Notes to Sorites Paradox
1. Other parts of speech—e.g., verbs, adverbs, names, even indexicals—also appear to be soritical, but predicates have received the most attention in the literature. See, e.g., Ellis 2004 for relevant discussion.
2. Williamson contends that, unlike tolerance principles, margin for error principles do not generate a paradox (1992: 161).
3. Williamson’s defense of epistemicism leans heavily on the claim that other resolutions of the paradox are untenable, but some of his principal negative arguments are viewed as question-begging; see e.g. Wright 1994: 135-8 and Raffman 2014: 95–96, for some discussion.
4. Though see the reference to Burns 1991 in §3.3.4.
5. Epistemicists represent borderline cases in the usual way, as neither definitely \(\Phi\) nor definitely not \(\Phi\), but they interpret the definiteness operator epistemically: borderlines are neither knowably \(\Phi\) nor knowably not \(\Phi\).
6. Bivalence is preserved largely by means of an incompatibilist analysis of borderline cases that defines them in terms of an opposition between incompatible predicates like ‘old’ and ‘middle-aged’ rather than contradictories like ‘old’ and ‘not old’ (op.cit., chapter 2).
7. Of course, even in a series of pairwise judgments, speakers must shift categories before the end. They do this by shifting between pairs; for example, they will classify 23,725 days (=65 years) as old when they consider it pairwise with 23,726 days (=65 years + 1 day), but as middle-aged when considering it pairwise with 23,724 days (for supporting evidence, see Raffman op.cit., chapter 5). The high degree of similarity between neighboring ages is what makes this flexibility of classification possible.
8. These are of course empirical claims that would need to be tested.