Sex and Sexuality

First published Thu Jul 5, 2018; substantive revision Fri May 5, 2023

Sex has received little attention in the history of western philosophy, and what it did receive was not good: Plato denigrated it, arguing that it should lead to something higher or better (Phaedrus, Symposium), Aristotle barely mentioned it, and Christian philosophers condemned it: Augustine argued that its pleasures are dangerous in mastering us, and allowed sex only for procreation (City of God, bk 14; On Marriage and Concupiscence), while Aquinas confined its permissibility to conjugal, procreative acts (Summa contra gentiles III.2; Summa theologica IIa–IIae). Immanuel Kant (Lectures on Ethics) considered it the only inclination that cannot satisfy the Categorical Imperative, and Jean-Paul Sartre claimed that sexual desire aims to capture the other’s freedom (1943: pt. III, ch. 3]). The Marquis de Sade (a philosopher of sorts) went to the opposite extreme, celebrating all types of sexual acts, including rape (1785; 1791; 1795). Only during contemporary times do philosophers, beginning with Bertrand Russell (1929) and including Sigmund Freud (1905), think of sex as generally good (see Soble 2006b and 2008, ch. 2 for this history; Belliotti 1993, Pt. I).

The philosophy of sex and sexuality includes conceptual issues about what sexual desire, sexual activity, and sexual pleasure are, and which of the three has conceptual priority. It also addresses the concepts of sexual orientation, preferences, and identity. Normative issues are paramount, too, especially the morality of sexual activity and sexual desire, where consent and objectification have taken pride of place. Normative issues also include whether some of the moral questions that confront sex are unique to sex, the nonmoral goodness (and badness) of sex, sexual perversion, and the value of sex.

1. Conceptual Issues

1.1 Sexual Desire

The concept of sexual desire is a central concept in the philosophy of sex, one connected to other central concepts, especially sexual attraction, sexual pleasure, sexual motives, arousal, and sexual activity (all of which make an appearance in the discussion below). It refers to a biological capacity that human beings have to be attracted to others and to seek sexual pleasure and activity, and it refers to specific instances of desiring specific people or activities (when, e.g., X experiences sexual desire for Y).

Five broad issues are prominent regarding sexual desire: (1) whether it is merely a biological drive, an intentional mental state, or both; (2) how it should be defined; (3) whether it is benign or malignant; (4) whether acting on it should be morally restricted to particular contexts; and (5) whether it admits of perverted forms. (Section 2 discusses (4) and (5).)

Definitions of sexual desire in terms of sexual pleasure seem to understand sexual desire as basically an appetite. On one such definition, “sexual desire” is “desire for contact with another person’s body and for the pleasure which such contact produces” (Goldman 1977, 268) or “sexual desire” is “the desire for certain bodily pleasures” (Primoratz 1999, 46; see also Halwani 2020; Soble 1991, 139–151 and 1996, 83). Thus, if X feels sexual desire, then X desires the touch of another person’s (Y’s) body and the sexual pleasure derived through that touch. An alternative definition avoids the conceptual involvement of another person, understanding sexual desire instead as desire for sexual pleasures, period. This accommodates cases in which the desire is not for the touch of another’s body: some cases of masturbation, voyeurism, and exhibitionism, for example.

These views have in common the idea that sexual desire is desire for brute bodily pleasures, possibly implying that sexual desire is merely a biological appetite. If so, they face the objection that they mischaracterize the nature of sexual desire, which should instead be understood as intentional through and through (Morgan 2003b). That is, whenever X sexually desires someone or something, X does so under a description: X desires Y because something about Y appeals to X. Even when X desires anonymous sex, X desires “the pleasure of anonymous sex” (Morgan 2003b). On the intentional view, sexual desire is no mere appetite but thoroughly infused with meaning.

Although the intentional view need not insist on the conceptual requirement of another person, its most common instantiation is the idea that sexual desire is interpersonal—that the agent’s sexual desire always seeks fulfillment with another person, or at least always ought to seek fulfillment with another person. Interpersonal sexual desire involves the “marshalling and directing of animal urges toward an interpersonal aim, and an interpersonal fulfillment” (Scruton 1986, 289) and might be thought to involve multiple levels of awareness: X desires Y, desires that Y desire X, desires to be aroused by Y’s desire of X, and so on (Nagel 1969). Some have thought it should, additionally, be directed to love (Scruton 1986: 339; cf. Giles 2008, ch. 3). A normative view that sexual desire ought to be interpersonal or interpersonal in a specific way might be rejected as an account of what sexual desire is. To be an account of what sexual desire is, an interpersonal account would need to articulate a normatively neutral interpersonal view.

The pleasure view of sexual desire, however, is not committed to understanding sexual desire as mere appetite. For example, if X wants to masturbate, X is not being led by blind instinct; X can be thinking, “I look forward to enjoying the sensations of rubbing my clitoris with my favorite vibrator as I fantasize about having sex with my neighbor.” In other words, “sexual desire can be focused or selective at the same time as being physical” (Goldman 1977, 279; Halwani 2020, 124–127).

The intentional view is plausible in that sexual desire can be quite complex and that its complexity is not captured well (or at all) by the pleasure view, given that human mentality infuses our most basic urges and appetites. But it depends on what we want the pleasure view to accomplish. If it is meant to capture the “essence” of sexual desire, the two are compatible with each other; if it is meant as a detailed description of the depth, complexity, and variety of the phenomenon, the pleasure view falls short. Given that definitions are not usually meant to convey the complexity of what they define, we should not expect a definition of sexual desire to be a full-blown theory of it, and we can agree that sexual desire is a complex phenomenon.

This does not mean that the pleasure view of sexual desire is correct, only that its aim or strategy need not be misguided. Indeed, depending on how it is stated, the pleasure view might be wrong. For example, if it conceptually ties sexual desire to sexual pleasure obtained through the touch of another person, sexual desire would then be necessarily interpersonal and might implausibly render many sexual desires as nonsexual, such as some masturbatory desires, voyeurism, and exhibitionism. Furthermore, the touch of another person’s body implies that zoophiliac desires are nonsexual. Necrophiliac desires would also be nonsexual if “person” refers to a living person. A non-interpersonal definition—for sexual pleasures, period—avoids such implications (Soble 1991 and later editions of the essay, the last being 2013a; Halwani 2018b, ch. 5).

Even a non-interpersonal pleasure view might face difficulties stemming from understanding desire in terms of what it seeks (sexual pleasure). Calling the approach that defines sexual desire in terms of what it seeks the “object-based strategy,” Rockney Jacobsen raises difficulties with it (2017, 30). One is defining “sexual pleasure” (see below), which the object-based strategy needs to do to be complete (2017, 33). Second, Jacobsen rejects the idea that all sexual desires are for sexual pleasure, giving the example of a couple who has sex to have a baby, not for pleasure (2017, 33; see also 1993). Third, our sexual partners would in principle be dispensable if there are other ways to attain the pleasure. This third objection is not moral—that we use our sexual partners as mere instruments—but ontological: sexual pleasure cannot be the only or common goal to all sexual desires otherwise the agent would be indifferent between the available ways of attaining sexual pleasure. Since this is not true, Jacobsen concludes that sexual desire is not solely for sexual pleasure (2017, 33).

Jacobsen prefers the “feature-based” approach, which defines “sexual desire” in terms of “sexual arousal,” which is the state of being turned on (and that we often find ourselves in), manifested in erections, lubricated vaginas, flushed faces, and “tingling earlobes” (Jacobsen 2017, 35; cf. Shaffer 1978; see also Jacobsen 2006, 226–227). So when X sexually desires something (another person, an object, or an activity), X desires it because it has a feature that X expects to affect X’s sexual arousal (Jacobsen 2017, 36). The feature-based strategy is supposed to be superior to the object-based one because it does not face the above-mentioned three difficulties.

The feature-based view, however, might pass the buck: either “sexual arousal” means what we usually mean by “sexual desire” (the examples of sexual arousal—erections, lubricated vaginas—might serve equally well as examples of sexual desire), or it does not. If the former, we would still need a definition of “sexual arousal,” much like we needed a definition of “sexual desire.” If the latter, we would need an account of what “sexual arousal” is, because if it is not the same as sexual desire, what exactly is it? Referring back to erections and lubricated vaginas will not do, because we may ask, “Why aren’t they states of sexual desire?” So defining “sexual desire” in terms of sexual arousal might be convincing only if we can understand “sexual arousal” independently of “sexual desire” (Halwani 2018b, 170–171).

Jacobsen’s example of the couple having sex to procreate merits discussion. Jacobsen intends it to be a case of sexual desire but not for sexual pleasure. However, the example is under-described because the desire can be understood as the nonsexual desire for procreation. To better address such cases, it is useful to distinguish sexual motives—motives to engage in an activity to experience sexual pleasure—from nonsexual motives, such as to conceive a child, to make someone jealous, to exact revenge, and to pass the time. One can argue that if the couple in question indeed experience sexual desire for the act or each other, their nonsexual motive for procreation does not replace their sexual motive and can be added to it. Although people can have sex from purely nonsexual motives (e.g., many cases of sex work), once we postulate the presence of sexual desire, the motive of seeking sexual pleasure is present. Motives for having sex, like motives for nonsexual activities, can be mixed, involving sexual and nonsexual ones.

One reason for the insistence on the sexual motive in understanding sexual desire is that if sexual desire is partly a biological or physiological state (even if in human beings it is also a mental, intentional state), it exerts its pull even with the presence of nonsexual motives (see Dent 1984, ch. 2; see also Hamilton 2001, ch. 9; Webber 2009). Another reason is that without the motive for sexual pleasure, the idea of sexual desire becomes so broad as to refer to any desire for sexual activity, with the danger of obfuscation: we would have to understand a sex worker’s desire for sex with a client as sexual, whereas in fact it is solely financial.

Sexual desire’s pull supports pessimist views of sexual desire. Although pessimism and optimism have moral implications – some of which are addressed below – they are based in how pessimism and optimism perceive the nature of sexual desire. Pessimists consider sexual desire morally dangerous and threatening to our rationality (including Christian philosophers such as Augustine and Thomas Aquinas, Plato, Kant, and Schopenhauer [1859, ch. 44], and, among contemporary philosophers of sex Alan Soble, whose views in “Sexual Use” [2013b; 2017b; 2022c] imply with some certainty that he is also a pessimist). Optimism considers sexual desire as generally benign and as bringing people together (it commands a large majority of the philosophers of sex, including Bertrand Russell 1929, passim; Irving Singer 2001, passim; and Martha Nussbaum 1995, 1998), though it recognizes that it can be morally problematic (Morgan 2003a). The issue, then, between pessimism and optimism concerns not whether sexual desire can be morally problematic, but whether it is so by its nature (Soble, with Halwani 2017, 5–8).

Sexual pessimism can be deep. Jean-Paul Sartre’s version is that sexual desire aims to capture a person in their entirety through their body. To do so, the agent must also make him or herself pure flesh by allowing sexual desire to “clog” their consciousness (Sartre 1943 [1956, 504]). Thus, “I make myself flesh in the presence of the Other in order to appropriate the Other’s flesh” (Sartre 1943 [1956, 506]). Another version of deep pessimism is Kant’s, which considers sexual desire to be for the sexual parts or body of another person, not the person’s “work and services” (Kant 1930 [1963, 163]; see also 1797, 6:424–6:427; see below the moral implications of this view). Sexual desire sets aside another’s humanity and targets their flesh. This does not mean that in desiring Y, X would be as happy with Y’s corpse or with Y unconscious as with Y alive (as Shrage and Stewart [2015, 6] claim); for X, Y-dead is not at all equally preferable to Y-alive. It also does not mean that during sex X treats Y as an object with no desires or interests of Y’s own. Instead, X treats those interests as merely instrumental to the satisfaction of X’s sexual desires (Halwani 2018b, ch. 8; Soble 2013b, 2017b; 2022c; see also Herman 1993; O’Neill 1985; Papadaki 2007). A phenomenology of sexual desire seems to support the above views, according to which in sexually desiring Y, X is attracted to the bodily, physical attributes of Y.

Sexual optimists claim that although sexual desire can be morally dangerous, it need not be and is usually not. They agree that it focuses on the body but do not see this as a problem. Sex intimately and pleasurably brings two (or more) people together. It is a force for good, establishing trust and strengthening human bonds. Unlike appetites,

sexual interest … [is] … an interpersonal sensitivity, one that enables us to delight in the mind and character of other persons as well as in their flesh… [S]ex may be seen as an instinctual agency by which persons respond to one another through their bodies. (Singer 1984, 382; see also Goldman 1977, 282–283; Russell 1929 [1970, passim])

For the optimist, Soble notes, “Sexual pleasure is … a valuable thing in its own right, something to be cherished and promoted because it has intrinsic and not merely instrumental value” (Soble, with Halwani 2017, 8).

1.2 Sexual Activity

It is difficult to define “sexual act” or “sexual activity.” Various proposed criteria face difficulties (Soble 2006a). This is especially so when closely related concepts (e.g., “having sex”) do not have the same extension. In ordinary language use, and according to some studies, people distinguish between having sex and sexual activity; they count many activities as sexual but not as having sex, such as solo masturbation, cyber-sex, and even oral sex (Soble 2006a,: 15–16). Solo masturbation counts as sexual activity and as a sexual act, but not as having sex, though Soble has recently argued that solo masturbation is on a continuum with other forms of sexual activity, both physically and psychologically (2022a). There are a few criteria to define “sexual activity” (Soble 2006a). One criterion is reproduction: for an activity to be sexual it has to be or aim at being reproductive. This faces obvious counter-examples, such as same-sex sexual activities and heterosexual oral and anal sex (Soble 2006a, 18–19). Another criterion is bodily contact: sexual activities are those that involve contact with sexual body parts (though we need to figure out what these parts are). This fails as a sufficient condition (doctors sometimes have to touch patients’ genitals) and as a necessary one (achieving orgasm during a phone-sex chat) (Soble 2006a, 19–20).

Sexual pleasure is a third criterion: “Those activities … are sexual … which give rise to sexual pleasure” (Gray 1978, 191–192). But the production of sexual pleasure is not necessary because many acts do not produce such pleasure; and this criterion conceptually rules out non-pleasurable sex (Soble 2006a, 21–22). It might also not be sufficient: a man might see someone on the street and feel a twinge of sexual pleasure (Soble 1996, 130). The presence of sexual pleasure in this case does not suffice for the man’s experience to be sexual activity (perhaps if the man continues to look the experience becomes a sexual activity because of his intention to keep looking; Soble 1996, 130).

Another criterion is intention, though we need to figure out what the intention is for. One reasonable candidate is “the intention to produce sexual pleasure in oneself or in another.” But this is not necessary: two people who have sexual intercourse to procreate engage in a sexual act. The experience, if any, of sexual pleasure is a by-product of the action (Soble 1996, 132). This criterion is also not sufficient. Suppose that X intends to produce sexual pleasure in Y by “whistling ‘Dixie’,” but what X does is not a sexual act (Soble 2006a, 22).

Another criterion for defining “sexual activity” is sexual desire:

sexual desire is desire for contact with another person’s body and for the pleasure which such contact produces; sexual activity is activity which tends to fulfill such desire of the agent. (Goldman 1977, 268)

A “sexual act” (or “activity”, in Goldman’s terms) is activity “which tends to fulfill” sexual desire.

The definition sounds right: what else is a sexual act if not one that satisfies or “tends to” satisfy sexual desire? But it faces counter-examples. Consider a sex worker performing fellatio on a man: while fellatio fulfills or tends to fulfill the man’s sexual desire, it does not fulfill or tend to fulfill the sex worker’s sexual desire if she does not desire the client (as is often the case). Thus satisfying sexual desire is not necessary for an activity to be sexual. Whether it is sufficient depends on what we mean by “satisfaction” or “fulfillment.” If it means “the desire is no longer felt for the time being” or “the desire is gone,” satisfying sexual desire would not be sufficient. Taking a cold shower, a powerful sleeping pill, or even focusing on something else might get rid of the sexual desire, yet these activities are not sexual. If “satisfying sexual desire” means, “the desire achieves its goal” (which is sexual fulfillment), satisfying sexual desire by a particular activity would be sufficient for that activity to be sexual, but the definition becomes circular. The criterion of sexual desire, then, does not succeed in defining “sexual act”.

By the above criteria, a definition of “sexual activity” is hard to find. One crucial reason might be that what we commonly think is a sexual act does not depend on one criterion: behavior, intentions, contact with specific body parts, etc., play a role depending on the context. This reason motivates a disjunctive definition, according to which an activity is sexual if and only if it is done from a sexual motive, it tends to fulfill sexual desire, it involves contact with the genitalia (or sexual body parts) or one or more of the parties to the activity, or it behaviorally fits paradigmatic cases of sexual activity (this is just one example of a disjunctive definition). Whether such a definition succeeds depends on various factors, such as that each disjunct is itself philosophically unproblematic, the list of disjuncts is exhaustive, and the definition is not too unwieldy to be plausible or useful.

Another reason why a definition of sexual activity is hard to find (and one that might go against a disjunctive definition) is that there are many concepts closely related to each other that nonetheless commonly mean different things. “To have sex” or “to engage in sex” almost always refer to sexual activity with at least one more person, whereas “engaging in a sexual activity” and “having a sexual experience” do not have this reference, and they are not common expressions. Thus, defining these concepts is tricky if we want the definitions to agree with common linguistic usage, or if we rely on such usage to formulate these definitions. More worrisome, if we need to define these concepts for help with practical, moral, and legal issues, the rift between them and common language should give us pause.

1.3 Sexual Pleasure

“Pleasure” refers to various phenomena: (a) physical sensations, with specific bodily locations (e.g., scratching an itch); (b) enjoyment, as when one takes pleasure in solving a jigsaw puzzle or lying under the sun (enjoyment does not have a specific bodily location, though the same phenomenon can be experienced as sensation and as enjoyment (e.g., lying under the sun); (c) a “pure” feeling that is felt all over but has no specific bodily location, and that need not be focused on a particular activity, such as being elated (Goldman 2016, 88); and (d) an attitude, to be “pleased at something”; the belief that what one is pleased at is good (Goldman 2016, 83–90).

We thus have four types of pleasure: pleasure-as-sensation, pleasure-as-enjoyment, pleasure-as-feeling, and pleasure-as-pro-attitude. All four concepts can be relevant to sex, but the first two are especially important, because each can be a type of sexual pleasure, whereas the third is typically consequent to sexual activity and the fourth is an attitude about sex. (a) The pleasure of orgasm is an obvious example of the first, and (b) enjoying sexual activity is a usual experience that people undergo. (c) One can experience elation because of having had great sex, and (d) one can feel pleased at that (Halwani 2020, 111–122).

Moreover, one or more parties to the act might experience pleasure-as-sensation, yet not enjoy the activity itself ((a) and (b)). One can experience the pleasurable sensations of sex and enjoy the act, yet feel repulsion at the act later and be displeased with oneself at having engaged in the act ((c) and (d)). We can also see how each pleasure has its opposite when it comes to sex: one can feel painful sensations during sex (e.g., anal penetration), one can endure a sexual act (not enjoy it), one can feel nausea at what one has done sexually, and one can have a negative attitude at one’s sexual activity.

Although orgasm does not exhaust the pleasures of sex, there is something to the idea that the pleasure of orgasm is unique. As a sensation, it is unique in the way it feels and in its intensity, though this feeling might differ between men and women, especially since women seem to experience various types of orgasm (Meston et al. 2004, 174–176; but see Wallen and Lloyd 2011, 780–783). Moreover, it contrasts with other sensation-pleasures in its physiological aspects and ability to be produced through genital stimulation. For example, the sensation of having one’s ear licked is not as such a pleasure and depends on whom one thinks is licking it. But the sensation of orgasm is not like this, which makes orgasm a pleasure that cuts across social layers, a bodily sensation unmediated by social meanings or concepts; “the trait of female orgasm [is] a physiological trait or reflex, not a social trait” (Lloyd 2005, 48). Of course its frequency, significance, and meaning vary socially, culturally, and contextually (Blair et al. 2017; Janssen 2007; Mah and Binik 2002). This feature of orgasm might explain how we can speak of sexual desire across times and cultures as a unified phenomenon, even though sexual desires and bodily sensations are socially and linguistically mediated.

If the pleasure of orgasm is unique, why do people usually prefer sex with someone else to masturbating, given that masturbating produces orgasms, often more intense than partnered sex? This shows that orgasm is not the only pleasure sought in sexual activity, not that its pleasure is not unique. Touching, smelling, kissing, and licking, for example, are other goals of sexual desire (Soble 1996, 85–86). We can even claim that people prefer the pleasure of orgasm through the other goals just mentioned.

The discussion of sexual pleasure is important in itself and, as we have seen, for understanding “sexual desire.” For example, according to Igor Primoratz, “sexual desire is sufficiently defined as the desire for certain bodily pleasures, period” (1999, 46). But which bodily pleasures? One answer is pleasure-as-sensation: those “experienced in the sexual parts of the body, i.e., the genitals and other parts that differentiate the sexes” (Primoratz 1999, 46). More generally, and accounting for sexual pleasures not located in the genitals, sexual pleasure

is the sort of bodily pleasure experienced in the sexual parts of the body, or at least related to those parts in that if it is associated with arousal, the arousal occurs in those parts. (Primoratz 1999, 46)

To distinguish a sexual from a nonsexual kiss, we ask which of the two is associated with arousal, and we understand the notion of arousal as essentially linked to the sexual body parts.

Because the above view relies solely on sexual pleasure-as-sensation, it would have to understand the other two types ultimately in terms of pleasure-as-sensation. That is, what makes sexual pleasure-as-enjoyment sexual is its connection to arousal. This implies that “sensory pleasure is more fundamental when it comes to sex” (Goldman 2016, 95).

In most activities, the pleasure and the activity are intertwined—we do not watch a movie and then feel the pleasure. Instead, we enjoy the movie as we watch it. The pleasures here are pleasures-as-enjoyment. Things are different with sex because of pleasure-as-sensation, specifically, orgasm. Sexual pleasure-as-enjoyment supervenes on sexual pleasure-as-sensation, and it often culminates in orgasm, a result that comes at the end of the activity (though the orgasm as an end differs between men and women). We can then see why some prominent philosophers have considered temperance and intemperance to be about bodily appetites satisfied especially through touch (Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics 1118a–1118b).

Sexual pleasures-as-enjoyment and as-feeling might thus be parasitic on sexual pleasures-as-sensations. The butterflies one feels in one’s stomach at the prospect of sex exist because of the expectation of sensual pleasure, and so does enjoying a sexual act. Sexual pleasure, especially as-sensation, stands out as a crucial motivation for having sex, and its concept supplies us with a good way of defining “sexual desire.”

Sexual pleasure need not be the primary motive for sexual activity, and people have sex for various reasons. Cindy Meston and David Buss identify 237 expressed reasons for why people have sex (though in a few cases they count the same reason more than once), including, in addition to sexual pleasure, finding the other person attractive, expressing love, feeling desired by the other, deepening the relationship, and trying new experiences (2007, 480). They are silent on how many of the nonsexual motives are mingled with the motive for sexual pleasure. This question is important because it gets to the issue of how primary the sexual motive is in having sex, given that not being attracted to one’s potential sexual partner, even being repulsed by them, might be powerful enough to trump other reasons for wanting sex (people might not have sex just to exercise, to boost their self-image, etc.).

1.4 Sexual Preferences and Orientation

Sexual orientation is commonly understood as a person’s standing sexual preference for men, women, or both. It is a basic preference, unlike, say, the preference for hair color or buttock size. It is also an organizing preference: other sexual preferences are built upon it (Stein 1999, ch. 2). A foot fetishist is either gay, straight or bisexual, before he is a foot fetishist, though it is an empirical question whether there can be sexual orientations for body parts (or objects) regardless of the gender or sex of the person’s body part (Stein 1999, ch. 2; Wilkerson 2013). It is unclear, however, how to distinguish orientations from mere preferences; saying that the former are basic whereas the latter are not seems to merely reflect common views of the distinction (Dembroff 2016, 12; Stock 2019, 315). Halwani (forthcoming) argues that, given the importance we attach to orientations, it is a necessary condition for a sexual desire to be an orientation that its fulfillment is needed for the well-being of the person with the desire, whereas preferences are not tied to well-being in such strong ways.

Mere sexual preferences vary tremendously, targeting people, objects, activities, and sexual positions, probably because they are a function of the person’s individual history and the available social and cultural options (on this variety, see Love 1992). Some preferences are considered perverted (e.g., coprophilia), some immoral (e.g., pedophilia), and some both. Yet with others it is not so obvious, such as sexual preferences for members of particular races or ethnic groups. Perhaps X’s preference for Asian women is innocent, on a par with the preference for tall people. But it might also indicate an ethical fault if, say, racially ugly stereotypes inform it (Barn 2022; Halwani 2017b [2022]; Kershnar 2019; Zheng 2016).

Returning to sexual orientation, some philosophers have claimed that its popular conception relies on dubious assumptions (Corvino 2006a; Dembroff 2016).

(1)
It assumes three basic orientations: homosexual, heterosexual, and bisexual (or only two if one thinks, as does Kathleen Stock, that bisexuality is not a third orientation but an amalgam of the other two, such that bisexuals have two sexual orientations, heterosexuality and homosexuality [2019, 298–300]).
(2)
It includes the gender or sex of the person who has the orientation as an essential element of the orientation; X’s being gay means that X has the same sex/gender as the target of the orientation.
(3)
It is ambiguous between sex and gender: is a straight man attracted to the gender or the sex of women? And is the man straight because of his gender or sex?
(4)
It assumes a binary of gender/sex for both parties, excluding people who exist outside the binary.
(5)
It is ambiguous between sexual and emotional attraction: if a man is emotionally attracted to other men, does that mean that he is gay or something else?
(6)
It is silent on what counts as the basic components of the orientation: is it behavior, desires, or fantasies?
(7)
Finally, it assumes the cross-temporal and cross-cultural existence of the three sexual orientations: there were gay men and gay women in 15th century Russia just as there were in 21st century North America, albeit with adjustment for cultural variances.

(1) Is there a good reason to believe that there are only three sexual orientations? Some men are attracted to people with female features from the waist up but male features from the waist down (a penis), thus not easily accommodated by the above three-way division of sexual orientations. It is also unclear whether the many men who are attracted to both young boys and women—this is true of many cultures around the world, past and present—are bisexual. It is also possible that there are age- and species-orientations, such as pedophilia and zoophilia. Such potential orientations threaten to seriously expand the number of sexual orientations (consider that genuine zoophiles—people who have long-standing desires to have sex with nonhuman animals—will have as many sexual orientations as there are different types of animals to which they are attracted (Wilkerson 2013)). Whether we can maintain that there are only three (or two) sexual orientations depends on the answers to these questions and our tolerance for exceptions to the three. It also depends on the reasons for classifying people by sexual orientation (see Andler 2020; Dembroff 2016; Stock 2019).

(2) It is unclear why the gender/sex of the person with the orientation should be a component of the conception of sexual orientation. Under the popular conception, if a formerly straight man is currently a woman (after transitioning), they would now be a lesbian (assuming that their sexual desires for women does not change). But if we omit the person’s own gender from the conception, the person’s sexual orientation remains the same. Perhaps the answer to this issue depends on the political and moral gains reaped by conceiving of sexual orientation in one or the other way (Dembroff 2016; Stock 2019, 307–313).

(3) The lack of distinction between sex and gender makes it hard to classify cases such as this: X is attracted to Y who is anatomically male (sex) but who self-presents as a woman (gender). Assume that X’s own gender and sex are male. Then, whether we claim that X is gay or is straight, we face obstacles: if X is gay, X would not be attracted to someone who appears as a woman. If X is straight, X would not be attracted to someone who is anatomically male. The popular concept of orientation leaves such cases unclassified (Corvino 2006a; Wilkerson 2013; but see Stock 2019, 303–307 for a way to accommodate gender attractions on the sex-based account of sexual orientations). The difficulty of such cases has led some philosophers to include both sex and gender as the bases of sexual orientation (Diamond 2022; Dembroff 2016). Perhaps the distinction between orientations and preferences is relevant here, such that gender-based attractions might be considered preferences, whereas sex-based attractions are orientations (or vice versa).

(4) Connected to the previous point is that the popular understanding of sexual orientation assumes a binary conception of sex/gender, albeit one that can include trans people. A straight woman is a woman, cis or trans, who is attracted to men, cis or trans (a cisperson is someone whose gender identity—e.g., being a man—matches their biological sex—being male). Thus, there is no room for people who are gender fluid or whose gender or sex identification exists outside the binary (Dembroff 2016).

(5) Both the American Psychological Association (APA) and the Human Rights Campaign understand “sexual orientation” as including emotional attraction. The former’s definition states,

Sexual orientation refers to an enduring pattern of emotional, romantic, and/or sexual attractions to men, women, or both sexes. (American Psychological Association, Introduction to “Sexual Orientation and Homosexuality”, Other Internet Resources)

Thus, the APA believes that a man would be straight were he to be emotionally (even if neither romantically nor sexually) attracted to a woman. Yet it is possible that he is nonetheless sexually attracted to men, a result that leads to conceptual trouble. Perhaps keeping the conception of sexual orientation limited to sexual attraction so as to avoid such trouble is better (though adding romantic attractions is plausible, given that they usually include a sexual dimension) (Dembroff 2016).

(6) The popular conception of sexual orientation is not so crude as to rely solely on behavior, but it is silent about on what we should rely. Desires and fantasies are obvious candidates. But occurrent desires are not a good guide to sexual orientation: a shepherd can sexually desire sex with a sheep, but he need not be a zoophile, even were his desire for the sheep to recur. David—a straight guy—might desire oral sex from another man (Tom) or other men. Recourse to “enduring desires,” as in the APA’s definition, might not do the trick if the conditions under which David desires oral sex from other men recur. Other information, such as counter-factual information as to what the person would do under such-and-such conditions (e.g., Stein’s “ideal conditions”; 1999, ch. 2), is needed—if David prefers a woman’s mouth under ideal conditions, then he is straight. But stating these conditions is tough. What if David prefers the way that Tom performs oral sex? David might, under some conditions, still opt for Tom (Corvino 2006a; cf. Díaz-León, 2022).

Perhaps fantasies are a better guide if there is a good way to distinguish between fantasies that indicate the person’s sexual orientation and those that don’t (after all, David’s desire for Tom is a fantasy of sorts; Storms 1980). This might push us to ideal conditions again, to distinguish between someone’s real and “fake” fantasies. Or we might rely on initial sexual impulses: what sexually catches the eye of someone, without much thought: David does desire Tom’s oral skills, but what captures David’s sexual eye are women, not men.

(7) Philosophers and historians of sex are roughly divided into social constructionists and essentialists. Weak social constructionism claims that the concepts of “homosexuality,” “heterosexuality,” “natural sexuality,” and similar concepts are limited to a specific time period and geographical region. This version is weak because it is only concerned with how sexuality is conceptualized: there might have been homosexuals in ancient Greece, but the ancient Greeks did not think about them using the concept “homosexual.” Strong social constructionism—more in line with Michel Foucault’s views (1976)—claims that the very existence of homosexual and heterosexual orientations is geographically and temporally limited; our concepts of “homosexual” and “heterosexual” do not refer to anything when used to refer to other times and regions. Essentialists claim that homosexuals, heterosexuals, and bisexuals have existed in various times and cultures (see Card 1995, ch. 3; Corvino 1997, pt. III; Corvino 2006b; De Cecco 1981; Mohr 1992, ch. 7; Stein 1992, 1999, ch. 4; Wilkerson 2013).

Essentialism has difficulty accounting for the historical and cultural evidence: Were all the ancient Athenians who had sex with boys and women bisexuals? Possibly, but then why, in such social configurations, do we find a preponderance of bisexual men? If they were not all bisexuals, what were they? Neither “homosexual” nor “heterosexual” seems adequate. Perhaps then such men had an altogether different sexual orientation. Perhaps one option is to argue that most Athenian men were bisexuals, and their preponderance can be explained by the lack of social strictures that most people be straight, and their preferences for male youths, as opposed to male adults, can be explained by another set of social strictures, namely, that men should be sexually attracted to femininity. This explanation renders essentialism intact while allowing for a robust role for social factors to shape sexual desires. Related to this, essentialism has to be universally true for it to be true at all, for if it excludes some cultures and times, it concedes the truth of social constructionism. But if true of every single culture, it would be a very strong thesis, and the need for evidence becomes more urgent. Perhaps, then, some version of social constructionism is true. Our sexual desires are biologically rigid enough to target mostly members of our species, but not so rigid as to reflect only our three basic sexual orientations, though social constructionism would have to properly accommodate evolutionary biology’s “designing” us for procreation (Halperin 1990, ch.1).

Philosophers have only recently shown increased interest in asexuality and asexuals, even though non-philosophers had already started to address it (Bogaert 2012, 2015). Asexuals are not sexually attracted to others (they are thus not to be confused with incels, who are sexually attracted to others). According to Anthony Bogaert, this does not mean that they do not experience sexual desires, do not engage in sexual activity, or do not experience romance (see also Brunning and McKeever 2021; Eaton and Szustak 2022). Asexuals experience sexual desire and arousal because sexual desire is physiological and its (successful) satisfaction can yield physical pleasure (Bogaert 2012, 21, 74). They also sometimes masturbate for the sheer pleasure of it or to release tension, including while fantasizing, though the fantasies are disconnected from the asexual person who is fantasizing: they “view themselves as not being part of the sexual acts they are fantasizing about or viewing” (Bogaert 2012, 63).

Luke Brunning and Natasha McKeever accept the basics of Bogaert’s view; they understand attraction as an “involuntary way of being inclined toward things around us” (2021, 499). So to be sexually attracted to others is to experience them as “‘inviting’ certain forms of sexual engagement” (2021, 499). Asexuals, then, do not experience other people as sexually “inviting.” Understanding asexuality as lack of sexual attraction, not as lack of sexual desire or capacity to experience sexual pleasure, coheres with the above understanding of sexual desire as seeking pleasure, except that in the case of asexuals, feeling sexual desire is not triggered by sexual attraction (to anyone). It raises, however, the issue of the aptness of using the label “asexual” to refer to people who can experience sexual desire and pleasure. Bogaert argues that understanding asexuality in terms of (lack of) attraction helps us see it as a sexual orientation and it better explains the type of people under consideration—that is, as a type of person, asexuals experience lack of sexual attraction, not lack of sexual desire (2012, 22).

Whether asexuality is a sexual orientation is a complex issue. Stock claims that asexuality is not an orientation but an absence of one (2019, 300). Others argue that if orientations are patterns of attraction, asexuality is an orientation in that asexuals also evince a pattern. Moreover, their lack of sexual attraction is stable and identity conferring, which seems to assimilate it to an orientation (Brunning and McKeever 2021, 4). But the claim that asexuality is an orientation relies mostly on political and moral reasons, in that thinking of it as an orientation might secure asexuals social and legal protections (Brunning and McKeever 2021, 4; Eaton and Szustak 2022, 134).

1.5 Sexual Identity

The concept of “identity” is a philosophical minefield: identity can be descriptive or normative; public or personal; with explanatory power or inert. The distinction between first person and third person attributions of identity helps us see this. When Amy asserts that she is gay, she could be describing herself (informing someone of who she is); she could be asserting a political or cultural position, especially if the identity in question is threatened by the powers that be (“I am gay,” uttered as a way of resisting oppression); or she could be making sense of herself, either to herself or to others: “I am gay” helps Amy see herself or others see her more coherently. Third parties can make the same assertion about Amy in any of these ways.

The second and third ways are interesting because they allow both choice with respect to the identity and disagreement about its assertion. Amy can choose to adopt, be indifferent to, or reject the identity of being gay, and she can choose to use it (or not) to make sense of herself. She might fail to identify with her homosexuality because it is not important to her, because she does not find gay cultural ways appealing, because she does not think highly of gays, because she is ashamed, because she is religious, etc. This allows for healthy disagreements with Amy’s decisions. And Marcia, a straight woman, might be wrong to assert her straight identity in a climate in which gay people are oppressed, much like a person might be wrong to assert his white identity in a racist society, also allowing for disagreements with her (see Alcoff 2006, esp. pt. I; Andler 2021; Appiah 2005, ch. 3; Halwani 2006; Lance & Tanesini 2000; Ozturk 2017; Wilkerson 2007). In this way, it becomes an interesting question—albeit one that goes against everyday usage—whether one can be heterosexual and gay or homosexual and straight. Perhaps not, if being homosexual is necessary (but not sufficient) for being gay, and if being heterosexual is necessary (but not sufficient) for being straight.

Matthew Andler has recently argued, by trying to eliminate rival accounts, for a “cultural theory of queer sexual identity.” (“Queer” is an unclear concept, but in the hands of academics it generally means any gender identity, sexual orientation, or sexual identity that diverges, especially intentionally, from cisheterosexist ways of thinking and living; see Hall 2017 for discussion.) According to Andler, one has a queer sexual identity “in virtue of (i) being excluded from straight culture and (ii) being such that according to the constitutive norms of queer culture the individual ought to be included in queer culture” (2022, 124). Whether such an account succeeds depends on whether other accounts have been successfully argued against. It also depends on how monolithic and rigid we take such cultures to be, and so which of their aspects are exclusionary and which are not. Moreover, this account implies that there are no queer identities in those possible worlds in which gay and straight people exist but in which heterosexual cultures do not exclude queer people. It seems plausible that in such worlds there are queer identities (though “queer” would not have the same oppositional meaning as it does in the actual world).

The notion of sexual identity might help address the desired goals behind the claim that asexuality is a sexual orientation, for one can argue that even if asexuality is not an orientation, asexuals still have a sexual identity, and it is their identity that supports calls for their social and legal protections.

2. Normative Issues

2.1 Good and Bad Sex

“Good sex” and “bad sex” can refer to pleasurable as well as to morally, aesthetically, practically, and legally good or bad sex and to natural and unnatural sex (Soble 2008, 85–87; Soble, with Halwani 2017, 8–16).

It is unclear what aesthetic sex is (it is in need of philosophical exploration), but applying some common aesthetic concepts, such as “unity”, “coherence”, and “completeness”—concepts used in defining the aesthetic experience (Beardsley 1982, chs. 1, 5, 16; cf. Levine 2006; Singer 2001, ch. 5)—might be useful: a sexual act can be coherent, unified, and fulfills the parties’ expectations (this is Monroe Beardsley’s view of completeness; 1982, 85–86). Assuming these three are the only components of aesthetic experiences, sexual activity can provide an aesthetic experience to its participants. Other concepts, such as “beauty” and its opposites (e.g., “dullness”, “monotony”, “the disgusting”, “the insipid”) can also be relevant, though whether they retain their aesthetic sense when applied to sex is the question. This last point is as true, if not more, of “pleasure”: Is there such a thing as aesthetic pleasure, and can it be a property of sexual acts? (Shusterman 2021 provides historical in-depth treatment of the relationship between sex and aesthetics).

Sex can also be practically or pragmatically good or bad: a “sexting” politician can ruin his career, unprotected sexual intercourse risks contracting HIV, sex without contraception risks (undesired) pregnancy, and public sex risks arrest. Practically good sex does not lead to bad results and might have positive outcomes: a sense of rejuvenation, loss of calories, or a wanted pregnancy.

“Good sex” most obviously refers to pleasurable sex. A sex act can be good or bad depending on the amount and intensity of the pleasure or pain it provides (Vannoy 1980, ch. 3), though pain in sex can contribute to its pleasure (e.g., in bondage and sadomasochism). We must keep in mind the different senses of “pleasure” that can come into play, especially pleasure-as-sensation and pleasure-as-enjoyment.

2.2 Sex and Morality

Sexual activity is either morally permissible or impermissible. Natural Law philosophers (whose stance can be aptly described as conservative) think that sexual acts are permissible only in particular contexts, especially in marital or love relationships. Many take their cue from Aristotle and Aquinas to argue that our bodily organs have a telos that dictates to what ends we should pursue sexual activity. Edward Feser (2015), for example, defends “the perverted faculty argument,” according to which to flourish we must follow the procreative ends of our sexual organs, which include not only begetting children but also raising them to adulthood. Human beings who, for example, fornicate or have same-sex sex pervert this faculty. More recently, Feser (2022) has argued that advocates of his position of teleological essentialism approach sexual ethics from metaphysical bases so different from those of liberal philosophers that they are talking past one another.

Other Natural Law philosophers argue that our sexual organs must form a unity of the two partners in a way compatible with the end of procreation (see Finnis 1993, 2011; George 2003; George & Bradley 1995; Hsiao 2015; Lee & George 1997; Pruss 2000, 2012). The main reasons are the theory’s view of marriage, which, following Thomas Aquinas, is understood as a basic good, and its view of marital sexual acts as reproductive and unitive, as two-in-one flesh communions. Only marital sex—i.e., sex acts between married partners who do it from the specific motive of the good of marriage (what this means, though, is unclear)—is considered morally permissible, even good. Thus, although consent to the sexual act is necessary, it is not sufficient: the sex has to be done from the motive of marital unity.

Three prominent objections to the above Natural Law views are (1) that the view of marriage is both undefended and implausible; (2) that the connection between reproduction or biological two-in-one union and the morality of sex is unclear, and (3) that it is unclear why other goods, such as sexual pleasure, are ruled out as basic goods (Koppelman 2008; see also Biggar & Black 2000). Recently, Kurt Blankschaen (2020) has argued that Natural Law has the internal resources to not condemn same-sex sex because we can view the unitive aspect of sex as a genus with various species, one of which is procreation, much like the genus of tree bark is to protect trees, but such that some do so by photosynthesis while others do not.

Marriage need not be the only context to which sex ought to be confined. Non-Natural Law philosophers have considered love to be such a context (most importantly Roger Scruton 1986). A view confining sex to love need not insist also on only two partners to the relationship, or on being of different sex/gender. It requires only the presence of love. Other versions require only affection or a mutually respectful relationship (Hampton 1999; Nussbaum 1995). On such views, consensual casual sex between two strangers is impermissible.

Why must factors such as love and a mutually respectful relationship be present for the permissibility of sex? One prominent reason is that sex is somehow morally dangerous. Sex might make us treat our sexual partners as objects, and the power of sex might make us engage in sex with the wrong people, in the wrong circumstances, etc. So something is needed to minimize or erode this danger. Love or a respectful relationship minimizes these risks (Nussbaum 1995, 227–231).

Alan Soble, addressing Martha Nussbaum’s (1995) view that objectification and respect are compatible with each other, argues that love or a respectful relationship does not prevent lovers or partners from objectifying each other during the sex (Soble 2017b, 304–309; 2022c, 406–411; see below for discussion of objectification). Moreover, views about the ability of respect or love to curb sexual objectification might be too optimistic: if sex is so powerful or mind-numbing, being in a relationship might not attenuate its power or control it effectively (e.g., partners soon start eyeing people outside the relationship).

There are other normative questions besides the question of when sexual activity is permissible:

(1)
Can sexual activity be assessed as good or bad, not merely permissible or impermissible?
(2)
Are there sexual obligations—moral obligations to engage in sexual activity?
(3)
Is sex morally special or do the same general moral rules and norms that apply to nonsexual domains equally apply to sex?

The answer to (1) is “Yes.” To give three examples, sexual acts can be done generously (e.g., paying extra sexual attention to one’s partner), caringly (e.g., expressing tenderness), or fairly (e.g., performing oral sex on one’s partner because the partner performed oral sex on one). Moreover, these generous, caring, and fair motives need not compete with the motive of sexual pleasure: knowing that one’s partner enjoys the extra attention, one lavishes it on them during the sex. Thus, sexual activity can be morally evaluated as good, not merely permissible (because consensual).

The language of virtue is relevant here, since acting generously, caringly, or fairly can express virtuous motives (see Halwani 2003, ch. 3, 2018a, 2018b, ch. 7; Morgan 2003a). Sexual activity, including consensual sexual activity, can also manifest various vices. Consider the following examples.

  1. A student offers their teacher sex for a high grade (the teacher consents).
  2. A guy has sex with another guy during a wake (neither is directly related to the dead person).
  3. Lisa hates yet desires Nancy; she wants to sexually humiliate her; Nancy knows this but desires Lisa, and she does not care. They have sex during which Lisa heaps verbal abuse on the trembling-with-desire Nancy.
  4. Omar is a handsome gay man who loves having sex with many guys to feed his ego. At the end of the day, all spent, he agrees to a seventh hookup because the guy is a catch. He tells the guy, “You are my seventh today, so I might not be very energetic”. The guy says, “This is actually a turn-on”.
  5. Isabel has undesired sex with her boyfriend so as not to deal with his foul mood (he is not abusive, but accustomed to getting his way), even though she knows that she need not agree to sex every time he wants it.

Each case has the participants’ consent, yet each sexual act is bad in some aspect (though not all are seriously wrong) because it exhibits a vice: unprofessionalism, intemperance, maliciousness (and possibly cruelty and demeaningness; cf. Morgan 2003a), vanity, and cowardice, respectively. Thus, consent might not be sufficient for the act’s goodness, though perhaps it is for its permissibility (depending on the seriousness of the harm or vice).

(2) Sexual and romantic relationships provide the strongest cases for sexual obligations, because sexual activity is an expected and crucial aspect of (especially monogamous) relationships. Note that ordinarily threatening harm to someone unless they have sex is morally wrong, but threats to end a relationship unless the other party has sex (“Have sex with me or I will break up with you”) are not obviously wrong, further indicating that sexual obligations exist (Anderson 2013; Soble 2017a, 2022b; Wertheimer 2003, ch. 12).

The difficult question is whether there are sexual obligations outside such relationships. If having sex is a basic need, perhaps plausible cases involve a health caretaker alleviating the sexual needs of a patient. One can argue that although under the usual conception of “health care professional” (e.g., a nurse) there are no such duties, society should create a category of such professionals to meet these needs—if they are indeed basic.

Some philosophers have argued that there are positive rights to sex, especially for those who, due to disabilities, are unable to find willing sexual partners without having to pay them. The idea is that because sexual activity and pleasure with another person are crucial to a minimally decent life and not adequately substituted for by masturbation, those who are sexually deprived are entitled to some form of partnered sexual activity (Appel 2010; Firth 2019). Others have argued that not all sexually excluded people are disabled and not all disabled people are sexually excluded, so the issue of sexual exclusion cuts across that of disability (Earp and Moen 2016; Liberman 2018; Shakespeare 2022).

The argument for sexual positive rights has been met with resistance on two fronts. Some have raised concerns about women supplying sex for men given a history of sexism and misogyny, even if the men are disabled (Jeffreys 2008; [see DeBoer 2015 for replies]; Liberman 2022). Others have argued that such rights to partnered sex imply that some people’s rights to sexual autonomy will be violated, so there are no rights to partnered sex (Danaher 2020; DiNucci 2011, 2020; Liberman 2022; Srinivasan 2021, ch. 3). The most that is conceded is that if there are rights to sex, they are not to partnered sex, but to a bundle of services that can help people be more sexually included, such as validation of a group’s sexuality, sex education, sexual toys and instruments, including sex robots, and even professional assistance with masturbating or assistance with having sex with someone for those who cannot perform these acts on their own (the assistants themselves would not be part of the sexual act) (Danaher 2020, 2022; DiNucci 2017; Liberman 2022). It is unclear, however, once sexual partners are off the table, whether what remains (e.g., sex education) are proper objects of rights to sex.

Still, sexual obligations might exist even without corresponding rights, based in general duties of benevolence—attending to someone’s sexual needs would be similar to attending to someone’s hunger (Soble 2017a, 454–55; 2022b, 546). But it is unclear who would fulfill these obligations, what their fulfillment would amount to (is masturbating the beneficiary of the duty enough?), and whether the gender and sexual orientation of the parties matters or should matter. These are difficult issues, especially since the extent to which someone’s sexual needs are properly met does depend on their sexual desires and preferences: a straight man’s needs might not be met by a gay man, and straight women meeting men’s sexual needs is troubling given sexism and sex-based oppression. Moreover, if X’s sexual need cannot be alleviated by X masturbating, how the needs are to be met is a pressing question, and so is determining the depth of a sexual need to see whether it gives rise to an obligation. Ultimately, such sexual duties might face the same crucial objection that the right to partnered sex faces, namely, that people’s right to sexual autonomy is so important that it is incompatible with the existence of sexual duties.

Even if we have no obligations to satisfy others’ sexual needs, we might nevertheless have sexual obligations to ourselves to develop or dampen certain sexual preferences. Pedophiles, for example, might have an obligation to change their preferences, not merely to refrain from acting on them. Other examples include obligations to change one’s preferences (or their lack) for, say, members of a particular race, ethnic group, age group, body type, etc. These are more controversial, however, because it is not clear that such preferences are bad to begin with (Barn 2022; Halwani 2017b [2022]; Kershnar 2019; Zheng 2016), and some might not be under our control at all (e.g., preference for certain age groups) or as easily changed as others are (e.g., for skin color).

(3) According to Alan Goldman, “[N]o conduct otherwise immoral should be excused because it is sexual conduct, and nothing in sex is immoral unless condemned by rules which apply elsewhere as well” (1977, 280). This is true at a general level because the same general moral features (e.g., harm) affect sexual acts. But it might be false at more specific levels: sexual violation of the body by a penis or an object makes the violation distinct. This has to do with how one experiences sexual bodily violations, thereby making sexual consent a crucial moral aspect of sexual relations (Wertheimer 2003, 107–112). Moreover, if Kant is right, the objectifying nature of sexual desire makes it unique. If virtue ethicists are right, actions can be right and wrong because they are sexually temperate and intemperate: seducing the ex-boss’s husband is vengeful or intemperate, depending on the motive (Carr 2007; Halwani 2003, ch. 3, 2018a, 2018b, ch. 7; Piers 1999; see also the essays in SE). The specialness of sex might be explained by sexual desire’s rootedness in biology and its being directed at the bodies of other human beings (Dent 1984: ch. 2 and passim).

2.2.1 Consent

Whether one is conservative, liberal, or progressive about the permissibility of sexual acts, consent looms large. Most philosophers believe that informed and voluntary consent is necessary and sufficient for the moral permissibility of sex (Archard 1998; Mappes 1987; Miller & Wertheimer 2010; Primoratz 2001; Wertheimer 2003; but see Pateman 1988), though there are dissenters who debate consent’s sufficiency (see below).

Consent is crucial because (a) it transforms an otherwise wrong act into a permissible one (though not necessarily into a good act); (b) in heterosexual sex, men and women might importantly differ when it comes to sex; and (c) sexual violation is typically experienced as very harmful (Wertheimer 2003, 119–121).

(a) has been especially important to philosophers. Consent’s being morally transformative means that it changes an action’s moral status from impermissible to permissible. If John takes a book from Lisa’s library, the act can be one of robbery or one of lending (or gifting) depending on whether Lisa has consented. One issue here is whether consent to sexual contact is morally special or different from other types of transactions, including nonsexual bodily contact (Chadha 2022, 218–219). For example, is it especially important to consent to sexual penetration as opposed to, say, a shoulder massage or even a colonoscopy? Explanations of the importance of sexual consent that rely on our special relationship to our bodies, as opposed to our relationship to external objects like books (Gardner and Shute 2000), fail to distinguish between consent to sexual bodily contact and consent to nonsexual bodily contact. Perhaps evolutionary explanations are needed (Wertheimer 2003, ch. 2).

The claim that valid or genuine consent by all the parties to a sex act is necessary and sufficient for the moral permissibility of the sex act can put as follows:

X’s sexual activity with Y is morally permissible if, and only if, Y validly consents to the sexual activity.

One crucial question is what it means for Y to validly consent. It seems that Y has to do something, to perform some action, that amounts to consent. On the “purely mental view,” the action can be purely mental, such as a thought to the effect that “I consent to this act.” But more than mere thoughts, decisions, or beliefs might be needed to explain what is wrong with cases in which X proceeds to have sex with Y even though Y, who consents, does not clearly communicate their consent to X. Hence we get the “communications view,” according to which X wrongs Y if there is no clear communication to proceed with the sexual activity (Chadha 2022; Dougherty 2015, 2018). An important issue here is what it would take for Y to clearly communicate their consent to X. Is enthusiasm, for example, necessary or sufficient to convey one’s consent? (Pineau 1989; Dougherty 2022)

Another crucial issue is what Y is consenting to exactly when Y consents to sexual activity. For the consent to be valid, the activity engaged in has to be the one consented to, not some other activity. This seemingly obvious point raises the thorny question of what constitutes a sexual act and how many acts of consent are needed for a compound or extended sexual act, one that is made up of parts (kissing, then oral sex, then penetrative sex, and so on).

There are additional elements of valid consent, the two most important ones being lack of coercion and lack of deception. Coercion undermines the voluntary aspect of consent, and deception undermines its informed aspect (Dougherty 2013; Mappes 1987). Other elements are being of sound mind and having the cognitive and emotional maturity to consent (Chadha 2022, 223). After all, we can imagine cases in which neither coercion nor deception is involved, yet one is too young or too inebriated to consent. If “informed consent” means simply receiving or having the requisite information, we might need additional criteria like maturity and soundness of mind. If it means something stronger, such as “properly processing the information,” perhaps maturity and soundness of mind are redundant. A final element of valid consent might be lack of exploitation, especially in unequal relationships, given that the stronger party might take advantage of the weaker one despite neither coercing nor deceiving the weaker one (Archard 1994; Mappes 1987; for criticism of Archard’s views, see Boonin 2022).

Is valid consent sufficient for a sexual act’s moral permissibility? The views discussed in 2.2 that restrict permissible sex to an affectionate, mutually respectful, or marital context take consent to be necessary but not sufficient. Moreover, if sexual desire by nature objectifies, as the Kantian view has it, then the consent of the parties is insufficient because consent to sex is consent to a wrong action (see 2.2.2).

A different reason for rejecting the sufficiency of consent is harm. Setting aside harm to third parties, if sexual activity leads to harm to one or more of its parties, then consent might not be sufficient. This view is especially plausible when it comes to women, given that many women engage in consensual sex that is motivated by nonsexual desires, such as not wanting to put their partner in a foul mood. According to one account, the harm is psychological, especially to their autonomy (West 1995). This implies that prostitutes are harmed because of their consent to undesired sex, an implausible implication. However, even if specific formulations of the view are implausible (such as West’s; see Soble 1996, 37–39; Wertheimer 2003, passim), this does not negate the plausible claim that if sexual activity harms one or more of the consenting parties, the activity is wrong. One might object that this argument is paternalistic, telling people not to engage in sex when the sex is harmful (Soble 1996, 37–39). This objection is correct in that although harmful sex gives the participants a reason to not engage in it, it cannot be used to argue that social or legal forces should prevent this action (Wertheimer 2003, 130–131).

Despite disagreement about the sufficiency of consent, the necessity of consent is typically taken for granted by philosophers. But its necessity can be questioned. For instance, if we accept a “casual view” of sexual pleasure, “that sexual pleasure is morally like any other pleasure” (Benatar 2002, 192; see also Beckwith 2022), consent might not be necessary. For if sexual pleasure is insignificant, a person’s consent may be bypassed if there are cases, bizarre as they might seem, in which forcing someone, or not requiring their consent, to have sex with another person might be important or needed (to the former person, especially). This might occur with people with impaired abilities (see below), or even with minors if an ambitious parent thinks that it is a good idea for their child to experience some sexual activity (not necessarily intercourse) with another person (Benatar 2002, 194–195).

However, we need not accept a single view of sexual pleasure as casual or significant; we can instead argue that, depending on between whom the pleasure occurs, it might or might not be casual (Halwani 2022a, 48–51). Moreover, if, as seems to be the case, people’s considered beliefs about sex are that sex is significant (imagine claiming that incest or sex with animals is “cool” because sex is casual), the casual view of sex might very well be wrong, in which case the consensus surrounding the necessity of consent remains intact.

Why is sex significant? Sex is significant in that it involves one’s most important private space: one’s body. Suppose that X is a social person, always happy to have guests over at X’s house. One day, X discovers that some people have entered X’s apartment and used it to entertain themselves. X feels justifiably violated, indicating that the violation of private spaces is a serious wrong. If this is true of an apartment, it is true of one’s body, especially since sexual violation usually involves the insertion of something in the body. This explains why sexual violations are experienced as deeply traumatic (Wertheimer 2003, ch.5). Sex is significant because it pertains to one’s most important and private space (cf. Brogaard 2015, 188–190). Note that even if (or when) sex is significant, it does not follow that it must be experienced only in the context of love or mutually respectful relationship; it can be experienced casually as long as consent is secured.

John Gardner (2018) argues that consent might not be necessary to sex because we usually require consent to things that are done to someone, whereas sex, at least ideally, involves a mutuality that renders sexual activity a joint activity. Chadha (2020) replies that joint actions are made up of sub-actions, for each of which consent is necessary. Gardner could reply that sexual sub-actions are also joint, so consent to them is unnecessary. Moreover, even if some are not joint, that some are is enough to show that consent is not always necessary for sex. Still, it is unclear why joint activities render consent unnecessary. My participation in synchronized swimming or a musical duet still needs my consent.

People with severely impaired cognitive abilities raise complicated issues for sexual consent. Assuming that they desire sex but are unable to consent, or are unable to communicate it clearly, we are faced with the options of either denying them sex or re-thinking consent in their case, such as relying on the idea of advance consent (Bianchi 2022a; 2022b; Director 2019). Andrea Bianchi argues that for people with dementia we need to prioritize their well-being over consent because the issue of their quality of life is of “the upmost importance” (2022b, 365). She relies on the distinction between consenting to something and assenting with something, the latter of which, used in medical practices, describes “a person’s active willingness to engage in an act, specifically when they may lack the ability to fully comprehend it (e.g., the benefits and risks)” (2022b, 363–364). If Bianchi is right, only valid consent, not consent as such, would not be necessary for people with dementia to have sex, because assent is still a form of rudimentary consent. One difficulty with the argument is that valid consent might be seen as important for someone’s well-being as much as, if not more than, satisfying their desires is, so basing the argument on the priority of well-being might take us only so far.

2.2.2 Objectification

Objectification is a perennial issue in the philosophy of sex. It originates in Kant’s moral philosophy, and many feminists have adopted the language of objectification to criticize, for example, pornography; though whereas Kant was concerned with the objectifying nature of sexual desire, feminists do not target sex as such, but only in the context of patriarchy, claiming that it involves the sexual objectification of women by men in certain contexts (see below; some claim that all heterosexual sex is poison under patriarchy, e.g., Dworkin 1987). Indeed, sexual desire might not be necessary for the claim that a woman is sexually objectified under patriarchy: a man need not sexually desire a woman to catcall her.

Sexual objectification is treating or considering a person only as a sex object. Casual sex, watching pornography, catcalling, ogling, and other examples all allegedly involve sexual objectification. The “only” is important because otherwise there is no basis for moral complaint given that we frequently treat each other as objects. It is unclear whether objectification can consist of mere mental regard or whether it must have a treatment component (ogling someone is interesting because it is unclear whether it is treatment or mere regard). Some philosophers (Langton 2009; Nussbaum 1995; Papadaki 2017;) define “sexual objectification” broadly enough to include mere regard (others, e.g., LeMoncheck [1985, ch. 1] do not). The inclusion of regard is wise because objectification seems to involve mere attitudes and perceptions (e.g., ogling, the regard found in watching pornography). X then sexually objectifies Y if, and only if, X treats or regards Y only as a sexual object.

The importance of objectification stems from a view of human beings as more than objects (LeMoncheck 1985, ch. 1; Papadaki 2017). If human beings, regardless of individual merit, have elevated moral status in virtue of having rationality, dignity, autonomy, or some such property, reducing someone to a lower level is wrong. But how common the actual occurrence of sexual objectification and how serious it is, are additional questions. It seems rare to treat our sexual partners as mere objects in any obvious and troubling ways: not only are we aware of their humanity, we are also attentive to it. Indeed, among the various ways of objectification—instrumentality, denial of autonomy, inertness, fungibility, violability, ownership, and denial of subjectivity (this is Nussbaum’s list [1995, 257]; cf. Langton 2009, 228–229)—only instrumentality is common. Others, such as ownership and denial of subjectivity, seem rare (Halwani 2017a; Halwani 2022b). Clear cases of sexual objectification include sexually-motivated rape and catcalling.

The Kantian view is that sexual desire objectifies by its nature and makes it impossible for the sexual partners to satisfy the Categorical Imperative: “Act in such a way that you treat humanity, whether in your own person or in the person of another, always at the same time as an end and never simply as a means” (Kant 1785 [1981], 429). Equally problematic on this view is X objectifying X’s self—usually through masturbation or allowing X’s self to be objectified by Y. Kant considered duties to the self to be important and his treatment of objectification clearly includes duties to the self: when a human being has sex for the mere pleasure of it, he “surrenders his personality (throwing it away), since he uses himself merely as a means to satisfy an animal impulse” (1797 [1996], 6: 425; see also Kant 1930 [1963], 162–168; Soble 2017b, 309–313; 2022c, 411–415)]. The prohibition on allowing one’s own self to be objectified, in addition to the focus on the nature of sexual desire, is what sets the Kantian view apart from other views of objectification, especially feminist ones.

Sexual desire objectifies by its nature because when X sexually desires Y, X desires Y’s body and body parts, especially the sexual ones, making it hard, if not impossible, to treat the humanity in Y as an end (Kant 1930 [1963, 164]). Only sexual desire among our inclinations is directed at human beings as “flesh,” not “their work and services” (Kant 1930 [1963, 163]). Although it is morally permissible to use each other for all sorts of purposes as long as they involve our “work and services,” sexual interactions are different. In almost every interaction with each other, we are interested in some ability, talent, or service that another can perform, an aspect intimately connected to their rationality. In these cases, either X does not desire Y’s body (but Y’s abilities, talents, or services) or X desires it but as a vehicle of Y’s abilities. Only with sexual desire (and, Kant says, in the rare case of cannibalism; 1930 [1963, 162–63]) does X desire Y as a body, as an object. X wants to enjoy Y’s body, not Y’s beautiful voice, massaging abilities, or computer skills (and if X does want the latter aspects in the context of sexual desire and activity, X wants them insofar as they make Y more sexually appealing). Sexual desire renders people objects by reversing our normal relationship with their bodies. Their bodies become the objects, not the instruments, of our attention. Kant thought that only marriage can make objectification tolerable (Kant 1930 [1963, 163]), though his argument is implausible (see Soble 2013b, 2017b; Denis 2001; Wertheimer 2003, 130–135).

Consent is thus not sufficient for permissible sex because consenting to sex is consenting to objectification, to something wrong (Soble 2017b, 303–304). Kant’s view indicates also why including regard in a definition of “sexual objectification” is plausible: even though X and Y treat each other well during sex, they still regard each other as mere sex objects.

The phenomenology of sexual desire seems to confirm Kant’s point: The “other’s body, their lips, thighs, buttocks, and toes, are desired as the arousing parts they are, distinct from the person” (Soble 2013b, 302). During a good sexual act, even with one’s lover, at some point they focus on ass, cock, pussy, tits, etc. (Vannoy 1980, 14). Kant’s view that sexual desire and activity are different—perhaps even unique—from other ways we view and interact with other people seems correct, providing support for the conclusion that sexual desire objectifies.

Sexual desire seems also powerful: its pull is strong and its voice loud, insisting, and persistent, so much so that people do irrational and immoral things to satisfy it. This might be a gendered feature of sexual desire, more true of men than of women, though throughout history, and in today’s popular culture especially, women have often been portrayed as sexually insatiable (see Anderson & Struckman-Johnson 1998; Soble 2008, ch. 10). Of course, sexual partners normally observe limits on how they treat each other: they do not violate each other, treat each other literally as objects, and so on, exactly because they understand that they may not treat people in such ways. Thus, sexual desire operates within moral red lines.

The Kantian problem of objectification cannot be easily solved. Arguing that there is no objectification because human beings have no special moral status from which they can be lowered (Soble 2002, 53–63) does not meet Kant on his own grounds (as Soble insists in 2013b; 2017b; 2022c). Claiming that parties to the sexual act normally consent to it (Mappes 1987), that objectification is okay as long as the relationship is respectful (Nussbaum 1995, esp. 227–231), or that sexual partners attend to each other’s sexual needs (Goldman 1977, 282–283; Singer 1984, 382) also do not solve the problem because none addresses the nature of sexual desire (Soble 2013b; 2017b; 2022c).

Two other options are to accept the problem as a problem (but perhaps minimize it; Halwani 2017a; 2022b) or to argue that sexual desire among human beings is not always objectifying. This is not merely the idea, insisted on by the intentionalist view, that sexual desire in human beings is complex, because a Kantian view of sex can accommodate this point, but that

there is far more to sex than the desire to use another’s body in a degrading manner for your selfish pleasure. Even the elements in sexual desire closest to this are combined, at least in healthy people, with other elements of human emotion that radically transform their meaning. (Wood 2008, 227)

Kant’s view, however, can also accommodate this insight. For example, X might sexually desire Y because Y is, among other things, a kind person, such that X would not have desired Y otherwise. But once X desires Y, X desires Y’s body and body parts. Sexual desire can be selfish while layered within other elements of human emotions, and the Kantian view need not be confined to a simplistic view of sexual desire such that it is crassly selfish or always acted on in a degrading “manner”; Kantian sex can be attentive to the other’s needs.

Nonetheless, the above idea that sexual desire can be combined with healthy emotions makes it possible that sexual desire is not always toxic, though how remains unclear. To succeed, sexual desire needs to be injected with healthy emotions, and not merely added to them, so that its very nature changes on particular occasions.

On the Kantian view, not all sexual activity is objectifying: sexual activity not stemming from sexual desire might not be objectifying. Even in those cases when sexual activity is objectifying, its seriousness varies: in consensual encounters it competes with other moral factors, whereas in (sexually motivated) rape it is very serious as sexual desire is the primary motive. (The motive is not to sexually objectify someone, as this is rare; instead, X regards Y in a way that is sexually objectifying.)

Moreover, sexual objectification might differ between men and women, especially if men and women experience sex differently. Men experience sexual desire more frequently and insistently than women, though both are similar in their enjoyment of sexual activity (Ogas and Gaddam 2011, chs. 3 and 4; Symons 1979, 179; Wertheimer 2003, 38–46). Thus, men might engage in more sexual objectification than do women given that men think about sex more, ogle others more, and are more easily turned on visually. Since during sexual activity both would sexually objectify each other roughly equally, men would sexually objectify women overall more than women would men. Men also consume pornography (straight and gay) far more than women do, so would engage in much more sexual objectification than do women (by viewing people on-screen, by viewing people as mere sexual objects, etc.). It is perhaps in this sense that pornography allows women (and men, as objects of other men’s desire) to be objectified.

Some feminists have argued that pornography objectifies women by dehumanizing them, and it dehumanizes them by depicting them as mere sexual instruments for men (Hill 1987), by depicting their pleasure as only for the men’s (Longino 1980), by endorsing this treatment (Longino 1980; Eaton 2007), or by sending the message that all women are like those depicted in pornography (Garry 1978). But these claims seem unconvincing. Pornography shows both men and women sexually enjoying each other, and it is difficult to prove that women’s pleasure is depicted as merely for the men’s (one might as well argue for the reverse) because the scenes themselves do not tell us anything (Soble 2002, 19–20, 28, 98, 196; 1996, 225–227). Nor does pornography seem to send messages about the status of women, whether about the depicted women or women in general. Doing so disables the viewer’s ability to imagine the scenes as he wants, thereby undermining its own purposes of titillating him (Soble 1996, 231–234). But pornography enables the sexual objectification of women by displaying them to the gaze of the male viewer (ditto for men in pornography, albeit the gay male gaze). This form of objectification seems innocuous, as long as it is not implicated in harm towards women, either individually or as a class (Gruen 2006; see also Eaton 2007).

A deeper form of objectification is found in the view that pornography constructs women’s sexuality in a bad way (MacKinnon 1993; Dworkin 1974, 1979). It eroticizes patriarchal ways of viewing women, so that sexual desire becomes infused with dominance (cf. Morgan 2003a, 388–390). The sexual desires of young men who routinely consume pornography become desires for the sexual domination of women. Women become socially constructed sexual beings for men, such that men desire them as pornography depicts them—as non-real beings: “objectification comes to define femininity, and one-sidedness comes to define mutuality” (MacKinnon 1993, 26; see Mason-Grant 2004). This view, however, implausibly neglects sexual desire’s biology, assuming that sexual desire can be fully socially constructed. Moreover, insofar as it is an empirical view, no proper evidence has been marshalled in its support (Diorio 2006; Tarrant 2014).

Sexual desire, as we have seen, is sufficient for objectification. However, it is not necessary. The guy catcalling a woman to feel part of the group is an example, and so are pornography directors and editors, who, by choosing the angle of the camera and the footage cuts, help sexually objectify the performers by presenting them to the viewer in particular ways; similar reasoning applies to, say, brothel owners. Indeed, women themselves might have few options other than to sexually objectify themselves, in a society that values women mostly through their sexuality (Jütten 2016; Marino 2022a, 2022b). This might be the most pernicious form of sexual objectification in that social forces direct or pressure (not necessarily force) women to adopt such self-identifications or self-presentations to lead better lives, though whether they are actually flourishing is harder to gauge.

Recently, the concept of “derivatization” has been used to examine sex and sexual practices (Parker 2017; Wolf 2016).

To derivatize something is to portray, render, understand, or approach a being solely or primarily as the reflection, projection, or expression of another being’s identity, desires, fears, etc. The derivatized subject becomes reducible in all relevant ways to the derivatizing subject’s existence. (Cahill 2011, 32; see also 2013)

This view might capture some central feminist problems with pornography, namely, the depiction of women’s sexuality as reflecting men’s sexual desires of women. However, “derivatization” seems not to cover all cases (or all cases well). Consider a closeted gay man who catcalls a woman only to impress his peers. He objectifies her but does not seem to derivatize her. If the reply is that he catcalls that particular woman because she represents not his desires but, say, society’s desires of what women should look like, then, given that for any sexual situation one can attribute derivatization to some party or other, “derivatization” stands in danger of being empty or too broad to be explanatory.

2.3 Sexual Perversion

The most famous contemporary philosophical account is Thomas Nagel’s psychologically-based view of sexual perversion. “Natural” sexual desire involves a multi-leveled mutual awareness by two people of each other: X perceives sexual excitement in Y, Y perceives excitement in X, X perceives that Y is excited by X, and so on (1969, 10–12). Sexual desire is complex in that it includes X’s sexual arousal by Y and X’s feeling sexual because of Y’s arousal by X, and so on with higher levels. Sexual perversions are then standing preferences for sexual activity that does not involve such multi-levels of sexual arousal. Since this view locates naturalness and perversion in the agent’s preferences, the sexual act itself need not mirror this structure; only the desires need have this complexity. Thus, it is inaccurate to accuse it of being sexless (Solomon 1974, 336) or to evaluate it by giving examples of non-complex sexual acts (Kupfer 2016, 333).

Although this view accommodates some perversions, such as zoophilia, pedophilia, and “intercourse with … inanimate objects” because they “seem to be stuck at some primitive version of the first stage of sexual feeling” (Nagel 1969, 14), it yields counter-intuitive results: masturbation does not fare well on this view, depending on whether it insists on the perception of the actual (not imaginative) embodiment of desire in another person (Soble 2013a, 85–87). It also misunderstands how perversions usually work: a coprophiliac does not normally desire sex with feces, but to incorporate feces in his sexual act with another, which could involve multi-levels of perception. Moreover, the account does not capture common intuitions about natural and perverted sex: it goes beyond the plausible idea that the arousal of one partner increases the other’s, to that of multi-layered arousal—an unintuitive idea. Similar views rely on the idea that natural sexual desire is interpersonal, such as that it culminates in love (Scruton 1986, ch. 10) and that it communicates attitudes and feelings (Solomon 1974; see Halwani 2018b, ch. 9 for discussion).

A non-psychological account of sexual perversion, one closer to folk biology, claims that only reproduction allows us to distinguish perversions from non-perversions (Ruddick 1984, 287; cf. Gray 1978). This does not mean that every act has to be reproductive, only that natural sexual desires “could lead to reproduction in normal physiological circumstances” (Ruddick 1984, 288). Thus, a heterosexual couple having intercourse but not intending to procreate are not engaging in perverted sex: their desire is of the kind that, under “normal physiological circumstances,” could lead to reproduction (1984, 288).

The account might have implausible implications, however. Anyone who prefers (heterosexual) oral sex to intercourse would be perverted. Moreover, any heterosexual couple that incorporate fetish objects, urine, feces, and so on, in their sexual intercourse would be sexually natural (Gray 1978, 190–192; Primoratz 1999, 53–54). Indeed, coprophilia can sink all the above accounts: two people who exhibit inter-personal attitudes in the form of multi-level perceptions, and who have sexual intercourse of the reproductive type, communicating healthy emotions sincerely, yet use feces in their activity would counter-intuitively not be perverted on any of the above accounts.

Even though explaining perversion in terms of biology seems obvious, “perversion” is opposed not only to “natural,” but also to “normal,” and the natural and the normal do not fully overlap. Moreover, the concept of “perversion” could refer to many things: the immoral, disgusting, bizarre, and biologically abnormal, among others. Using only one of these to define “perversion” will probably fail. It might also be that the methodology of discussing this concept is flawed, failing to account for the concept’s social function (Miller 2010). Thus, some philosophers have proposed to get rid of the concept altogether (Priest 1997; Primoratz 1999, ch. 6; Ruse 1988, 197–201). Recently, however, a new account of perversion in terms of its inhibiting “shared joy, mutual exploration, self-affirmation, and union” was offered (Kupfer 2016, 351). But this view seems to set the bar too high for what counts as non-perverted.

A good account of perversion might have to be prescriptive, capturing the core of perversion but not necessarily capturing all our beliefs about it (it should explain why our beliefs are mistaken when they are). Furthermore, it will likely be a psychological account, a preference to have sex with or involving certain types of object that are anti-life, such as bodily waste and corpses, and that are biologically odd, such as inter-species sexual intercourse. Evolutionary biology and evolutionary psychology would have to play crucial roles.

2.4 Sex and Technology

The discussion of sexual exclusion and inclusion has led some philosophers to suggest that sexual needs can be met by sexual robots that can replace the need for partnered sex, especially if the technology is advanced enough so that sex with the robots provides an almost identical experience to sex with another human being (DiNucci 2017; McArthur 2017). This raises a few philosophical questions of its own. First, if the robots are sophisticated enough, they might be persons, which means that they, too, might have rights to sexual autonomy, which takes us back to the same issues with rights to partnered sex. It also raises the general question of how to morally interact with them (Nyholm 2022; Petersen 2017).

Second, there are feminist concerns as to what these robots would look like: if they are meant to “appeal to a stereotypical male gaze,” then “their use might encourage or exacerbate the objectification and dehumanization of actual women” (Liberman 2022, 458). Another feminist concern, regardless of the robots’ look, is that ease of sex with them, and their inability to genuinely refuse sex, might also entrench sexist attitudes toward women, especially that of male entitlement to sex (Danaher, Earp, and Sandberg 2017; Richardson 2005).

Issues with sex robots do not exhaust those of sex and technology. Another has to do with the effects on our lives of the use of dating and hook up apps, weighing their benefits and their costs. While such apps have allowed people to meet each other with more ease and to be selective in their choices, some worry that they allow them to be too selective, abetting lookism and racist desires (McArthur 2022a and 2022b; see also Klincewicz, Frank, and Jane 2022). Neil McArthur argues that the benefits are greater than the costs, many of which can, anyway, be fixed (2022a, 2022b).

McArthur also argues that technology has given rise to a new sexual identity—digisexuality. Digisexuals are “people for whom advanced technologies are an integral part of their preferred sexual experience, and who might not see the need for human sexual partners in order to have fulfilling sex” (2022a, 342). McArthur thinks that new identities are a good thing, because they allow like-minded people to find each other, and such identities can help usher in legal and social protections (if needed).

In addition to robots and apps, a third issue with sexual technology are “Internet-mediated haptic sex toys capable of remote transmission of tactile sensation” (Arrell 2022, 586). Such technologies have a large array of benefits, but they raise their own problems, such as third parties hacking the systems and thus having sex by deception or assaulting one or more of the parties to the systems, and partners claiming to be something other than who they are, such that even if one is not deceived that one is having sex with, say, John, who John says he is, is not who he actually is (Sparrow and Karas 2020).

Virtual reality and augmented reality technologies (or, more generally, extended reality technologies) are, according to Robbie Arrell, more likely than androids to be the future because they are cheaper, multi-purposed, can be moved around and stored more easily, and they are but a short step from current pornography technology (2022, 595). Although these technologies have benefits, they raise the moral worries of deepfakes and the possibility of people coming to prefer sex through them than with real-life sex partners (Arrell 2022, 595–596).

3. The Value of Sex

What is the value of sex? How important (or valuable!) is this value? Procreation, love, and pleasure are obvious answers to the first question. Sex is usually the way to procreate, so sex is valuable insofar as procreation is valuable. But this value is instrumental, and it is contingent given technology’s ability to separate procreation from sex. There is also anti-natalism (Schopenhauer 1851, 1859, ch. 46; Benatar 2006, 2015), which implies that sex has negative value in its procreative aspect. The value of sex in regard to procreation is thus precarious.

Another instrumental value of sex is that X’s sexual desire for Y can (help) cause X to love Y (Bertocci 1949, ch. 2). Here, sex’s value is contingent on love’s, and, despite sounding strange, the value of romantic love, especially in its early, passionate stages, is not obvious given its negative effects on the lover and others. Still, if sex leads to the settled stage of love (via the passionate one), it is valuable for that. Sex can also express love and affection for one’s partner and cement their relationship. Natasha McKeever argues that many goods of sex—pleasure, union, intimacy, and care—are shared with those of love, so sexual interaction enhances and strengthens the love (McKeever 2016; see also McKeever 2017, but see Vannoy 1980: ch. 1). Even if true, all this still makes sex’s value dependent on and instrumental to love’s, especially since the two are very different (Goldman 1977, 272–275; Soble 2008, ch. 9 [which adds marriage to the mix]; Vannoy 1980, 7–12).

Does sex have intrinsic value? If it does, it is probably sexual pleasure, as-sensation or as-enjoyment, a pleasure that provides people with a crucial motive for having sex, often with drastic consequences. So then how valuable is the pleasure of sex? Perhaps we should regard our appetite for sex like we do that for food to avoid obsessing about it (Russell 1929 [1970, 289]). But can we go further?

People spend much time pursuing projects and activities they enjoy or consider worthwhile. Some do so only when time, work, or family time permit, and some do so much of the time (they are, say, independently wealthy). Writing, pursuing Hollywood or Bollywood stardom, playing chess, swimming, traveling, and, of course, building a family are examples. Other than philosophical far-fetched examples of worthless pursuits (counting blades of grass, collecting bottle caps), most projects and activities have some worth, unless we are willing to condemn most human beings of having worthless lives. Perhaps some projects are more worthwhile than others (though how to argue for this is difficult), but almost all have some worth, and an intellectual one at that, including what many might consider to be mentally passive, such as watching reality television or reading junk fiction (Carroll 1998, esp. ch. 1 and 2).

Now consider X, whose life project is the pursuit of sexual pleasures. X says,

I am young, moderately good-looking, and, with current technology, I can easily sexually hook up with others. I enjoy sex, and it makes me feel good. In between bouts of sex, I can see friends, go to the gym, movies, whatever. But my deepest enjoyment—my life-plan, to use philosophical jargon—is to pursue the pleasures of sex.

Is there something we can say to prove X wrong, especially if X has the talent for something considered more important? Perhaps we can claim that pursuing sex is not as worthy as reading Russian literature, but even here we are on insecure ground.

One can argue that X is not using X’s intellectual powers. But this underestimates the reliance on intellect in sexual pursuits or presumes that such use is unimportant. Alternatively, one can argue that X is not using X’s intellectual powers deeply or in a theoretical way. But this would rule out many a life as good. One can argue that there are more important things in life than pursuing sexual pleasure. But X need not live without friends, family, and other important things present in normal lives. One can argue that sex objectifies, so it is wrong to make it central to one’s life. But unless one were a die-hard Kantian, the objectification involved in sex can be redeemed by other factors.

One can argue that sexual sensory pleasure “will not be at the center of a rational life plan,” and that these pleasures are “intermittent and short-lived,” their value ultimately depending “entirely on the interpersonal relationships into which they fit and which constitute their context” (Goldman 2016: 98). But it is unclear why the pleasures’ brevity and intermittency are problems. One can argue that someone who prefers masturbation to sex with others “could reflect a failure to understand the importance and value of sex and sexual pleasure” (Scanlon 1998, 175) because the importance of sex is its expression in relations with other people (Scanlon seems not to have in mind casual or promiscuous sex). But X can have affectionate sexual relationships with others, and friendships, etc., with different others. Even casual hookups have their bonding aspects. Finally, one can argue that sex “achieves a level of passion” with “no equal in other forms of interaction,” especially when it occurs between lovers

it defines a most significant moment of goodness between two people, where each achieves a most profound moment of affirmation and satisfaction that is inextricably tied to the endeavor to please the other (Thomas 1999, 59).

But note how the affirmation and satisfaction here can as easily apply to passionate yet love-less sex.

Thus, even if pursuing sexual pleasure is not as intellectually stimulating as reading classical Arabic poetry, it is not worthless, whether intellectually or non-intellectually, and it is on a par with many other pursuits that people undertake that are far from having intellectual depth. Moreover,

[I]sn’t being a provider of sexual pleasure an important and valuable attribute, one to be cherished? Maybe we should construct a theory of human dignity based on our sexual capacities … instead of looking for something “finer” beyond or above the sexual (Soble 2002, 58–59).

If X conducts X’s life morally, and if X develops some talents or hobbies for those rainy days (sure to come) when X is no longer sexually desirable and X’s friends are busy with other things, then X’s life is not less worthwhile than most human lives. Claiming otherwise is philosophically haughty and pretentious.

Bibliography

Abbreviations for Classic Anthologies

The following anthologies are crucial resources for someone studying the field of the philosophy of sex. The following abbreviations were used above.

  • DLI: Desire, Love, and Identity: Philosophy of Sex and Love, Gary Foster (ed.), Don Mills, Ontario: Oxford University Press, 2017.
  • PHSE: The Palgrave Handbook of Sexual Ethics, David Boonin (ed.), Cham, Switzerland: Palgrave Macmillan, 2022.
  • PoS: The Philosophy of Sex: Contemporary Readings, Savage, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
    • PoS2: second edition, Alan Soble (ed.), 1981.
    • PoS3: third edition, Alan Soble (ed.), 1997.
    • PoS4: fourth edition, Alan Soble (ed.), 2003.
    • PoS5: fifth edition, Alan Soble and Nicholas Power (eds.), 2008.
    • PoS6: sixth edition, Nicholas Power, Raja Halwani, and Alan Soble (eds.), 2013.
    • PoS7: seventh edition, Raja Halwani, Alan Soble, Jacob M. Held, and Sarah Hoffman (eds.), 2017.
    • PoS8: eighth edition, Raja Halwani, Jacob M. Held, Natasha McKeever, and Alan Soble (eds.), 2022.
  • PPSL: Philosophical Perspectives on Sex & Love, Robert M. Stewart (ed.), New York and Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995.
  • PSL: Philosophy: Sex and Love, James M. Petrik and Arthur Zucker (eds.), Farmington Hills, MI: Macmillan Reference USA, 2016.
  • PSLR: Philosophy of Sex and Love: A Reader, Robert Trevas, Arthur Zucker, and Donald M. Borchert (eds.), Upper Saddle River, NJ: Prentice Hall, 1997.
  • PS: Philosophy and Sex, Buffalo, NY: Prometheus Books.
    • PS2: second edition, Robert Baker and Frederick A. Elliston (eds.), 1984.
    • PS3: third edition, Robert Baker, Kathleen J. Wininger, and Frederick A. Elliston (eds.), 1998.
    • PS4: fourth edition, Robert Baker and Kathleen J. Wininger (eds.), Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books, 2009.
  • RHPSS: The Routledge Handbook of Philosophy of Sex and Sexuality, Brian D. Earp, Clare Chambers, and Lori Watson (eds.), Routledge: New York, 2022.
  • SE: Sex and Ethics: Essays on Sexuality, Virtue, and the Good Life, Raja Halwani (ed.), Basingstoke: Palgrave Macmillan, 2007.
  • SPP: Sex from Plato to Paglia: A Philosophical Encyclopedia, Alan Soble (ed.), Westport, CT: Greenwood Press, 2006.
    • SPP1: volume 1
    • SPP2: volume 2

Secondary Literature

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  • –––, 413–426, City of God, Marcus Dods (trans.), Peabody, MA: Hendrickson Publishers, 2009.
  • Barn, Gulzaar, 2022, “The Ethics and Politics of Sexual Preference”, in RHPSS, pp. 421–436.
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  • Beckwith, Francis Joseph, 2022, “Why Is Sexual Assault Special?: Transactional Sex and Sacred Intuitions”, in PHSE, pp. 191–202.
  • Belliotti, Raymond, 1993, Good Sex: Perspectives on Sexual Ethics, Lawrence, KS: University Press of Kansas.
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