B. Coordination: Logical non-visibility?

The examples discussed in Sections 1 and 2 involve cases in which logical elements that are not morphologically expressed in spoken languages appear in an overt form in sign languages. But can the reverse also be found? That is, are there logical elements that are typically expressed (i.e., visible) in spoken languages that remain covert in sign languages? And if so, can such examples be informative for natural language semantics?

Arguably, one such example is the case of coordination (conjunction and disjunction) in ASL (Davidson 2013). In ASL, there do exist lexical items AND and OR, but the two are used less frequently than in English. Both conjunction and disjunction are frequently realized using general use coordination strategies, expressed by concatenating constituents while enumerating on the fingers or shifting the body in space. For instance, the sentence in (B1), in which COORD-SHIFT is realized by a shift in body position, can be interpreted as either (B1a) or (B1b).

(B1)

IX-a DRINK TEA-b COORD-SHIFT COFFEE-c. (Davidson 2013)

a.

‘She drank coffee and tea.’

b.

‘She drank coffee or tea.’

Davidson (2013) makes the case that these sentences are genuinely ambiguous, but that the ambiguity does not arise from lexical ambiguity of COORD-SHIFT. She thus proposes that COORD-SHIFT collects its arguments as a set of (Hamblin-style) alternatives, and that quantification (universal or existential) is contributed by a silent higher operator. Similar examples in spoken languages (e.g., Japanese, Ohori 2004) suggest that conjunction and disjunction may in general be decomposable into two components: one which collects coordinates and one that quantifies over them.

While more work is needed to establish patterns of coordination in sign languages beyond ASL, it is possible that similar patterns appear frequently in the signed modality. Such a finding would be compatible with the observation that sign languages generally have fewer sequentially-expressed morphemes (but as much propositional information!), due to a relatively slower articulatory speed of the hands compared to the mouth and tongue (Bellugi & Fischer 1972).