1. These are questions addressed by a number of researchers, including Piter Bijma, Austin Booth, Pierrick Bourrat, Robert Brandon, Ellen Clarke, Richard Dawkins, Ford Doolittle, Devin Drown, John Dupré, Marcus Feldman, Andy Gardner, Scott Gilbert, Peter Godfrey-Smith, Charles Goodnight, Alan Grafen, James Griesemer, Paul Griffiths, William Hamilton, David Hull, Ben Kerr, Philip Kitcher, Richard Lewontin, Elisabeth Lloyd, Sandra Mitchell, Maureen O’Malley, Samir Okasha, Alex Rosenberg, Eugene Rosenberg, Ayelet Shavit, Deborah Shelton, John Maynard Smith, Subrena Smith, Elliott Sober, Kim Sterelny, Elisabeth Vrba, Michael Wade, Ken Waters, Stuart West, George C. Williams, David S. Wilson, Edward O. Wilson, William Wimsatt, Sewall Wright, Ilana Zilber-Rosenberg, and others cited in these references, among many others in both philosophy and biology.

2. It was then argued that the force of this distinction between replicator and interactor had been underappreciated, that the question about interactors should more accurately be called the “levels of selection” debate to distinguish it from, the “units of selection debate” title, about replicators (Brandon 1982; Mitchell 1987).

3. Philosophical and biological work on units of selection and the definitions of individuality and the term “organism”, is sometimes overlapping. For some recent work, see esp. Maynard Smith & Szathmáry 1995; Queller & Strassmann 2009, 2016; Gilbert, Sapp, & Tauber 2012; Herron 2017; Clarke 2016; Lidgard & Nyhart 2017; Dupré & O’Malley 2013; Ereshefsky & Pedroso 2013; Love et al. 2018; Michod & Roze 1999, 2001; Nicholson & Dupré 2018; Godfrey-Smith 2013; Meincke & Dupré 2020; O’Malley & Powell 2016; Okasha 2018; Pradeu 2016a,b; Rees, Bosch, & Douglas, 2018; Michod 1999; S. E. Smith 2017; Sterner 2015; R.A. Wilson, Barker, & Brigandt 2007.

4. Their tool, contextual analysis, was not meant to answer units questions theoretically, but rather, explicitly through its empirical application (contra Bourrat 2022). Moreover, such statistical tools do not divvy up the relevant populations, as Bourrat seems to demand; the tools do not do the science, they require scientists to apply them intelligently (see §4.6). Damuth and Heisler insist that:

determining whether any valid possible unit of selection is or is not at any moment functioning as one is a problem for empirical investigation. (Damuth & Heisler 1988: 409)

5. Replicators were originally described using two orthogonal distinctions. A “germ-line” replicator, as distinct from a “dead-end” replicator, is “the potential ancestor of an indefinitely long line of descendant replicators” (Dawkins 1982a: 46). For instance, DNA in a chicken’s egg is a germ-line replicator, whereas that in a chicken’s wing is a dead-end replicator. Note that DNA are, but chickens are not, replicators, since the latter do not replicate themselves as wholes. An “active” replicator is “a replicator that has some causal influence on its own probability of being propagated”, whereas a “passive” replicator is never transcribed and has no phenotypic expression whatsoever (Dawkins 1982a: 47). There is special interest in active germ-line replicators, “since adaptations ‘for’ their preservation are expected to fill the world and to characterize living organisms” (Dawkins 1982a: 47). See §2.2.

6. At the birth of the “interactor” concept, the concept of “evolvers” was also introduced, which are the entities that evolve as a result of selection on interactors: called lineages (Hull 1980). They can be seen to be playing a role in considering the question of what entity “owns” or manifests an adaptation and who benefits from evolution by selection (see §2.3 and §2.4; compare Okasha’s “Type1-Agents”, 2018; discussion ).

7. See also significant discussion in: Bolker 2000; Brandon 1999; Sterelny 2004; Gilbert 2020a,b; Watson & Szathmáry 2016; O’Malley, Brigandt, et al. 2014; Wagner 2015, 2016; Love 2016; Love et al. 2018; Godfrey Smith 2009; Hall 1994; McKenna et al. 2021; Oyama, Gray & Griffiths, 2003. We will discuss this development further in §4.5 below.

8. See, e.g., Wade 1977, 1978, 2016; Wimsatt 1980a,b; Brandon & Burian 1984; Wade & Goodnight 1998; Gould 2002.

9. Contextual analysis, an application of partial regression analysis (see details in, e.g., Boyd & Iversen 1979, §4.1), has become the most widely used method in experimental and field studies of multilevel selection that support theoretical frameworks involving interactor evolution, esp. of the Evolutionary Change school (Goodnight 2015; Wade 2016). It has a strong theoretical basis, as a generalization of the “selection gradient” method (Lande & Arnold 1983) to structured populations (S. Wright 1931; Lloyd 1988 [1994]: Ch 4: “Structured Populations”; Wade 2016; Wolf et al. 2000). The latter method distinguishes traits that are simply correlated, from traits that have a causal relationship with fitness.

Contextual analysis extends this method to include not just individual characters in the comparison, but also group context, in the multiple regression analysis of fitness:

The partial regression coefficients associated with the group characters estimate the ability of specific group properties to account for variance in individual fitness in excess of what can be accounted for by the phenotypes of the group members themselves. (Heisler & Damuth 1987: 598)

When introduced, the Heisler and Damuth methods separated two aspects of the analysis of interactors involving group traits; the role of the statistical analysis was clarified as follows, in contrast to the causal analysis of an interactor:

“The first [“study of natural selection”] focuses on the quantitative relationships between the characters of organisms and components of their fitness. The second activity [“identification of the natural agents of selection”] is aimed at constructing causal explanations for differences in fitness associated with particular characters” (Heisler & Damuth 1987: 594).

Heisler and Damuth emphasize that contextual analysis

alone cannot demonstrate causal relationships, even if one can specify…the strength of the relationship between any defined character and fitness. (1987: 595)

I.e., the specific causal account needed also to be specified.

10. This is most often due to the unfortunate combination of, and confusion between, interactor and manifestor-of-adaptation requirements: the discontented authors are usually requiring that their “cohesive interactor” fulfill engineering adaptive functions as well as acting as a simple interactor in a selection process (e.g., various Bourrat and Okasha discussions, see §4.5 below). As a different but related issue, Schneider usefully summarizes Pradeu’s positions:

Thus, [according to Pradeu] the physiological individual relates to the boundaries and degrees of cohesion while the evolutionary individual relates to variation, heritability, reproduction processes, and differential fitness (Pradeu 2010b, 2011, 2016a). This distinction, according to Pradeu, clarifies the understanding that when thinking about definitions of the organism or unit of living, the discussion is of the physiological organization that can include the collaboration between different evolutionary units (Pradeu 2016a). (Schneider 2021: 5; see Love 2018)

11. This is true even if the models are denied to have a causal interpretation, as is done by those promoting a “statisticalist” interpretation of selection theory (Walsh, Lewens, & Ariew 2002). On this view, evolution is seen as a purely statistical phenomenon, and population genetics is seen as studies of statistical relations estimated by census, and not causal relationships.

The claim is that the “deeply uninteresting” units of selection problem has been dissolved, whereas in fact, it has simply been restricted to the interactor question (while ignoring the other three “units” questions entirely); the open problem of how to deliver an empirically adequate selection model is not directly addressed (Walsh, Lewens, & Ariew 2002: 470–471). Instead, an unspecified method is simply assumed, i.e., one that “identifies classes [that] … adequately predict and explain changes in the structure of the population” (2002: 471), with no acknowledgment that this involves making a commitment to one or another of the methods of determining an interactor, whether under a causal interpretation or not. Thus, the interactor RQ has not been escaped or avoided, whether or not it is interpreted causally (see Otsuka 2016a,b, 2019a,b; Otsuka et al. 2011; Okasha & Otsuka 2020).

12. Lewontin 1970, 1974; Franklin & Lewontin 1970; Slatkin 1972; see discussion in Wimsatt 1980a; Brandon 1982.

13. This is not to suggest that the replicator question has been solved. Work on the replicator question is part of a rich and continuing research program; it is simply, by convention, no longer a large part of the “units of selection” debates. That this parting of ways took place is largely due to the fact that evolutionists working on the units problems tacitly adopted the original suggestion that the replicator, whatever it turned out to be, be called the “gene” (Dawkins 1982b: 84–86). This move neatly removes the replicator question from consideration (§4.3 & §4.4).

Exactly why this move should have met with near universal acceptance is to some extent historically contingent, however the fact that the intellectual tools (largely mathematical models) of the participants in the units debates were better suited to dealing with aspects of that debate other than the replicator question which requires mainly bio-chemical investigation, surely contributed to this outcome.

Following up on Lewontin’s insight, the use of genomic selection models in domestic breeding has proved very significant, for example (e.g., Heslot et al. 2012; Crossa et al. 2017; Rice & Lipka 2021).

There is a very important class of exceptions to this general abandonment of the replicator question. Developmental Systems Theory was formulated as a radical alternative to the interactor/replicator dichotomy (Oyama 1985; Griffiths & Gray 1994, 1997; Oyama, Griffiths, & Gray 2001). Here the evolving unit is understood to be the developing system as a whole, privileging neither the replicator nor the interactor.

14. The newer notion of “reproducer” is even more broadly inclusive, in that it relaxes the material overlap requirement, and instead focuses on formal understandings of “who came from whom, and roughly where one begins and another ends” (Godfrey-Smith 2009: 86). With regard to retroviruses, on one side is the claim that there is no material overlap in the case of retroviral reproduction, and that the key is formal or informational relations (Godfrey-Smith 2009; Griesemer 2014). On the other side, is a view that sees material overlap due to RNA strand hybridization guiding and channeling flows of information (Griesemer 2000a,c, 2014, 2016). There is also the introduction of a notion of reproducer that involves only the copying of a property, with no substance overlapping involved (Nanay 2011). Like the second view of reproducer, it appeals to the case of retroviruses having no material overlap (contrast Griesemer 2014, 2016, 2018; see comparison in §4.1).

15. See §2.5, §4.5 below; discussion in Griesemer 2000c, 2014, 2018, 2019; Buss 1987. This topic concerns the major transitions of life from one level of complexity to the next, for example, the transition from unicellularity to multicellularity. See Veigl et al., 2022, Suarez and Lloyd 2023, on the newly introduced unit of reproduction, the reconstitutor, which requires no material overlap.

16. For explicit assumptions by both biologists and philosophers that being a unit of selection involves having an adaptation at that level, see Brandon 1982, 1985; Burian 1983; Mitchell 1987; Maynard Smith 1976; Vrba 1984.

17. The key claim is that

multi-level selection …does not usually lead groups to exhibit the degree of internal harmony that a typical individual has. Indeed in a sense this is a definitional rather than a substantive truth, since where groups do evolve a high degree of cooperation and functional integration…

they are considered individuals or “organisms” (Okasha 2018: 53, emphasis added). What is meant by “individual”, “organism” or “type 1 agent” here, is a manifestor of adaptation or combinations of them; the requirement of functional integration of entities at a level indicates engineering adaptation, in addition to interactors, at a level, as noted in §2.1 and §2.2. Okasha’s interpretation is reinforced by the requirement that, in reference to group or multilevel selection, conflicts between functional traits among distinct levels are not permitted (2018: 52). On the distinction between the manifestor of adaptation and Type-1 agent (p. 12), the manifestor can be:

a unit where a selection process has acted/acts consistently over time resulting in the accretion of a new mechanism or new process not seen before in the lineage, i.e., in a tinkering/engineering or trans-temporally accumulated adaptation. A type-1 agent is a subclass of the manifestor in which the optimization of several traits at the level seems obvious, and where the history and accumulation of selection is responsible for such optimization. (Suarez and Lloyd, 2023, p. 12)

18. See examples in, e.g., Sober 1984; Sober & Wilson 1994, 1998; Brandon 1985, 1990; Arnold & Fristrup 1982; West-Eberhard 1992; Burian 1992; see Lloyd/Sober & Wilson correspondence in Lloyd 2008.

19. For example, G. C. Williams 1966; Bock 1980; Dunbar 1982; Ghiselin 1974; Gould & Lewontin 1979; Hull 1980, 1988; Darwin 1964; Lewontin 1978; Mayr 1978, 1982; Maynard Smith 1976.

20. Consider, for example, Waddington’s (1956) genetic assimilation experiments. How should we interpret the results of Waddington’s experiments in which latent genetic variability was made to express itself phenotypically because of an environmental pressure (G. C. Williams 1966: 70–81; see the lucid discussion in Sober 1984: 199–201)? The question is whether the bithorax condition (resulting from direct artificial selection on that trait) should be seen as an adaptive trait, and the engineering adaptationist’s answer is that it should not. Instead, the bithorax condition is seen as “a disruption…of development”, a failure of the organism to respond (G. C. Williams 1966: 75–78). Hence, this analysis drives a wedge between—the notion of a trait that is a direct product of a selection process and—a trait that fits the more demanding engineering definition of an adaptation (see Gould & Lewontin 1979; Sober 1984: 201; cf. Dobzhansky 1956).

(Note that Williams also says that “natural selection would produce or maintain adaptation as a matter of definition” (1966: 25; cf. Mayr 1976). This comment conflicts with the conclusions Williams draws in his discussion of Waddington; however Williams later retracts his bithorax analysis (1985). Williams is committed to an engineering definition of adaptation (personal communication 1989).

21. This latter systems definition is most often identified as a Cummins function approach (Cummins 1975). See Larry Wright (1973) for more on the etiological approach.

22. G. C. Williams 1966; Lewontin 1978; Gould 2002; compare Sober 1984.

23. Lloyd & Wade 2019; see agricultural applications in Marín 2021.

24. Brandon (1985) argues that such a view, which separates the level of adaptation from that of a beneficiary, cannot be explanatory. Although I sympathize with Brandon’s conclusions, they follow only under his set of definitions, which Dawkins and other genic selectionists would certainly reject.

25. Introduced formally in Lloyd 2015 to describe evolutionary biology and adaptationist research approaches, in complement to drift, phyletic leftovers, developmental/selection byproducts, genetic correlates, and so on (see Lloyd 2021). And really, “the logic and pragmatics of RQs”, as introduced there; with the principles applied to debates in various scientific fields, e.g., in Ketcham 2018 (ant behavior), Morrison 2021 (climate model building), Warrener 2023 (archaeology).

26. Griesemer compared and analyzed major approaches, including: Lewontin 1962, 1970; Hull 1980, 1988; Lloyd 1988 [1994]. See §4.6

27. Often through misperception, misunderstanding, or mis-representation of its claims (e.g., see §4.1, §4.6).

28. On the other hand, some biologists do distinguish meanings concerning units of selection in terms of three or four separable meanings or functional roles, in order to articulate with precision certain contemporary debates in the biological sciences (e.g., Bijma 2014; Gardner 2015a; G. C. Williams 1992; see Griesemer 2014, 2005; Wade 2016).

29. I.e, that, for the purposes of addressing especially the interactor and manifestor-of-adaptation versions of the units of selection controversies, kin selection and multilevel selection “differ primarily in the types of questions being addressed”, and thus differ in their research questions (RQs), and programs, as well as. background assumptions, rather than primarily in their technical modeling types (Goodnight 2013: 1546; 2015).

30. A model type is a general outline for, or abstraction, of a model, including a partial specification of its type of state space, i.e., its details, its variables, its parameters (often only partially filled-in or “specified”, i.e., given values (mathematical or otherwise); this is part of what makes it a model type and not just a model), and its transformation and coexistence laws (or patterns of change or stasis; which again, may be formal or informal) (Lloyd 1988 [1994: 35, 72]).

More simply, a ‘model-type’ is where the models have in common a type of structure, sharing general characteristics, in which ‘certain parameters are left unspecified’ (see van Fraassen 1980: 44). Note, again, that model-types may be very general shapes or standards that are informal, such as what were originally conceived as informal “model outlines” of evolution by natural selection by Darwin, according to Lloyd’s and Beatty’s analysis).

31. Brandon 1990 is a superior discussion of the interaction of organism and environment, with the exception that the functional roles of interactor and manifestor are conflated much of the time.

32. As well as network modeling, see D. Fisher and McAdam (2017). For example, see review of different Networking Methods of delineating groups effective in evolutionary change, ranging from the simple to complex, provided by Fortunato and Archetti (2010), with a comparative analysis offered by Lancichinetti & Fortunato (2009). Tyler et al. (2009) studies epistasis and pleiotropy, for example.

33. See S. Wright 1931, 1945, 1980; Goodnight & Stevens 1997; Goodnight 2015; Kramer & Meunier 2016; also Wade 1978, 2016, Wade & Goodnight 1998. Sometimes also called “new group selection” by those unfamiliar with the founders of population genetics (e.g., West, Griffen and Gardner 2007: 423).

34. Explored, e.g., in: Moore, Brodie, & Wolf 1997; Bijma & Wade 2008; McGlothlin et al. 2010

35. Heisler & Damuth 1987; Goodnight, Schwartz, & Stevens 1992; Goodnight 2020; Bijma & Wade 2008; Laiolo & Obeso 2012; D. Fisher & McAdam 2017; McAdam, Garant, & Wilson 2014; McAdam, Webber, et al. 2022.

36. In sum, quantifying such social effects on phenotypes or fitness has been of great interest to those studying selection and evolution using quantitative genetics within the Evolutionary Change school (Moore, Brodie, & Wolf 1997; Wolf, Brodie, et al. 1998; Wolf, Brodie,& Wade 2000; Wolf 2003; Bijma, Muir, and Van Arendonk 2007a; Hadfield & Wilson 2007; Mutic & Wolf 2007; McGlothlin et al. 2010, 2014a,b; Ellen, Rodenburg, et al. 2014; D. Fisher & McAdam 2017; McAdam, Garant, & Wilson 2014; McAdam, Webber, et al. 2022).

37. Again, a model-type is a general outline for, or abstraction, of a model, including a partial specification of its type of state space, i.e., its variables, its parameters, or its laws, if a formal model-type (see Section 3.1 definitions of these terms. See, e.g., Maynard Smith 1974 for archetypal informal and formal model-types from game theory for Adaptationist/KS school approaches.

38. Maynard Smith 1978 is a classic source. Constraints on optimality should also be attended to also, e.g., Lewontin 1979; see Spencer, Kennedy, & Gray 1995.

39. Although each school is not exclusively committed to using only one model-type.

40. Nevertheless, it is very common, in the Adaptationist approach, to see claims that the two model types are “mathematically equivalent”, regardless of the research contexts, uses, and applications of those model types (addressed in §4.1).

41. This can have consequences, as Wade and Goodnight explain here:

In the very large populations of Fisher’s theory, considerations of the genetic architecture are not relevant and the additive effect of a gene changes for only two reasons: as a function of the mean of its population and as a function of its own frequency within the populations. Little of consequence is lost by lumping epistatic gene interactions with the nonheritable environmental variance. This is not a statement about the existence of epistasis, but rather one about its lack of importance and irrelevance to the evolutionary process. When genes are present in all possible combinations in proportion to their frequency (R. Fisher 1930 [1958: 30–31]), the statistical description of the average additive effect does capture the essence of a gene’s contribution to adaptive evolution, at least for one generation, and for subsequent generations if linkage disequilibrium between simultaneously selected loci is ignored. (Wade & Goodnight 1998: 1543)

However, in actual organisms, FST values (of linkage disequilibrium) are significant, and “for observed FST values, epistasis cannot be ignored and, in fact, it limits the adaptive process as conceived by Fisher” (Wade & Goodnight 1998: 1544).

42. We shall discuss why this might be, in §4.1. They refer to: Maynard Smith 1976; Dawkins 1982b; West, Griffin, & Gardner 2007, 2008; West, El Mouden, & Gardner 2011; Gardner & Grafen 2009; Gardner 2015a,b,c. As we can see, in Gardner and Welch’s words: “The cardinal problem of biology is to explain the process and purpose of adaptation” (2011: 1801).

43. Group benefits do not necessarily exist because they benefit the group; they often do not have the appropriate causal history to be a group-level adaptation, i.e., having arisen and accumulated from a group selection process.

44. Many commentators (Doolittle and co-authors, Godfrey Smith, etc.) tend to simply appeal to Hull’s original Interactor/Replicator [I/R] distinction without realizing or acknowledging that Hull’s own views were dynamic and that his project of understanding units of selection was a conceptual journey. I/R was one stop along that journey and Hull himself embraced modifications, enhancements and developments in the ideas, e.g. endorsing Lloyd’s addition of manifestor-of-adaptation and beneficiary when he personally edited a version of Lloyd’s (2001) for inclusion in his co-edited volume with Ruse (2007). Hull was also open to alternative conceptualizations of “replicator” in such concepts as Griesemer’s “reproducer,” through similarly unseen channels.

45. This combined requirement was later a popular version of the necessary conditions for being a unit of selection in general, as taken from the Adaptationist/KS school of multilevel selection theory (§3).

46. See Aoki 1982; Boorman & Levitt 1973; Crow & Aoki 1982; R. Fisher 1930; Ghiselin 1974; Leigh 1977; B. Levin & Kilmer 1974; Maynard Smith 1964, 1976, 1980, 1984; Uyenoyama 1979; G. C. Williams 1966. See D. S. Wilson for trait-group models, 1975, 1997, 1980; D. S. Wilson & Colwell 1981.

47. Hence, the effectiveness of GS, for the Adaptationist/KS school, is to be measured by the existence of self-sacrificing behavior on the part of individual organisms combined with the presence of a corresponding group-level engineering adaptation (§3). Maynard Smith concluded that any explanation “in terms of group advantage… always calls for some justification in terms of the frequency of group extinction” (1976: 278; discussion in 1980; contrast Wade 1978, 2016, on group fitness; Goodnight 2015, 2016; S. Wright 1980).

48. For example, on some Evolutionary Change model-types, migration occurs by propagules of large populations; each propagule is made up of individuals from a smaller subpopulation, with no mixing of colonists from the different subpopulations. Thus, much more between-population genetic variance can be maintained (Slatkin & Wade 1978: 3531; Slatkin 1981b; Wade 2016; cf. D. Craig 1982; Maynard Smith 1964, 1976).

49. Understanding a genic-selectionist response from G.C. Williams to this analysis focusing exclusively on interactors—rather than also group adaptations—is also significant for recent discussions; e.g., see West, Griffen, & Gardner 2007 below.

50. Examples of suggested techniques within the philosophical community include Brandon’s use of Salmon’s notion of screening off (1982, 1990), Lloyd on contextual analysis, and the work by Wimsatt and Lloyd on the additivity approach (Wimsatt 1980a,b; Lloyd 1988 [1994], Lloyd and Gould 1993; Wimsatt 1997; Wade & Griesemer 1998; Okasha 2004a; Ketcham 2018, 2024, for discussion). Biologists have suggested a variety of techniques for addressing this issue, as well. See, for example, the work of Arnold and Fristrup, Heisler and Damuth, David Sloan Wilson, and Wade and his students (Arnold & Fristrup 1982; Heisler & Damuth 1987; Damuth & Heisler 1988; D.S. Wilson & Colwell 1981; and Wade, Goodnight, Drown, and McCauley).

51. I.e., additive and related properties of the relevant variance in a component of fitness parameters at the upper level, and their relation to traits and environmental context, and to using statistical tools such as contextual analysis—carefully, and with all standard precautions—to do so (Lloyd 1986: 414; 1988 [1994: see pp. 69-96 for discussion of standard constraints and precautions using such statistical tools]; see Ketcham 2018 & 2024; Wade and Griesemer 1998). See also Lewontin 1974, Wade & McCauley 1980, McCauley & Wade 1980, Wimsatt 1980a: 254, 1980b, 1997; Wade 2016; Goodnight 2015.

52. “…determining whether any valid possible unit of selection is or is not at any moment functioning as one is a problem for empirical investigation” (Damuth & Heisler 1988: 409). Other technical discussions have addressed issues concerning the type of statistical tools that are preferable in different types of selective scenarios to discover or establish interactors. Details can be found in Okasha (2006), Earnshaw (2015), Goodnight (2015), and Wade (2016).

53. The myxoma and rabbit case is now treated as a “paradigm” case of co-evolution, and is assumed to be due to organismic selection, without any testing of group membership (P. Kerr, Liu, et al. 2015). See Wade 2016 for discussion of this type of move.

54. Thus, it fascinates me when I find Adaptationist/KS school’s Stuart West et al. complaining about GS more than a decade later that, “Although this debate [GS] was solved decisively during the 1960s to 1980s, by evolutionary biologists”… (West, Griffin, & Gardner 2007: 423, referring to Reeve and Keller’s discussion of G.C. Williams 1966 and his conflation of manifestor and interactor requirements).

55. Appropriately, as they were responding to Gardner & Grafen 2009, Gardner 2015a,b. Yet note that Gardner & Welch 2011 carefully and self-consciously take up the distinctions among the roles not only of interactor and manifestor-of-engineering-adaptation, but also beneficiary.

56. Goodnight 2015; Wade 1985, 1994, 2016.

57. For example, look at this confusion/conflation in hymenoptera:

… caste is interpreted as an adaptation for the queen, bestowing upon her a reproductive or survival benefit relative to other queens. Here, caste is not the result of group selection because it is not an adaptation for the group. Instead, it is seen as an adaptation for the queen and therefore evolved by individual (i.e., queen) selection. The unsatisfying equivalence of queen and colony is not addressed in this argument. (Wade 2016: 23; see Davidson et al. 2016; Gordon 2014)

58. See Goodnight 2013, 2015; Wade 2016; G. C. Williams 1990, 1992.

59. But Earnshaw 2015 argues that Damuth and Heisler’s MLS1 is not compatible with Sober’s definition of GS, which, he also argues, cannot handle complex cases of group selection in any case. And note that Sober’s “common fate” requirement for a unit of selection needs to be sharply distinguished from that of Dupré’s “common fate” requirement, which consists in the solitary property of being an interactor at that level (see Dupré and O’Malley 2013; Dupré 2012b). This demonstrates the desirability of the more technical requirements, detailed below.

60. Sober and Wilson, in virtue of their pursuit of the group level engineering adaptation of altruism—or perhaps it is only a group level selection-product adaptation, and not an engineering adaptation, as Earnshaw 2015 considers, above?—often appear as advocates of a hybrid of Adaptationist/KS and Evolutionary Change schools, especially because of D. S. Wilson’s early contributions to trait-group modeling (1975, 1980). But their confusion, in their preferred context of altruism, is clear to others: on Sober and Wilson’s definition, units as interactors are required to exhibit a level of functional organization enough to be considered one of their units of “common fate”. Their conflation of interactor and manifestor of engineering adaptation was rejected in a BBS discussion by one philosopher, who claims

if we recognize that group selection does not require functional organization (either as a necessary prerequisite or a necessary consequence), then the failure to find such organization is not definitive evidence against group selection, (Grantham 1994: 623)

and also explicitly by another, who claims that Sober & Wilson are “conflating selection acting on groups [interactor] with selection of group adaptations [manifestor]” (E. A. Smith 1994: 636).

61. Wade clarifies and continues:

… the \(\textrm{Cov}(z, w[z])\) equals \(\Delta Z = Z' -Z\), the difference between the mean of the parent population after selection, \(Z',\) and its mean before selection, \(Z.\) In order to compare one selection experiment with another, the difference, \(\Delta Z,\) can be expressed in units of phenotypic standard deviations—that is, it is multiplied by \((1/[V(z)]^{1/2}).\) In this standardized form, one can determine where in the life cycle the selection is strongest; for which trait among a suite of traits it is strongest; and whether selection is stronger in one deme, ecosystem, or species than it is in another. (Wade 2016: 87–88)

There are other RQs that this method cannot answer, however as discussed in this section.

62. Needless to say, this reflection or judgment against the appropriateness of real-life usability of his formalism has been ignored by the entire Adaptationist/KS school, both biologists and philosophers alike, who instead do routinely use his formalism to represent hierarchical selection processes. One philosopher wishes to define a unit of selection using a notion derived from the formalism, (but also attempting to fix the damage done, by heavily borrowing from the non-additivity, aggregative, and context-sensitivity concepts articulated by others—see Bourrat 2021a,b, and other work, above, without acknowledging the unsuitability of this notion’s foundations). But we can see throughout this entry some of the conceptual havoc caused by the formalism itself, no surprise to George Price himself. Thank you to Griesemer for discussion and insight.

63. Griesemer, personal correspondence, April 28, 2022.

64. For example, Maynard Smith 1976; Gardner, West, & Wild 2011; Abbot et al. 2011; Dugatkin & Reeve 1994; Birch & Okasha 2015, West, Griffin, & Gardner 2007, 2008; West & Gardner 2013; Lehmann et al. 2007; Frank 2013; Queller 1992; Sober & Wilson 1998; Grafen 2006; Marshall 2011.

65. see Hamilton 1975 for an expansion to multilevel selection, discussed below.

66. Indeed, “all apparent group selection cases are really cases of kin selection” was a claim voiced by all but one of the many evolutionary biologists I heard—in conversation, in presentation, informally, and formally—when visiting Oxford University’s Zoology Department in late 1989 for six weeks. But such a claim would be misleading. William D. (“Bill”) Hamilton, the original creator of kin selection genetical models, told me, in one-to-one conversation, that kin selection was a subcategory of group selection, and not the other way around (Pers. Comm. November 1989), and then took me to his office and gave me a copy of his 1975 paper stating exactly that (see analysis: Lloyd 1988 [1994]: chs 4–5; the 1994 paperback reprint carries one of Hamilton’s predator/prey models as the front cover illustration, as he liked the book’s analysis).

67. Contra West, Griffin, & Gardner (2007, 2008), Thies and Watson note:

MLS (multilevel selection) introduces a layer in the causal structure that cannot be deduced from [kin selection theory]. Identifying this causal substructure requires an intuitive inspection of the empirical system. We thus demonstrate transparently … how MLS represents a non-reductionist refinement of KS with respect to the causal structure of selection. (2021: 3)

68. Marshall concludes, about whether GS models really are needed, or are fully equivalent to KS (note contradiction of, e.g., Bijma 2014; Wade 2016):

The only matter open to debate is whether Hamilton’s rule is always valid in its classical form; of particular interest is whether it is valid for non-additive fitness effects. In fact, Hamilton’s rule might have to be extended for certain kinds of non- additivity [Grafen 1985a,b] (Box 3), but this will always result in a corresponding change in the group selection formulation. It has long been known that, for non-additive payoffs, both the inclusive fitness and group selection viewpoints fail to achieve a clean separation between fitness effects (response to selection) and genetic effects (heritability), for the same reasons [Queller 1992]. Thus, despite assertions to the contrary [Nowak et al. 2010], the group selection and inclusive fitness viewpoints have long been known to be equivalent perspectives on the same process [Hamilton 1975], even for strong selection and non-additive interactions [Queller 1992]. (Marshall 2011: 329; emphasis added)

69. For example, E.O. Wilson 2008; Nowak, Tarnita, & Wilson 2010, 2011; Hölldobler & Wilson 2009; van Veelen 2009; van Veelen, Garcia, et al. 2012; van Veelen, Luo, & Simon 2014; B. Allen, Nowak, & Wilson 2013; E.O. Wilson & Nowak 2014; Traulsen 2010; Clarke 2016; Shavit & Millstein 2008; Uyenoyama 1979; S. Wright 1930; E.O. Wilson 2012; Bodmer 1965; Bijma & Wade 2008.

70. Geneticists have also offered an effective critique of the Adaptationist/KS school’s theoretical “Formal Darwinism Project” to units of selection, arguing that the project’s preferences for the level of individual organism is arbitrary, as is their bias against multilevel selection in Evolutionary Change modeling (Shelton & Michod 2014a,b; Gardner & Grafen 2009).

71. Recent equivalence and conventionalist claims, such as Bourrat 2021a, etc., still frequently refer to the assertions of Dugatkin and Reeve 1994, as if they were completely unproblematic, or well-established, despite having been challenged in both the technical genetics and philosophical literature.

72. “[N]one of [those promoting genic selection models] discussed group selection for organismic advantage to individuals… although this process… is not fragile at all, in contrast with the fairly obvious fragility of group selection for group advantage” (S. Wright 1980: 841).

73. see West, Griffin, & Gardner 2007 quote, above; also: “There is no theoretical or empirical example of group selection that cannot be explained with kin selection” (West, Griffin, & Gardner 2008: 375; West, El Mouden, & Gardner 2011).

74. Wright was interested in exploring the dynamics of interdemic selection in the shifting balance process, contrasting it with “group selection for group advantage” (S. Wright 1980: 840; see S. Wright 1931, 1984). The Evolutionary Change argument of Wright was that the primary KS model-type is “very different” from “group selection for the uniform advantage of a group”, both theoretically and empirically (S. Wright 1980: 841).

75. Goodnight 2015; 2013; Goodnight & Stevens 1997; contrast West, Griffin, & Gardner 2007, 2008.

76. The precise meaning of this RQ depends on whether we are asking about simple selection-product adaptation or engineering adaptation—the two schools of genetics often use term “adaptation” to mean different things. We will take the meaning in the engineering sense here, as this is primarily an Adaptationist/KS RQ.

77. We can see this tension in a recent philosophical analysis of group selection; even though it usefully re-introduces the distinction between interactors and manifestors of adaptation, and explicitly rejects the dual interactor + manifestor requirement highlighted earlier for group selection to occur, the author also requires “well integrated” groups at the higher level, seemingly a manner of reinstating a functional or adaptive requirement at the group level, in order to satisfy the kin selectionist/Adaptationist approach (Birch 2020).

78. These issues also help us understand why the recommendations calling “for a reframing of the theoretical foundations of sociobiology from a multilevel perspective” (D. S. Wilson & E. O. Wilson 2007) were rejected by most sociobiologists and animal behaviorists, i.e., the Adaptationist/KS school: the multilevel models of the Evolutionary Change approach did not primarily model engineering adaptations, only interactors.

79. Wade continues:

To this extent population genetic models which assume random mating and random mixing of individuals are inappropriate to the study of the evolution of these traits. (Wade 1980b: 854)

80. All of this analysis is rejected under a “Darwinian population” analysis. The “Darwinian populations” view previously mentioned provides a considerably different view of the necessary conditions for GS. For a given selection story to be descriptively sound, a “Darwinian population” must exist at the level of selection being described, which, (on this analysis) requires the presence of an interactor, a manifestor, and a reproducer at that level, thus putting together what others since Dawkins have pulled apart (Godfrey-Smith 2009: 112). A Darwinian population is conceived as, at minimum,

a collection of causally connected individual things in which there is variation in character, which leads to differences in reproductive output (differences in how much or how quickly individuals reproduce), and which is inherited to some extent. (Godfrey-Smith 2009: 39)

There are further differentiations between paradigmatic, minimal, and marginal Darwinian populations based on a variety of criteria (Godfrey-Smith 2009: Chapter 3). Note that, despite the protestations of the author, this concept fuses interactor, manifestor, and reproducer functional roles (Lloyd 2017; Suárez & Lloyd 2023). This leads to confusion, as shown, e.g., in the debates about holobionts (see §4.6).

The approach to multilevel selection using Darwinian populations and reproducers (Godfrey Smith 2009, 2016) is claimed to present an advantage over other available analyses of units of selection because it can account for previously neglected examples such as epigenetic inheritance systems, although Griesemer’s account of units (1998, 2000a, 2003, 2016, 2018, 2019) both introduced the concept of the “reproducer”, and includes epigenetic systems of inheritance and developmental features. The question remains as to whether gaining an account to deal with the supposedly neglected examples is worth rejecting entire classes of biologically accepted group selection models, including virtually all Adaptationist/KS school accounts and almost all Evolutionary Change accounts of GS, and whether such a loss is truly necessary to deal with epigenesis, given that we have an epigenetic account with reproducers that allows for group selection.

81. As introduced into the philosophical literature in the early-mid nineteen-eighties by Lloyd (1983, 1987, 1988 [1994), Griesemer (1984), and others using a model-based approach.

82. “…in which the adaptation is not conferred via something carried by an individual of the adapted species (as with genes, behavior, or associated microbes), but by some structural or compositional aspect of the population”. (Lamm & Kolodny 2022: 1) Note that this notion is consistent with the flexibility with which the Evolutionary Change school treats higher-level traits in both selection and transmission processes, while also providing an optimum.

83. For review of similar processes, see Goodnight & Stephens 1997; Wade et al. 2010; Fewell & Page 2000; Wade, Bijma, et al. 2010; Wade 2016; Shaffer et al. 2016.

84. The selfish mutation

is no more a threat to a social system evolved by group selection than it is to an “ordinary” adaptation evolved by individual selection. (Breden & Wade 1981; Wade 2016, 146).

85. In the midst of this passage, Wade also notes, explaining further:

The fitness costs and benefits are defined by what the altruist genotypes do, not by what the genetically selfish individuals do—they do nothing to incur a fitness cost, but simply reap the fitness benefits. So, the fitness effects do not change. (Wade 2016: 146–147)

86. Bijma & Wade 2008; Bijma et al. 2007a,b; Bijma 2010b, 2011, 2014; Drown & Wade 2014; Lloyd 1988[1994]; Lloyd & Wade 2019; Koskella & Bergelson 2020.

87. Provided, that is, that they have the right kinds of relations with higher-level fitnesses, e.g., according to properties of variances in aspects of fitnesses, as examined in the additivity approach, and shown through contextual analysis or other methods (as proposed in Lloyd 1988[1994]). This view was also defended in Damuth and Heisler 1988, as well as Grantham 1995; Lloyd and Gould 1993; contrast Cracraft 1985. It quickly became a widely accepted standard among the paleontologists for species selection (see Vrba 1989; Gould 2002; Jablonksi 1987, 2008; Jablonski and Hunt 2006; Coyne and Orr’s textbook 2004, and others.) Sober 1989 and Sober and Wilson 1998 opposed the approach, from a philosophical perspective.

88. As G.C. Williams himself has acknowledged, in a discussion on higher level selection:

“The answer to all these difficulties must be Lloyd’s…idea that higher levels of selection depend, not on emergent characters, but on any and all emergent fitnesses.” (1992: 27)

89. That is, in terms of group-level trait variances and fitnesses, meaning the non-cross-level-byproduct higher-level aspect of variance in appropriate fitness components of a higher-level, i.e., species-level, “aggregate” (or adaptive) trait, plus requirements at the lower-level, e.g., in one approach, involving non-additivity of variance in fitness components, which is a form of context-dependence, etc.. Damuth & Heisler (1988) agreed with this assessment of what would be required for the higher-level selection process—in this case, selection up at the species level based on higher-level traits:

The issue is …whether there exist characters definable at the group level whose association with individual fitness cannot be accounted for by the associations of individual characters with fitness. (1988: 421)

They write:

• “of interest is the evolution of group characters in the population of groups”. (1988: 409–410)

• “In this [MLS2] case, we have identified a different kind of fitness than in the first, a group-level fitness that is not simply the mean of the fitnesses of the group’s members”. (1988: 409–410)

Take note, this is not the same type of group-level traits whose fitnesses play a role in most group selection model-types considered in philosophical discussions (e.g., Sober & Wilson 1998; Sober 1984; Okasha 2006, etc., which makes a big difference, as Bourrat 2021a,b has recently noticed; see Grantham 1995). For today, see Carotenuto, Di Febbraro, et al. 2020. Slatkin 1981a provides an early model.

90. As Evolutionary Change school theorists, including Heisler and Damuth, note, the point of doing a selection analysis is to identify relationships between characters and fitnesses at various levels. Once these relationships are identified, they need to be explored using a variety of tools to investigate their causal relations, although in many cases, especially in paleontology, only correlational data may be directly available. (And remember that variances and covariances may not be particularly good at establishing causal relationships (Lewontin 1974).) This is why laboratory experiments are so valuable; we ourselves can act as the causes, (and Evolutionary Change researchers use Contextual Analysis, not often ANOVA or covariances; see discussions in Heisler & Damuth 1987; Damuth & Heisler 1988; Griesemer & Wade 1988, on the value of the experimenter as causal agent).

91. As Jablonski (2017b: 452–453) summarizes the situation exploring correlations among lineage ranges and long-term lineage success recently, with regard to species selection and inheritance, [using a non-fully-abstract approach that includes both the interactor and reproducer functional roles, following Lewontin (1970), as Griesemer has analyzed (2005)]:

Thus, as (a) species vary in their geographic range sizes, (b) variation in species range-size is causally associated with species survivorship (and, more controversially, with speciation rates), and (c) range size is heritable at the species level (i.e. ranges of related species are more similar in size than expected by chance), this species-level trait meets Lewontin’s (1970) classic triad required for evolution by selection, at any level: variation, differential survival and reproduction owing to interaction of that variation with the environment, and heritability of that variation. (on species ranges, heritability, and multilevel selection, see Jablonski 1987; Hunt, Roy, & Jablonski 2005; Waldron 2007; Carotenuto, Barbera, & Raia 2010; Borregaard, Gotelli, & Rahbek 2012; Alves, Diniz-Filho, & Villalobos 2017; Pie & Meyer 2017; Zacaï et al. 2017)

92. Dawkins has recognized from the beginning that his question is completely distinct from the interactor question, because his debate with others concerns the ultimate beneficiary of the selection process (Istvan 2013; Ågren 2021a).

93. He argues that if Lewontin, Franklin, Slatkin and others are right, and linkage disequilibrium is very strong, his view will not be affected. Thus, if linkage disequilibrium is very strong, then the “effective replicator will be a very large chunk of DNA” (Dawkins 1982b: 89; Sapienza 2010). Dawkins is not interested in the replicator research question at all; he claims that his framework can accommodate any of its possible answers.

94. Dawkins 1982b: 81, my emphasis; see pp. 4, 5, 52, 84, 91, 113, 114. Compare an alternative formulation of Dawkins’ central question:

When we say that an adaptation is “for the good of” something, what is that something?…I am suggesting that the appropriate “something”, the “unit of selection” in that sense, is the active germ-line replicator. (1982a: 47)

This particular formulation, I think, asks two questions, one about who the beneficiary of the selection process is and one about who possesses adaptations. Griesemer and Wimsatt’s studies (1989) on Weismannism are of great help here.

95. Note that Williams, even though he “keeps his books” in terms of genes, argued against the notion that particular group traits were group adaptations because these group traits are not properly understood as benefiting the group in the proper historical selection scenario (G. C. Williams 1966).

96. Replicators may therefore be taken in some sense as information and not as biological entities (see Hampe & Morgan 1988)

Adaptations must thus be seen as being designed for the good of the active-germ-line replicators for the simple reason that replicators/reproducers are the only entities existing long enough to enjoy them over the full course of natural selection, whether of organisms or groups, as Dawkins acknowledges (1982b: 114; 85). And because only the active germ-line replicators “survive”, they are the true locus of adaptations (1982b: 113; emphasis added).

97. Hence, Dawkins rejects the interactor approach partly because he identifies it with the manifestor-of-adaptation approach, which he has answered by definition, in terms of the long-term beneficiary, that is, his replicator, which we now correct, to a reproducer.

98. Note that this is a typical RQ in the Adaptationist/kin selection research school, as discussed in §3.

99. The genic selectionists’ lack of consideration of the broader interactor definition of a unit of selection, by itself (see §3), leads to serious problems elsewhere with the argument against vehicles/interactors, e.g., the inability to identify interactors when they are not engineering adaptations, as well as also, the tendency to interpret all group selectionist claims as being about beneficiaries and manifestors of adaptations as well as interactors (§4.1). This is a serious misreading of authors who are pursuing the interactor question, such as the Evolutionary Change multilevel selectionists (§3; see also §4.1).

100. On an altogether different reductionist note, further work in the philosophy of biology brings the level of the unit of selection down even further than the original genic selectionists do (Rosenberg 2006). Higher level selection is reducible to more fundamental levels. Taking a reductionist stance, which is taken to be necessary to avoid an “untenable dualism” in biology between physicalism and antireductionism, the argument is that the principle of natural selection (PNS) should be properly viewed as a basic law of physical science (specifically chemistry), which can operate at the level of atoms and molecules (Rosenberg 2006: 189–191). Different molecular environments would favor different chemical types, and those that “more closely approximate an environmentally optimal combination of stability and replication”, are thus the “fittest” and would predominate (2006: 190). This could then be applied at each step of the way from simple molecules to compounds, organelles, cells, tissues, and so on, such that, while having the disadvantage of merging characteristics of interactors and replicators, the result at each level of chemical aggregation is the instantiation of another PNS, grounded in, or at least in principle derivable from, the molecular interactions that follow the PNS in the environment operating at one or more lower levels of aggregation. (Rosenberg 2006: 192)

101. The line of argument was initially pursued by Waters (1986, 1991), Sterelny & Kitcher (1988), and by Kitcher, Sterelny, & Waters (1990). While there are substantive differences between their views, especially about scientific realism, the discussion will be restricted here to what they have to say narrowly about genic selectionism and genic pluralism. (see also Sterelny 1996a,b; Waters 2005; Kellert, Longino, & Waters 2006; §3; §4.1.)

102. John Odling-Smee and Kevin Laland argue that the genic approach cannot accommodate the consequences of niche-constructing activities, even taking into account the extended phenotype stance (2011; contrast Dawkins 1982a,b). See discussions of group and kin-selection/genic model equivalences above in §4.1.

103. They write that if you want to model, from the gene’s level out, the overall fitness of the “A” allele, you consider the fitnesses in each set of specialized, detailed environments (aka interactors) and weight them according to the frequency of that environment, using the identical statistical tools that multilevel selectionists use to identify interactors at hierarchical levels of organization (e.g., Waters 1991: 563 uses Lloyd 1988 [1994]; Sterelny & Kitcher 1988: 354 use Brandon 1982).

104. In addition to the biologists’ objections discussed in §4.1, see objections by philosophers, e.g.: Sober & Lewontin 1982; R.A. Wilson 2003; Stanford 2001; van der Steen & van den Berg 1999; Gannett 1999; Shanahan 1997; Glennan 2002; Sober 1990; Sober & Wilson 1998; Brandon & Nijhout 2006; Sarkar 2008.

105. In the genic selection case, the pluralists appear to be claiming that the genic level models are fully independent from the multilevel models. The claim is: although the genic models are mathematically equivalent, they have different parameters, and a different interpretation, and they are completely independent from the multilevel models (Waters 1991, 2005).

106. Contrary to many claims of genic pluralists, cases of frequency-dependence, such as in heterosis and in game-theoretic models of selection, necessitate selection at higher than genic-levels because the relevant properties of the entities at the genic level are only definable relative to higher levels of organization. Thus, they cannot be properly described as properties of alleles nor are they “even definable at the allelic level” (Sarkar 2008: 219). In addition, when drift is taken into account, the genic accounts fail to be empirically adequate (Brandon & Nijhout 2006).

Recent work from the Evolutionary Change school of multilevel genetics research concerning empirical discoveries about the interactions among genes in different individuals in a population having effects on both organismic and group level traits, has changed the direction of new evolutionary research.

Consider Evolutionary Change geneticist Bijma (2014), concerning an issue impacting all genic state-space models, who notes that:

Indirect genetic effects (IGE) occur when the genotype of an individual affects the phenotypic trait value of another conspecific individual. IGEs can have profound effects on both the magnitude and the direction of response to selection…. The increasing research effort devoted to IGEs suggests that they are a widespread phenomenon, probably particularly in natural populations and plants…. [which] should considerably broaden our understanding of the quantitative genetics of inheritance and response to selection in relation to the social organisation of populations. (Bijma 2014: 61).

What this means for genic selectionism, including genic pluralism—because of its eliminativist position on interactors—is that treating single replicators as individually-acting causes in natural selection models, as many from the genic pluralist, genic selectionist, or Adaptationist school still do, is likely to be empirically faulty, and nearly guarantees that practitioners will misrepresent an evolving system, at the genic, organismic, and group levels. The more we learn about the context of individual alleles, the more we discover that their genetic, family, group, and physical and biotic environments make large differences to their evolutionary fitnesses and to the fitnesses of those around them. In the end, this means that treating individual alleles as having individual, stable, fitnesses and individualized evolutionary trajectories will become more and more an approach of the past (see Bijma 2011: 1357; Wade 2014).

107. Glymour 1999; Van der Steen & Van den Berg 1999; and Shanahan 1997. The approach does not so much criticize genic pluralism as simply ignore it.

108. Some examples of this approach used against the genic pluralists (including Sober 1990; Sober & Wilson 1994, 1998) also appeal to aspects of the manifestor-of-adaptations and beneficiary questions to establish the failure of genic pluralism to represent certain selective events correctly. Causal concerns are also raised in other work (Shanahan 1997; Van der Steen and Van den Berg 1999; Stanford 2001; and Glennan 2002), though without the focus on other units research questions reviewed in §2. This line of criticism needs a notion of cause that is both plausible and plausibly true of multilevel but not genic level models. In a separate analysis, the relationship between kin and multilevel models was spelled out using causal graphs (Okasha 2015), although this was critiqued by Birch (2020), and Otsuka (2019a). As argued by a number of authors independently, just because the two models can produce the same changes in gene frequencies, it does not follow that they represent the same causal structure (Okasha 2015; Otsuka 2019b; see §4.1).

109. Discussed in Lloyd, Lewontin, & Feldman 2008. Bourrat 2022 resuscitates the same issue, but also does not answer the challenges: it is usually the scientist who is responsible for entering “real” biological entities into their statistical analyses. To demand your tools to do it for you is to mistake methods for metaphysics; it also evidently leads to deficient science.

110. Thus, it is the “project of a theory of evolutionary transition to explain the evolutionary origin of entities with such capacities” (Griesemer 2000a: 70; 1998). For early investigations or parts of these theoretical projects, see: Maynard Smith 1991; Morowitz 1992; Szathmáry 1999; Szathmáry & Maynard Smith 1993; Maynard Smith & Szathmáry 1995; Wade 1979; Michod & Roze 1999, 2001; discussion in Stencel & Suárez 2021.

111. Clarke writes that she will:

focus on two pairs of authors, both of whom have, in light of major transitions, reconfigured the traditional relationship between bearing adaptations, being an organism, and being acted on by natural selection, (Clarke 2018: 3, ms., emphasis added)

citing Sober and Wilson, Lewontin, and Gould (e.g., Clarke 2016: 3-6, ms.; emphasis added), whose mixture of Adaptationist/KS and Evolutionary Change group selection modeling long precedes—and differs radically from—the entire context of major transitions literature, especially Szathmáry and Maynard Smith-strictly-two-layer-style modeling of evolutionary transitions using a gene-centered modeling approach. As animal behavior specialist Deborah Gordon emphasizes in her new book on group emergent problem-solving and intelligence, group-level interactions and fabulous (my word) adaptations did not emerge recently in ant evolution—i.e., as a new evolutionary invention of higher-level selection—they have always been there since the organisms in question evolved altogether (Gordon 2023: Ch. 9). For consideration of evolutionary novelties, see, e.g., Wagner 2015, 2016; Wagner et al. 2014; McKenna 2021).

112. In a paper recommending that the EES (Extended Evolutionary Synthesis, see entries on evolution, evolution and development, and cultural evolution) not otherwise explicitly discussed here, although many of its theoretical contributions are implicitly and indirectly included in our conversation, e.g., see references to Feldman’s work; see Laland et al. 2015) two biologists recommend that we should:

consider various communities that are made up of interacting populations, and for which the individual members can belong to the same or to different species. Examples of communities include biofilms, ant colonies, symbiotic associations resulting in holobiont formation, and human societies. (Sukhoverkhov & Gontier 2021: 1; see §4.6)

113. Using the distinctions offered by Heisler and Damuth (Heisler & Damuth 1987; Damuth & Heisler 1988) in their contextual analysis of units of selection, this analysis claims that early on in the process of an evolutionary transition, a multi-level selection 1 (MLS1) model-type applies, in which the organisms (“particles”) themselves are the “focal” units upon which selection directly acts. However, by the end of the transition, both the collectives and the organisms are focal units of selection processes, with independent fitnesses, a case of Damuth and Heisler’s multi-level selection 2 (MLS2) model type (Okasha 2006: 4). We can see that understanding evolutionary transitions may be partially usefully interpreted to provide additional examples of Damuth and Heisler’s model-types, given the caveats in the text.

114. introduced in Suárez & Lloyd 2023

115. The term, “Darwinian individual”, first appeared in Gould & Lloyd 1999, referring to interactors. This is a different meaning, combining functional roles.

116. These transitions involve a “de-Darwinizing” of the lower-level entities such that an initial collective has come to engage in definite high-level reproduction, and this has involved the curtailing of independent evolution at the lower level. (Godfrey-Smith 2009: 124) This can be accomplished in a variety of ways, such as through the bottleneck caused by the production of new collectives from single individuals, coupled with germ-line segregation (as in the transitions to multicellularity), or by a single member of the collective preventing all other members from reproducing (for example, among some eusocial insects), or by a single member having primary but not total control over the other constituents (as in the evolution of eukaryotes) (Godfrey-Smith 2009: 123–124).

117. Lower-level entities are dependent on the germ-line cells for the propagation of new collectives, and thus their ability to act as replicators is necessarily curtailed. Thus, to prevent subversion and encourage cooperation, such a transition requires both the “generation of benefit” and the “alignment of reproductive interests” (Godfrey-Smith 2009: 124, with terminology from Calcott 2008; see Booth’s 2014 analysis of heterokaryotic Fungi using Godfrey-Smith’s approach). For example, in the case of multicellularity, the latter can be accomplished by “close kinship within the collective” (Godfrey-Smith 2009: 124). Thus, it seems that all four of the meanings of “unit” distinguished in the anatomy of units approach are actually utilized in Godfrey-Smith’s analysis here, despite Godfrey-Smith’s programmatic denial of multiple meanings of the term, and the empirical evidence suggesting that ETIs are more complex processes.

But see Wade (2016) for discussion elaborating the complexity and mitigation of this claim; Stencel & Wloch-Salamon (2018) and Papale (2021) for conceptual evidence that the evolution of manifestors/type-1 agents may not always require sequestration of reproduction at the focal level, and Suárez & Triviño (2020) for a case of evolution of manifestors/type-1 agents at one level without known collective reproduction at the level. What really matters from the MTI perspective is the evolution of manifestors/type-1 agents with respect to their reproduction, rather than with respect to any other type of optimal design (Suárez & Lloyd 2023). See also Shelton & Michod 2020 on the stages of ETI.

118. Lynn Margulis 1991; Guerrero, Margulis, & Berlanga 2013; Leo Buss 1987; Rudolf Raff, both as founder/Editor-in-Chief of flagship journal, Evolution and Development, author, with Thomas Kaufman, of Embryos, Genes, and Evolution: The Developmental-Genetic Basis of Evolutionary Change (1983), and, with Elizabeth Raff, of Development as an Evolutionary Process, 1987 (MBL Lectures in Biology), see Raff 1996; Bordenstein & Theis 2015; Brucker and Bordenstein 2012, 2013a,b; Griesemer 2019; O’Malley 2017, and Suárez 2018 give historical contexts to these studies, as does Alan Love and Ingo Brigandt’s commentary on Lidgard and Nyhart’s collected 2017 volume of essays on the concept of the “biological individuality”. Gissis, Lamm, & Shavit’s volume (2017) and pioneer Scott Gilbert’s eco-evo-devo approach are uniquely valuable, as well: Gilbert, Rosenberg, & Zilber-Rosenberg 2017; Gilbert, Bosch, & Ledón-Rettig 2015; Gilbert 2011, 2014, 2019a, 2020b; Funkhouser & Bordenstein 2013; Gilbert, Sapp, & Tauber 2012; McFall-Ngai et al. 2013; Gilbert & Tauber 2016; Sariola & Gilbert 2020; Dupré & O’Malley 2007, 2013; O’Malley & Dupré 2007; Dupré 2010, 2012a,b, 2020, 2021a,b; Nicholson & Dupré 2018; see also below.

119. I should note having taken a small role in co-authoring this paper with many esteemed colleagues, and especially highlighting the importance of keeping the four RQs of units distinct; thanks go to Kevin Theis and the fellow co-authors for the opportunity.

120. See also Gilbert’s fascinating review of “health fetishism” 2018.

121. Bacterial symbionts serve as a core of the human immune system, helping to induce and sustain T-cells and B-cells (Lee & Mazmanian 2010; Round, O’Connell, & Mazmanian 2010), as well as providing essential vitamins to the host human being. Gut bacteria are necessary for: cognitive development (Sampson & Mazmanian 2015), as well as for the development of blood vessels in the gut; lipid metabolism, detoxification of dangerous bacteria, viruses, and fungi; and the regulation of colonic pH and intestinal permeability (Nicholson et al. 2012).

122. To my knowledge; if you know an earlier claim, please let me know. See Rosenberg & Zilber-Rosenberg 2020.

123. See specifically Lamm & Kolodny 2022; Dupré 2020; Pradeu 2016a,b, 2018, 2019; Suá & Stencel 2020; Triviño & Suárez 2020; Hurst 2017; Bordenstein & Theis 2015; Schneider 2021; for work relating notions of holobiont to “biological individual”. Schneider suggests, specifically, “viewing the holobiont as a host ecosystem using ecological concepts in the examination of boundaries and immunity” (2021: 3). But she is primarily concerned about the boundaries of individuals in immunological terms (see discussion in Schneider 2021).

Also see Love & Brigandt’s closing essay of Lidgard & Nyhart’s 2017 volume on the concept of the “biological individuality”.

124. Note that a number of philosophers and some biologists entering the debates about either ETI or holobionts, or both, do not even recognize the distinctions between these two fundamental ETI vs. multilevel model-types or approaches, thus conflating very distinct evolutionary processes; this is often accompanied by trading between the product-of-selection and engineering notions of adaptation at a variety of levels, resulting in many confusions: e.g., Clarke 2013, 2016; Moran & Sloan 2015; Douglas & Werren 2016; Stencel & Wloch-Salamon 2018; Inkpen & Doolittle 2021: 7; Bourrat 2021a,b; Sukhoverkhov & Gontier 2021.

125. That is, an old-fashioned super-restrictive GS “Haystack” model-type from Maynard Smith; see his 1964 or 1976 papers for this structure, that is: one focusing on higher-level-entity reproduction combined with near-total suppression of the lower-level fitness/trait significance.

126. For example, Goodnight 2013, 2015; S. Wright, 1980; Lewontin & Dunn 1960; Lewontin 1962; Wade 2016.

127. Compare Douglas & Werren 2016; Moran & Sloan 2015; Skillings 2016; Queller & Strassmann 2016; Stencel & Wloch-Salamon 2018.

128. Koskella & Bergelson (2020) conclude that new concepts and analyses of interspecies interactions—with regard to holobionts—can be subsumed under Lloyd & Wade’s (2019) model-type presenting epigenetic models of holobiont coevolution; and we do not need a paradigm shift, new model-types, or novel terminology in microbiology beyond what Lloyd and Wade propose. See next Note [130].

129. Koskella & Bergelson conclude, as emphasized in Wade (2016), higher levels of selection may have access to pools of genetic variation unavailable to lower levels (as we noted repeatedly in §3, §4.1), through a wide variety of inheritance mechanisms:

This idea is reinforced by multilevel selection models [Lloyd & Wade 2019], where selection on the interaction can lead to, rather than depend upon, the evolution of transmission modes. Using a community population genetics framework, the impact of species interactions (or “interspecific epistasis”) on fitness can be examined as a higher level of organization upon which selection acts, in addition to selection at lower levels [Wade 2007]. (Koskella & Bergelson 2020: 4; emphasis added)

They continue, helpfully,

This approach can be used, for example, to help explain why mutualistic interactions are reinforced (assuming some vertical transmission) while “cheating” can be self-limiting [Lloyd & Wade 2019]. (Koskella & Bergelson 2020: 4; emphasis added)

130. Herron seems to be very sympathetic to Michod’s view of new evolutionary individuals in new ETI as new units of selection (Michod & Herron 2006), and notes, “Szathmáry has recently come around to viewing major transitions as transitions in the units of selection” (Herron 2021: 6).

Ultimately Szathmáry seems to have defined the evolutionary Individual as a “unit of selection”, but unfortunately, does not clarify which meaning of “unit” he intends (Szathmary 2015). Studying the text, he seems to intend “interactor” as a functional unit in nearly all contexts, given that the emphasis is on the interactions between the organisms and their reproductive fitness in relation to/interaction with their environments. Thus, the authors do not intend “reproducer” as the unit, contrary to the explicit claim that both Harron and Szathmary claim to be following Godfrey-Smith’s framework. (Herron 2021)

131. Lloyd 2001

132. Goodnight 2000, 2015; Wade 2016; S. Wright 1980; Gould 2002; discussed in Suárez & Lloyd 2023. The theoretical framework that makes this contrast clearest, explicated in §3, is described, e.g., by Wade (2000; 2016), Goodnight & Stevens (1997), or Goodnight (2015).

133. For example, assumptions and model-types from the Adaptationist/KS school regarding optimality, game theory, and selective functions. This is so, even as they cite some Evolutionary Change sources, and engage with D. S. Wilson’s trait-group model-type in modeling the holobiont systems (Foster et al. 2017).

134. see Foster & Wenseleers 2006:

The evolution of mutualisms presents a puzzle. Why does selection favour cooperation among species rather than cheaters that accept benefits but provide nothing in return? (Foster & Wenseleers 2006: 1283)

The significant results from their model are:

that phenotypic feedbacks (partner-fidelity feedback, partner choice) are a more important explanation for between-species cooperation than the development of genetic correlations among species (cooperator association). (Foster & Wenseleers 2006: 1283)

135. For example: “Transmission from parents to offspring might increase the fitness of a helpful symbiont, as it can now also benefit by helping the host to have offspring [Douglas & Werren 2016]. However, with imperfect vertical transmission, it is difficult to see how these effects can protect against loss of a less competitive microbe [Kaltenpoth et al. 2014]”. (Foster et al. 2017: 43: Box 2)

136. This is so, using community ecology-type modeling, e.g., using epistasis and its effects on fitness parameters. See Drown & Wade 2014; Wade & Drown 2016; Edenbrow et al. 2017; Lloyd & Wade 2019; De Lisle et al. 2022.

137. Compare Griesemer’s 2005 analysis of abstraction in Lloyd’s units framework, wherein her framework for analyzing both the theory and entities was found to be uncommitted to any particular biological hierarchy, unlike Hull’s or Lewontin’s approaches.

138. In this well-designed experiment done by a collaboration of 15 adaptationists and kin selection theorists using cheater-predicting genic selection theoretic models, they measured the traits and fitnesses in nature of the precise spots they predicted cheaters, using a theoretical ly sound basis for this experiment (Jones et al. 2015).

Yet despite using the very exemplar cheater cases that they had always taught, they found zero cases in nature of actual cheaters that fulfilled their fitness requirements. In their own words:

Cheating is a focal concept in the study of mutualism, with the majority of researchers considering cheating to be both prevalent and highly damaging. (Jones et al. 2015: 1270)

They proposed an appropriately strict, fitness-based definition of cheating, and then tested the traditional, “best-studied” exemplars of mutualisms in nature for fulfillment of these requirements for cheaters. Recall that Jones et al. conclude:

We find … there is currently very little support from fitness data that any of these meet our criteria to be considered cheaters. (2015: 1270, emphasis added)

A philosopher and biologist team also note that molecular phylogenies of mutualisms in nature provide much evidence that they are not, as is predicted by the Adaptationist/KS school, vulnerable to cheaters (Lloyd & Wade 2019).

See further discussion in §4.1.

139. Perhaps a simplest way to picture this, is on a continuum of verticality of reproductive fidelity, from internal cellular incorporation to fully horizontal inheritance (e.g., Drown & Wade 2014; Thies et al. 2016; Wade 2016; Viegl et al. 2022; §4.6).

140. A sampling would include: Griesemer 1998, 2000c, 2005, 2014, 2016; Dupré & O’Malley 2007, 2013; Godfrey-Smith 2009, 2011, 2013, 2016; Sterelny 2011; Booth 2014; Suárez & Stencel 2020. This may be partly because many philosophers discussing the topic, focused almost exclusively on the Adaptationist/KS school, are unfamiliar with the many ways of representing reproduction of higher-level traits within the Evolutionary Change model-types (consult Goodnight 2000; Goodnight 2020; Wade 2016; e.g., Bourrat 2021b, reinvents a very basic manner of reproducing group-level traits, glossed in §4.1, see other citations in that section; Griesemer, Wade, and Lloyd are Evolutionary Change researchers).

141. These theorists introduced a continuum notion spanning the concept of complete evolutionary interdependence (a holobiont, or full symbiosis) all the way down to complete evolutionary independence, conceptualized for a set of organisms, across a set of traits. If a pair of organisms has partial dependence, that is, if one organism evolved to depend on the other species, but that other species did not evolve to depend on the first species, it is called a “demibiont” on this continuum, halfway between a holobiont or symbiont and two totally independent species (Lloyd & Wade 2019). Note that this continuum is quite different from the continua described with regard to Godfrey-Smith’s reproducer (2009), described primarily in terms of reproduction. Demibionts, in contrast, are defined in terms of selective interaction, primarily, and only secondarily in terms of the distinct functional roles of whether they might also be reproducers, reconstitutors, or manifestors of adaptations. De Mazancourt, Loreau, & Dieckmann (2005) may also offer an alternative, Adaptationist/KS school perspective on modeling demibionts that may apply in some cases.

It should be noted here that the introduction of this continuum leaves untouched the issues involving what a biological “individual” is defined as. For example, Suárez & Stencel 2020 analyze these evolutionary dynamics and emphasize the necessity of using a particular agent’s “point of view” when discussing individuality; that is, from a part-oriented view, the holobiont has a certain property, but from the host-perspective, it has another (see discussion in their 2020 paper).

142. See also Dupré & O’Malley 2013; Gilbert, Sapp, & Tauber 2012