truly recognized, does only that. It is joyful, delighting in what is presented, and not troubled by where it leads or what it means. This is not to restate Santayana’s view poetically but rather to convey that Santayana characterizes consciousness, itself, as poetic rather than as a means to an action or as a way of implementing an action. The more dower, moralistic, and evangelical aspects of religion he saw as confused efforts to make religion a science, a social club, or a political movement. Spirit, or consciousness, is momentary, fleeting, and depends on the physical forces of our bodies and environment in order to exist. Shaping one’s life to enhance these spiritual, fleeting moments, extending them as long as is practical, is one of the delights of living for some people, but it is certainly not a goal for all, nor should it be.

Bibliography

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Complete Works

The Works of George Santayana, Martin A. Coleman (Director and Editor), David Spiech (Textual Editor), Marianne S. Wokeck (Senior Editor), Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr. (Founding and Consulting Editor), Cambridge, MA and London: The MIT Press. The volumes are as follows:

  • Volume I (1986), Persons and Places: Fragments of Autobiography, edited by William G. Holzberger and Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr., Introduction by Richard C. Lyon.
  • Volume II (1988), The Sense of Beauty: Being the Outlines of Aesthetic Theory, edited by William G. Holzberger and Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr., Introduction by Arthur Danto.
  • Volume III (1989), Interpretations of Poetry and Religion, edited by William G. Holzberger and Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr., Introduction by Joel Porte.
  • Volume IV (1994), The Last Puritan: A Memoir in the Form of a Novel, edited by William G. Holzberger and Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr. Introduction by Irving Singer.
  • Volume V (2001–2008), The Letters of George Santayana, edited by William G. Holzberger and Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr.
    • Book One: [1868]–1909, published 2001.
    • Book Two: 1910–1920, published 2002.
    • Book Three: 1921–1927, published 2002.
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    • Book Five: 1933–1936, published 2003.
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Selected Translations

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  • Il senso della Bellezza, Guiseppe Patella, translator, Palermo: Aesthetica Edizioni, 1997.
  • El Sentido de la belleza, Carmen García Trevijano, translator, Madrid: Editorial Tecnos, 1999.
  • Personas y lugares: fragmentos de autobiografia, Pedro García Martín, translator, Madrid: Editorial Trotta, 2002.
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