Sortals

First published Thu Feb 9, 2006; substantive revision Mon Jul 7, 2025

Sortals have played an instrumental role in resolving various theoretical challenges. They have helped tackle significant problems in multiple areas of philosophy, including metaphysics, philosophy of language, and philosophy of mind. Beyond philosophy, sortal concepts have proven relevant in psychological fields, especially in theories related to infant cognitive development and human perception. Moreover, they have been applied in computer science, notably in artificial intelligence and knowledge representation.

Despite its importance, the notion of a sortal remains vague and ambiguous. There are conflicting interpretations of this notion, and authors write at cross-purposes. As a result, readers of any text about sortals should approach the subject with caution. This confusion partly stems from its origin as a technical term introduced by John Locke in 1690, who focused on concepts that define the essence of things. Later philosophers have reinterpreted the term to align with their philosophical goals, leading to a situation where the criteria for what constitutes a sortal predicate can vary. For instance, Peter Strawson, who revived the term in 1959, emphasized sortals as providing criteria for counting. For their part, Wiggins (1967, 2001) looked at sortals as telling us what a thing is, Dummett (1973) as providing persistence criteria, Quine (1964) as a predicate that divides its reference, and Geach (1980) as conveying identity criteria. In general, most of the authors working with the notion of a sortal have proposed one or more of the following interpretations:

  1. A sortal defines the essence of a thing or, at the very least, provides an answer to the question “What is it?”
  2. A sortal offers a principle of individuation, enabling us to single out an entity
  3. A sortal establishes criteria for identity and differentiation, specifying when something is the same as or different from a given object
  4. A sortal provides a persistence criterion, determining when something continues or ceases to exist

These different characterizing features of sortals are not necessarily independent. For example, counting criteria presupposes identity and differentiation criteria, and the same applies to persistence criteria. It is also claimed that a principle of individuation entails identity and differentiation criteria.

In addition to the above, grammatical criteria have also been adopted. It has been claimed that sortal predicates admit the definite article, the plural ending, the pronouns “same”, “other”, and “another”, and quantity words such as “all”, “many”, and “one”, “two”, “three”, etc. These features have suggested the idea of developing specific formal logics for sortals.

The longstanding debate on the so-called problem of universals has also complicated the discussions surrounding sortals. Various positions-nominalism, realism, and conceptualism- have been proposed as potential solutions to the problem, each supported by different arguments for and against them. Different approaches to sortals can be contextualized within this spectrum of solutions. From a realist perspective, sortals are seen as properties; from a conceptualist view, they are regarded as concepts. Nominalist, on the other hand, consider sortals merely as predicates. For instance, from the nominalist perspective, words like “dog”, “house”, and “animal” would be considered sortals. From the conceptualist perspective, the concept of a dog, house or animal would be viewed as sortals. From the realist perspective, the property of being a dog, a house, or animal would count as sortals. Works on sortals can be generally classified under one of the three perspectives.

Despite the above complexities, we find common ground for the different philosophical approaches in the various prototypes of what counts as a sortal or non-sortal predicate. These prototypes have contributed to grounding the defining criteria and guided discussions on this subject. In general, it is widely accepted that most or many common count nouns are sortals, while most adjectives and intransitive verbs are generally not. For example, expressions like “book”, “horse”, and “car” are typically considered sortals, and those like “red”, “aromatic”, “stiff”, “deafening”, “cold”, “bitter”, “cry”, and “borrow” are not.

Most nouns that are not sortals can form sortals in contexts where a unit is implicated, often without the supplementary unit being explicit. Coffee and gold are not sortals by most accounts, but we can intelligibly ask how many coffees Harry drank or how many golds the ski team won. It is understood from context that we are asking about cups of coffee and gold medals. These unitized sortals can be in any of the forms discussed above.

1. Three main issues on sortals

The above points to three clear issues regarding sortals. The first concerns the very notion of a sortal. As we have noted, this notion has always been technical in nature, historically determined, and somewhat theory-laden. Thus, it is crucial to clarify its underlying elements separately and within a historical context to grasp what its content involves. We will focus our attention on these points in sections 2–9.

The second issue addresses the logic of sortals. This arises from examining the grammatical criteria associated with sortals, such as their use in constructions involving relative quantifiers and identity. These features suggest the need to develop a logic incorporating these characteristics. Additionally, different interpretations of sortals-particularly from the theory of universals-could result in varying reasoning principles. In section 11, we will present the different logical theories of sortals that have been developed thus far.

Finally, the third issue addresses the potential applications of sortals across various fields. As noted earlier, sortals have played a role in resolving specific philosophical issues, as well as in psychological research and advancements in artificial intelligence. In sections 10 and 12, we will explore these applications in psychology and artificial intelligence, respectively. Philosophical issues will be discussed throughout the article.

2. The nature of a sortal

As mentioned above, the nature of a sortal has been historically shaped by its historical introduction and subsequent evolution under the influence of various philosophical perspectives. The following exposition intends to capture this development. We will start by tracing the history of the concept of a sortal, exploring how various philosophers have interpreted and developed the idea over time. In some instances, we will highlight how the concept has been influenced by philosophical theories that address specific philosophical issues. In this exposition, we will distinguish between two key times: the pre-1959 period and the late 1950’s and subsequent years period.

On the other hand, the defining features of sortals, in line with various philosophical contexts, have been interpreted differently. These variations have led to diverse understandings of the notion of a sortal. These interpretations will be examined in relation to the various criteria proposed as constitutive of the content purportedly conveyed by sortals.

3. Pre-1959 views on sortals

Many philosophers (e.g., Wallace 1965) have claimed that the notion of a sortal is the same notion as developed by Aristotle under the label “secondary substance” in several of his writings. However, this concept is complex and controversial (see Furth 1988 and the entry on Aristotle metaphysics Aristotle’s metaphysics). For this reason, the present discussion will not pursue the connection further.

The first use of the term “sortal” is in Locke’s Essay Concerning Human Understanding (1975 [1690]).

But it being evident, that things are ranked under Names into sorts or Species…the Essence of each Genus, or Sort, comes to be nothing but that abstract Idea, which the General, or Sortal (if I may have leave so to call it, from Sort, as I do General from Genus) Name stands for. And this we shall find to be that, which the word Essence imports, in its most familiar use. (Bk.III, Ch.III, 15)

Locke goes on to distinguish between real essences, which are mostly hidden from us and determined by nature, and nominal essences, which we (somewhat) arbitrarily construct, but doesn’t say which he means to pick out by the expression “sortal”. It is ironic that in discussion of the history of the term Locke and Aristotle are cited as the two historical sources, when a main point of Locke’s Essay was to argue against Aristotelian essentialism (see the entry on Locke).

Roughly contemporaneously with Locke’s introduction of the term, Spinoza noted the importance of a sortal like term for counting though he did not use the term “sortal” or a Latin equivalent.

He who holds in his hand a penny and a dollar will not think of the number two, unless he can call both the penny and the dollar piece by one and the same name, to wit, a piece of money or a coin. (Spinoza 1674: 259)

The other pre-twentieth century author who is frequently cited as an antecedent of contemporary discussions is Frege. In Frege (1884) he makes the point that in counting things, we need to know what kind of thing we are counting. For example, something can be counted as one thing, a deck of cards, or as fifty-two cards. Frege was perhaps the first to use the phrase (which is translated as) “criterion of identity”. There is disagreement about whether Frege intended his remarks to apply to all kinds of identity, as Dummett (1973) argues, or only to numbers, as Lowe (1989) argues, but Dummett’s is the more common interpretation.

Wright (1983) argues that one of Frege’s most important contributions was emphasizing that numbers are objects and that this is intimately connected to Frege’s claim that “natural number” is a sortal. Wright is aware of the difficulties in characterizing sortals but remarks that “…whether or not it is ultimately rigorously explicable, the intuitive notion of a sortal concept is clear enough for our immediate purpose” (1983: 4). For further discussion see the entry on Frege.

4. Late 50s and subsequent years

The expression “sortal” reappeared on the philosophical stage in the 1950s and 1960s in lectures and in the written work of Strawson (1959), Quine (1960), Geach (1962), and Wiggins (1967) and variations on the concept entered the mainstream philosophical vocabulary. Because philosophers lecture and circulate manuscripts with their ideas for years—sometimes decades—before publication, the dates of the main publications of the protagonists concerning sortals do not necessarily reflect the historical priorities and influences. The most accurate simple summary is that the ideas of Geach, Strawson and Quine co-evolved and that Wiggins’ writings built on a foundation laid by those predecessors.

The widespread use of the term “sortal” definitely derives from Strawson, but readers should note that there are important differences among these authors. For a start, Strawson applies “sortal” to universals, Quine to predicates, and Wiggins to concepts. In this way, these authors illustrate the realist, nominalist, and conceptualist interpretations of sortals’ nature that we presented earlier.

For his part, Geach did not use the word “sortal” but most commentators identify his notion of a “substantival expression” with “sortal” in the other writers. While Geach appears to align more closely to Quine, given that “expression” seems to be a linguistic concept, Geach extends his conclusions across languages in ways that Quine would likely dispute. These variations in terminology among the four authors would not be important, if there were straightforward, universally agreed upon connections between concepts, universals, and expressions. But there aren’t.

Strawson made no mention of Locke, Aristotle, Spinoza or Frege in the context of introducing the expression “sortal universal” in Individuals in 1959.

A sortal universal supplies a principle for distinguishing and counting individual particulars which it collects. (1959: 168)

Strawson had two main projects in Individuals. The first was to show that material bodies and persons occupy a central position among particulars and that items in these two categories are basic to our conceptual scheme. The second was to

establish and explain the connection between the idea of a particular in general and that of an object of reference or logical subject. (1959: 11–12)

Sortal universals are central to this second task because, according to Strawson, reference to particulars occurs by using expressions that are associated with sortal universals.

Strawson thus emphasizes two characteristics. Sortals

(1)
give a criterion for counting the items of that kind
(2)
give a criterion of identity and non-identity among items of that kind.

It is not difficult to see why someone would identify these requirements. In order to know that there are exactly two Gs in a region S, it is necessary and sufficient to know that

There is an x which is in S and has G, a y which is in S and has G and is not identical to x, and for any z, if z is a G which is in S then z is identical with either x or y.

The phrase “criterion of identity” seems to mean a criterion which gives a necessary and sufficient condition for identity. In many cases, however, a weaker condition suffices for counting. To conclude that there are exactly two Gs in region S, all that is required is a sufficient condition for x and y to be distinct, and a sufficient condition for z to be identical with x or y. In the case of physical objects, it may be that being at the same location at the same time is sufficient for identity, and being in entirely separate locations at the same time is sufficient for distinctness. In most circumstances, these will suffice to count Gs, but it is far short of providing answers about partially overlapping Gs, and provides no guidance about identity across time. So often we may be able to count Gs without having a criterion of identity in the strong sense.

One of the unclarities of the phrase “criterion of identity” is that it is never spelled out what the criterion is to be applied to. For example, is it a criterion to be applied to names of objects or to perceptual representations of objects or to the objects themselves? It is also unclear how strictly we are to understand “criterion”. In “Entity and identity” (published in 1976 and reprinted in Strawson 1997b) Strawson proposed being quite strict, limiting the phrase “criterion of identity” to cases where there either is an explicitly statable necessary and sufficient condition that does not use the identity relation, or one where the identity relation is only applied to constituent parts of the objects. This can be done for numbers and sets, but probably not for any kind of concrete objects. In 1997, he retracted that proposal in favor of the looser (and still undefined) general philosophical use of the term (1997a: 2–3). In contrast, Wiggins understands the counting criterion very strictly so one instance where there is not a determinate answer to a question leads him to reject the counting criterion (2001: 75).

At the other end of the spectrum, Griffin (1997) only requires that

A term “A” is a sortal iff there can be cases in which “A” provides, without further conceptual decision, and without borrowing other principles of individuation, principles adequate for counting As. (1997: 43)

Since most philosophers who invoke the distinction want to reject “thing”, “object” and “entity” as non-sortals, Griffin’s suggestion is inadequate or, at least, is a shift to a different concept with the same label. The question “How many things/objects/entity are in the space S?”, where S is an empty space has the determinate answer “zero”, so all of these terms pass the Griffin standard. One could attempt to amend the criterion by requiring that there can be cases which satisfy the above criteria and where there is at least one A. However, this fails to delineate the right cases, because there are sortals such as “unicorn” and “square circle” which have no instances. These points, and the observation that some of the various notions of sortal diverge, were first made in Feldman (1973) but have not been widely noted (see the entry on relative identity). We will revisit some of these issues in §10.1 on the concept of physical object.

5. The content provided by sortals

As illustrated above, the history of the sortal concept shows that there is no singular, universally accepted interpretation of its meaning. Moreover, as it will be discussed next, the criteria that sortals are believed to convey can be understood in various ways, further contributing to the uncertainty surrounding its content.

5.1 Counting

As we have observed, sortals are widely regarded as a conceptual foundation for counting. Therefore, one key criterion for determining whether a given predicate is a sortal is whether is makes sense to ask a meaningful “how-many” question about it. The requirement for the question to be meaningful should be understood not just grammatically, but also in a subjunctively operative sense. That is, meaningfully asking such a question means that counting the entities to which the predicate applies is, subjunctively speaking, a feasible task: a task that one could complete if there were no material or time constraints. This does not mean that carrying out the task should be presumed to be computationally effective. Thus, the counting criterion conveyed by a sortal is not necessarily an algorithm. (For various interpretations of the counting criterion, see Wallace 1965 and Griffin 1977.)

If counting were the only criterion for defining sortals, many of the so-called counting nouns would have to be classified as sortals. However, as noted earlier, nouns like “object” and “thing” would not meet this criterion unless we accept that the answers to the “how-many” question in these cases could be either an infinite or, as noted earlier, zero number of objects (things). Even with this possibility in mind, scholars, such as Ayers(1977) and Wiggins (1977), continue to argue against classifying these and similar concepts as sortals. Therefore, the counting criterion is not universally accepted as the definitive characteristic of sortals, and additional criteria are needed.

On the other hand, as mentioned earlier, while the counting criterion is one of the most commonly recognized features of sortals, it relies on other criteria that have been suggested as potential defining factors for a predicate to be considered a sortal, such as those of individuation and identity. Therefore, we must consider additional criteria.

5.2 Individuation, essential sortals, and the “What is it?” question

An important idea in several philosophical theories is that sortals provide a criterion of individuation. The nature of the criterion is not always clear, though, because the concept of individuation can be interpreted differently. Sometimes it refers to the process by which something becomes or is made into an individual, while at other times, it designates the characteristic of being an individual. In the latter sense, individuation is known as individuality (see Gracia 1988).

In light of the above, we can distinguish between a cognitive and a metaphysical sense of individuation (see Lowe 2003 and 2007). The cognitive sense refers to the process of singling out an entity as an individual in thought, perception, or linguistic reference. In the metaphysical sense, individuation is a relationship of ontological determination between entities. In this case, entities are assumed to metaphysically explain the individual character of other entities and condition their individuality. For example, in the case of sets, their members determine their individuality—that is, their individual character.

It is important to note that there is no one-to-one correspondence between the cognitive and metaphysical senses of individuation. For instance, sortals like “architect”, “blacksmith”, and “teacher” provide cognitive criteria of individuation but not necessarily for individuality. However, some sortals, such as those for natural kinds, may serve both purposes.

Individuation in the cognitive sense is involved in the counting and identity criteria. For example, to ask how many horses there are in the barn, one must be able to single out the horses in thought, perception, or language. Similarly, asking whether John is the same person as Peter presupposes a cognitive act of singling out.

Whether individuation suffices for counting is controversial. For instance, Wiggins in his later writings gives examples to show that criteria of individuation are insufficient to count objects under a sortal:

…the concept crown gives a satisfactory way of answering identity-questions for crowns. But there is no universally applicable definite way of counting crowns. The Pope’s crown is made of crowns. There is no definite answer, when the Pope is wearing his crown, to the question “how many crowns does he have on his head” (1980: 73; 2001: 75)

In a footnote to the same pages, Wiggins gives a list of other examples of terms which permit individuation but not counting: “wave, volume of fluid, worm, garden, crystal, piece of string, word-token, machine”. Wiggins continues by explaining that, on his view, his account does not disagree with Strawson’s but corrects and enlarges it (2001: 75). We find it puzzling that Wiggins dismisses “animal” as a sortal but is willing to include “machine” which seems at least as problematic. According to Wiggins, only those concepts that possess clear criteria of individuation count as sortals, and he maintains that “animal” lack such a definite criteria. In his view, although the term “animal” can readily acquire individuative force from contextual factors or the presence of another, more specific sortal predicate, it does not, in and of itself, establish a single principle of individuation.

We should point out that, corresponding to the two senses of individuation discussed above, there are two philosophical theories in which sortals play a crucial role: perception sortalism and metaphysical sortalism. The first theory, perception sortalism, holds that sortals are essential for perception, as they are thought to be the means by which objects are identified (see Campbell 2002 and Clarke 2006). In contrast, metaphysical sortalism asserts that individuals are individuated by their essences or as being of a particular kind. These essences or kinds are considered real entities, which are expressed or captured by sortal predicates (see Lowe 2009 for natural kinds, and Heil 2003 for artifacts). Subsequently, in §10.3, both philosophical theories will be revisited and examined once more.

Sortals that convey essences are referred to as essential sortals. Some argue that, in general, sortal specify the essences of the things they categorize. However, this is a controversial position. There is significant debate about whether the entire concept of essence is coherent, which leads to disagreements about the existence of essential sortals. For instance, Brody (1980) and Wiggins (2001) defend the idea of essential sortals, while Mackie (2006) argues against it. Moreover, even among those who accept the existence of essential sortals, there is disagreement about whether they operate at a general level, such as “animal” or, at a more specific level, such as “dog”.

Even assuming that there are essences, no consensus exists on whether kinds have essences. For instance, Quine would argue that they do not. Additionally, among those who assert the existence of essences, there is no agreement on what those essences are. Contemporary versions of sortal essentialism attempt to address those issues, particularly the theories put forward by Brody (1980) and Wiggins (1967, 1980, and 2001) mentioned earlier. Another influential approach is offered by the essentialism of origin, proposed by authors like Forbes (1985) and Salmon (1981) (for a discussion of these theories, see Robertson (1998, 2000)). Minimalist essentialism (Mackie 2006) is an alternative to those two forms of essentialism.

In addition to the idea that sortals stand for essences, there is the broader view that they answer the “What is it?”question. Unless the question is given a more specific technical sense, it seems that sortals in the broad Strawsonian sense— such as a “A kitten” or “A red table”— answer the question adequately. The kitten does not go out of existence when it becomes adult, but it is no longer a kitten. This approach could encompass the essentialist perspective as well.

5.3 Identity, criterion of identity, and sortals

As we have indicated, the idea of a sortal has been closely linked to the notion of identity and its related notion of a criterion of identity. Over time, different perspectives on such notions have emerged, adding another layer of variation to understanding what the nature of a sortal entails. To clarify this aspect, we will now focus specifically on the notions in question in their connection to sortals.

5.4 Identity, indiscernibility, and the criterion of identity

It is a law in many logical systems that things that are identical share all of their properties. This is known as the law of the Indiscernibility of Identicals. The controversial converse, known as the Identity of Indiscernibles, says that things that share all of their properties are identical. If “property” is understood sufficiently liberally, then the latter principle is certainly true—any object \(b\) has the property of “being identical to \(b\)”, and if \(c\) also has that property, then \(b = c\). The question is whether the principle holds with any more restricted sense of property. Ladyman et al.(2012) discuss and relate different interpretations of indiscernibility associated with various senses of properties. Many of these interpretations would ground different versions of the identity of indiscernibles principle. (See the entry on this principle for philosophical perspectives other than those considered by Ladyman et al. (2012).)

One might closely link indiscernibility to the notion of a criterion of identity (together with its connection to sortals) when “criterion of identity” is understood as follows:

For any sortal \(F\) there is a set of properties \(\phi\) such that if \(b\) and \(c\) both are \(F\), then if \(b\) and \(c\) instantiate exactly the same properties in \(\phi\) then \(b = c\).

Some attempts to give content to the phrase “criterion of identity” can be understood in this framework. Black (1952) argues that purely internal properties of objects do not suffice; his example is a universe with two spheres which share all of their internal properties, i.e., are the same color, weight, composition, etc.

There are a wide range of philosophical views about criteria of identity. Brody (1980) takes the two identity and indiscernibility principles as jointly definitive of identity and consequently argues that no further criteria of identity are required. Baker (1997) argues that there are no criteria of identity across time, while Jubien (1996), Merricks (1998) and Zimmerman (1998) articulate reasons to doubt that there are any criteria of identity. Lowe (1989,1997, and 2009) are more recent attempts to clarify the concept

Finally, there are well-known historical debates about identity that lead to disagreements regarding the relationship between essential sortals and identity. Some philosophers argue that there is a unique, universal identity relation that holds (or does not) independently of any sortals. In contrast, others maintain that identity is always relative to a sortal. For example, we may have a statue of Lincoln and a statue of Caesar, which are considered distinct statues, even though they are both made of the same lump of bronze. In this case, the sortals “statue” and “lump of bronze” provide different answers to the identity question. These examples underscore the necessity of now considering notions of identity as sortal-relative.

5.5 Is identity strongly sortal relative?

One of the novel claims in Geach’s Reference and Generality was that identity is relative in the strong sense that for two sortal expressions F and G, b and c might be the same F, but not the same G. Geach used the expression “substantival” to characterize the kinds of term F and G are. His “substantival” coincides in many cases with sortals as understood by others, but cannot be entirely the same since he cites “gold” as an example of a substantival, in fact:

we can speak of the same gold as being first a statue and then a great number of coins, but “How many golds?” does not make sense. Thus “gold” is a substantival term, though we cannot use it for counting. (1962: 64)

One of the examples he gives is that b might be the same river as c, but not the same water. Or, if some bronze is made into first one statue, then a different one, then the two statues are not the same statue but are the same bronze.

Quine (1964) and others were critical of Geach’s solution to these puzzles and defended the view that there is only one unqualified sense of identity. In each of the problem cases, his strategy was to try to show that one of the statements of the form “same G as” is not a true identity statement. So in the river example, Quine would deny that the water is identical to the river and thus the two statements are about different objects. Almost all of Geach’s examples can with some plausibility be treated by distinguishing more carefully between objects of reference or distinguishing constitution from identity. Thus, one might say that the bronze at different times constitutes the two statues but is not identical with them. Whether constitution really is or isn’t identity is a matter of continuing debate; for articulations of the two sides see Johnston (1992), Noonan (1993), Baker (2007, chap.3), and the entry on material constitution. For later stages in the debate between Quine and Geach, see the entry on identity .

Sometimes it appears that identity is relative, when in fact ambiguity of reference is present. We might say that George and I took the same bus, meaning that we both took a bus on route #56. Or you might say of the same events that we took different buses, because I took the #56 at 10:25 and George took one at 12:30. But these are not conflicting identity statements about the same things. The first concerns sameness of bus routes, while the second concerns time specific instances of the route.

One example that does not readily lend itself to these approaches is the problem of the Christian Trinity. According to this doctrine, God the Father, Jesus, and the Holy Spirit are three persons but one God or one substance. Thus, they provide an alleged example where b and c are distinct persons but the same substance. We will not enter the debate, which is been conducted for over a millennium, as to whether this doctrine is coherent, but refer the reader to a modern discussion in Cartwright 1987. It is certainly accurate to say that all of Geach’s examples are contested. For details on how the problematic character of such examples can be systematically dispelled, see, for instance, Wiggins (2001, chap. 2).

5.6 Is identity weakly sortal relative?

Wiggins and others argue that identity is dependent on a sortal in a weaker sense. The criterion for the identity of sets is perhaps the one clear and uncontroversial case: Two sets are identical, the same set, if and only if they have the same members. (Notice that while the criterion is clear, the appeal to identity reappears with reference to the members.) While it is perhaps less uncontroversial, my car is the same as the car I owned five years ago even though the oil, tires, battery and have been replaced; the car can remain the same even though some parts change. My friend is the same person as he was five years ago in spite of many natural changes in the molecules composing his body, some dental fillings, an artificial hip and a new cornea lens. Two natural numbers are the same if they gave the same successor, and two real numbers are identical iff they bear all of the same order relations to the other numbers, =3.14…. Notice that in all of these cases appeal to identity recurs with reference to parts (whether body or automotive) or relations to other objects of the same category.

The weak sortal relativity claim consists of saying that the identity relation for sets is different from those for numbers, which is different from those for people and artifacts like cars, and numbers. For sets it involves members of whatever kind, for numbers relations to numbers and for persons and artifacts continuity of life and of function. For abstract non-mathematical things, the relation is even less clear—the question when two ideas are the same idea is often only settled in a court case about copyright or patent infringement.

In other words, there are two conceptions of identity: On one the general identity relation is pieced together from the different identity relations for different categories of things. For a and b to be identical is for them to be the same person or the same number or the same artifact or …. On the other conception, there is a general notion of identity, perhaps given by the identity laws discussed in Section 5.4 , and the specific ones are ways of instantiating that relation. The best argument for the first view is that the pieces seem too diverse to be parts of the same general relation. The best argument for the second is that as we move from domain to domain, and even invent new ones, the general identity scheme guides our development of an understanding of the more local notion. (For a detailed analysis of Wiggins’ claims see Snowdon 2009.)

6. Sortals and the mass-count distinction

Linguists have long distinguished between mass and count nouns based on grammatical factors. Mass nouns include terms for materials like water, gold, iron, and meat. However, like sortals, mass terms convey identity criteria and can appear in relative identity statements. For instance, one might say c is the same gold as b, referring to a gold bucket (c) that was melted to form a gold bracelet (b).

The fact that mass terms can convey identity criteria has led some philosophers to group them with sortals (e.g. Lowe 2009). Others argue that mass terms should be treated within the sortal vs. non-sortal distinction. A key reason for this is grammatical. Count nouns form plurals and appear in constructions like “How many …”. Mass nouns, on the other hand, do not pluralize and typically occur in constructions such as “How much …?”. For example, we ask how many cats someone owns, but how much cat food they have. Some words have both a mass and a count sense, such as “chicken”. We can ask both how many chickens someone owns and how much chicken they want for dinner. (For more in-depth discussions on the mass-count distinction, from philosophical, linguistic, and cognitive perspectives, see Pelletier (1979, 2010), as well as the entries on the logic and the metaphysics of mass expressions, .)

The grammatical distinction is robust; nearly all speakers of a language agree on which sentences are grammatical and which are not. However, philosophers continue to debate how closely count nouns align with sortals. For example, while the sentences “There are three red things on the shelf” and “Two objects collided” are grammatical correct and so “red thing” and “object” are count nouns, many philosophers contend that they are not sortals, as previously noted. Hirsch (1977) and Wiggins (1977), for instance, claim that you cannot count red things or objects, even though the request to do so is grammatical. Others think that we can count red things, but the only correct answers are “infinitely many” and “none”- if there are no red objects, there are none, but if some red thing is present, its top half, bottom half, and various of its parts can be counted as separate red things, such as the three thirds or eight eights of the object, leading to an infinite number of red things. This view is contested, and the debate resurfaces later when we discuss, in Section 10, the role of sortals in cognition.

The philosophical distinction between “stuff” and “things” might also be instrumental in the above debate. Some stuff composes things—such as wood constituting a ship. The count-mass distinction often aligns with this difference but not always. For example, while “vehicle” and “vegetable” are count nouns, “fruit” and “furniture” are mass nouns, even though the specific items they refer to-for instance, apples and chairs-are countable. Additionally, different languages treat these concepts differently —In English, vegetables are counted, while in German, speakers ask how much Gemuse you want, even though “Gemuse” refers to the same things as “vegetable”. In Italian both “frutta” and “verdura” are mass nouns.

Finally, there is the distinction between counting and measuring. While the differences between counting—how many oranges do we have—and measuring—how much rice do we have—are clear, other cases are perplexing. Salmon (1997) offers multiple possible analyses of sentences such as “There are two and a half oranges on the table”, but he finds all of them wanting.

7. The persistence criterion and substance sortals

Questions of identity over time are difficult because they involve issues of persistence. For example, when a kitten grows up, it ceases to be a kitten but is still the same cat and the same animal. In contrast, if we tear down a garage and build a treehouse from the same materials, it is no longer the same building. If a car is crushed into a metal cube, it no longer exists as a car, but if the car is transformed into a boat, does one thing exist as a car and then as a boat? Some views suggest that when a person dies, they cease to exist, while others propose that the same person may be reincarnated in a new form. Similarly, is a werewolf sometimes a person and sometimes a wolf, or are they always a werewolf, neither a person nor a wolf?

In general, when does something survive change, and when it does not? Which kinds of change allows for continued existence? Sortals, which provide criteria for persistence through time are often referred as substance sortals. By their characteristics, essential sortals will qualify as substance sortals, but the reverse is not necessarily true. Similarly to the case of essential sortals, there are systematic disagreements among philosophers whether the substance sortals are to be located at a relatively specific level, e.g., “dog” and “river”, or at the level of a more general category, e.g., “animal”and “geographic feature”.

The sortals that Wiggins regards as crucial, the substance sortals, are a proper subset of the ones Strawson is concerned with. Substance sortals contrast with phase sortals; the latter typically only apply to some temporal segment of an object. Kitten is a phase sortal because when a cat matures it ceases to be a kitten but it does not go out of existence. Substance sortals are also contrasted with restricted sortals, e.g., “red table”. Wiggins has a detailed theory of the structure of substance sortals, arguing that if any two substance sortals overlap, then either one is a restriction of the other or both are restrictions of some other sortal.

This seems problematic because it is plausible that plant and animal are both substance sortals. While they do not overlap, another candidate for being a substance sortal carnivore overlaps both. This would probably not disturb Wiggins, since he already denies that “animal” is a substance sortal:

It is not to be denied that the words “this animal” suffice to express a rough and ready identification in ordinary contexts of what things are. But this is because “animal” so easily takes on an individuative force from a context and/or some other sortal predicate that is ready to hand. But the designation “this animal” is complemented in all sorts of different ways. In itself it determines no single principle of individuation. (2001: 129)

We said earlier that in contrast with Strawson, Wiggins is concerned primarily with the narrower class of substance sortals. Yet if we read his account carefully, it emerges that in the end individuation rests with an even smaller class which he calls “ultimate” sortals:

By an ultimate sortal I mean a sortal which either itself restricts no other sortal or else has a sense which both yields necessary and sufficient conditions of persistence for the kind it defines and is such that this sense can be clearly fixed and fully explained without reference to any other sortal which restricts it. (1967: 32)

…I shall call x’s ultimate sortal concept … the sortal concept which is individuative of x and restricts no other sortal concept. (1980: 65)

The idea is that “cat” and “dog” may both be individuated by the same criterion, so the fundamental criterion is not only associated with them but with other substance sortals that fall under the same ultimate sortal. We know from Wiggins’s remarks that “animal” is not a sortal, so the ultimate sortal for “cat” and “dog” is somewhere in the hierarchy above those concepts but below “animal”. Surprisingly, given the centrality of this notion, Wiggins nowhere gives an example of what he regards as an ultimate sortal. (At 1980: 123 he does speculate inconclusively that “man” might be the ultimate sortal for Julius Caesar.)

Without more specificity about when principles of individuation are the same and different, the foundation of Wiggins’s account is murky. For example, we don’t have enough information to determine whether some middle level term such as “mammal” is an ultimate sortal or not.

There are also other problems. Wiggins recognizes that his account of individuation of biological kinds in terms of “characteristic forms of activity” does not transfer well to prototypical artifacts. He tries to meet this concern by giving an analysis in terms of function for artifacts such as clocks. However, he seems to assume that there are not problematic intermediate cases between natural kinds and pure artifacts. Many kinds of things, e.g., rivers and lakes, can be either natural or artificial. They can also be partly artificial, as when a river is dredged or a lake enlarged. Nevertheless, Wiggins (2016, chap. 16, sec. 16–17, and chap. 12) might provide criteria for deciding upon these cases. (See Carrara & Vermass (2009), Baker (2004, 2008), and Losonsky (1990), for critical discussions on Wiggins’ view on artifacts; see also the entry on artifacts for more general discussions of this notion in diverse areas of philosophy.)

Moreover, in his own favorite cases of biology, he remarks:

Almost everything that has been said so far has been mainly directed at words standing for the various species of natural substances. The account could be extended and adapted without overwhelming difficulty to predicates of genera, wherever these were still determinate enough to be autonomously individuative. (2001: 86)

Unfortunately, his own favorite examples, “elm” borrowed from Putnam (1975) and “frog” are not terms for species. “Elm” is a genus and “frog” an order. In fact, a quick consultation with a good dictionary will reveal that most commonly used biological terms are expressions for some classification above the level of species. Since Wiggins is cautious about extending his account to genera, he may have very few substance sortals by his account.

Another issue with using species as the model of sortals is that contemporary philosophers of biology generally agree that species don’t have essences, though there is disagreement among them about the best way to characterize species (for details, see the entry on species). However, Wiggins defends a different version of essentialism—namely, individual essentialism. This is the view that an individual is essentially a member of the species it belongs to (Wiggins 2001, chap. 4), and it is logically independent of species essentialism. For example, a given whale, is essentially a member of the species whales, even if the species itself possesses no essential property. Therefore, rejecting species essentialism does not necessarily entail rejecting individual essentialism. Moreover, there are attempts by Wiggins to argue that species don’t have essences. He states, for example, that species is an:

…insecure concept in plant-taxonomy, and threatened even in zoology by such phenomena as ring-species and the imperfect transitivity of the relation interbreeds in the wild with—the operational test of identity of species. (1967: 62)

There is no incoherence here on Wiggins’ part because, as pointed out above, species essentialism is logically independent of individual essentialism. Nevertheless, Wiggins’ essentialism is, like species essentialism, also subject to criticism based on contemporary results from the philosophy of biology (Laporte 1997 and Okasha 2000). But see Ferner (2016) for a sympathetic discussion of Wiggins’ doctrines from the perspective of biology, and Devitt (2018) for a recent defense of individual essentialism, which considers the views and criticism in question.

8. Sortals for abstract objects

Most discussions of sortals focus on kinds of physical objects, but by the definitions given many sortals also apply to abstract objects. And in some of these cases the question what a criterion of identity is becomes even more difficult. We can ask how many new ideas a political candidate has, how many governments Italy has had since 1950 and how many books David Wiggins has written. Ideas, governments and books (in the sense of type of book, not specific copies) are all abstract objects. We comment on changes in corporations over time—Apple has grown—which implies identifying Apple over time in spite of changes. But we are far short of having criteria to make decisions in harder cases: Did Rice Institute cease to exist in 1960 or was it just transformed with a new name and some changes in charter to Rice University. The buildings, faculty and students all persisted, but did the educational institution?

The question can perhaps be made more pointed if we consider sortals for collections that do not imply complex structure. Corporations are complex, as are educational institutions. In contrast, a flock of birds does not entail a great deal of complexity, just enough birds in one location. We can sometimes definitively say that two flocks are the same: if exactly the same birds flew over the lake this morning as did yesterday then the two flocks are in fact one. And if none of the birds that flew over the lake yesterday were in today’s flock, then they are definitively different. But suppose most but not all were the same birds?

Mathematics also presents issues about what counts as a criterion, even when the definition is quite precise. Two irrational numbers x and y are identical if they have exactly the same relations to each of the rational numbers. Pi is identical with 3.14… because Pi is greater than 3, 3.1, 3.14, etc. and less than 4, 3.2, 3.15, etc. But does this count as a criterion? It appeals to the less than relation, which is a close cousin to identity itself and it involves relations to similar entities.

Yet another issue involves possible identification between different kinds of numbers. There is a natural number 2, a positive integer +2, a rational number 2/1, a real number 2.0000… Are these the same number? Different understandings of number and different philosophies of mathematics offer differing answers. But these controversies seem insufficient reason to deny “number” the status of a sortal.

9. Sortals as terms that divide their references

W.V. Quine (1960) introduced the characterization of sortals as terms that divide their references. Clearly, this characterization differs from that of Strawson, Wiggins and Geach, although in footnote 1 of Quine 1960: 90 he says that his expression is equivalent to Strawson’s “sortal”. Unfortunately, that cannot be exactly true since 1960: 91 Quine says that “object” divides its reference, though we have seen “object” is not a sortal by the criteria of Strawson or Wiggins because it does not enable counting. We should note that in other of his writings (1969, 1981) he also used the expression “individuative word” as an alternative to the expression “term that divide”.

Quine does not give an explicit criterion for determining when a term “divides its reference”, but some have been proposed on his behalf. Wallace (1965) discusses two understandings of the term. The first is

G divides its reference iff it is never the case that if a is G, a can be divided into two parts which are G

While this characterizes “cat” as a sortal and “object” as a non-sortal, it also excludes some terms that are sortals by the counting criteria, e.g., garden hoses, rocks, piles of snow, sand dunes, amoeba and ice cubes. He also discusses the converse: G divides its reference just in case whenever a and b are G, the result of putting a and b together is never G.

This will get the easy cases right, as above, but also fails on the same problematic list. (Most of these points were made in Feldman 1973 where he also explores various other ways of modifying these principles.)

The closest Quine comes to an explicit formulation of a characterization is in contrasting individuative terms with mass terms:

So-called mass terms like “water”, “footwear” and “red” have the semantical property of referring cumulatively: any sum of parts which are water is water. (1960: 91)

By “sum” here he almost certainly means the mereological sum, not the result of physical juxtaposition. This would mean that “object” and “space time region” would not be sortals, but “spatio-temporally continuous object” and “space-time region with volume less than x” are sortals. These results may be consistent with Quine’s views given that he has indicated that he accepts “object”, but they diverge from the Strawson-Wiggins intent. Note that the three terms listed above have some significant differences; “water” refers to a kind of stuff, “footwear” to a kind of thing, and “red” is a property of both stuff and things. (See Laycock 2011 and the entry on object for further discussion.)

In any event, Quine’s view of the distinction is much more pragmatic than most. In explaining the distinction, he says:

The contrast lies in the terms and not in the stuff they name. …consider “shoe”, “pair of shoes”, and “footwear”: all three range over exactly the same stuff, and differ from one another solely in that two of them divide their reference differently and the third not at all. (1960: 91)

Even this characterization of a contrast is dubious if we note that by the last criterion “object with mass more than 2 kg” is not an individuative term since the sum of any two such objects is another such object, whereas “object with mass less than 2 kg” fails the test since the sum of two such objects sometimes has mass over 2 kg. It is difficult to see any important respect in which the two expressions divide their reference differently. Object more than 2 kg and object less than 2 kg seem to divide their reference.

Another example, given by Feldman (1973), can be used to illustrate the somewhat capricious nature of the distinction and its language dependence. He claims that “five-foot garden hose” is an individuative term since no part of it is a five-foot garden hose, but “garden hose” is not individuative. The latter claim requires some qualification. If being a garden hose requires a coupling on one end and a nozzle on the other, then the halves of a garden hose are not garden hoses. If being a garden hose requires neither a nozzle nor coupling, then each half (indeed each nth, up to some n) of a garden hose is a garden hose. If being a garden hose requires a coupling but not a nozzle, then one half of a garden hose is a garden hose but the other is not. Although the differences may be important to the gardener, it is difficult to see anything metaphysically deep here.

10. Sortals and their role in cognition

The concept of a sortal has made its way into the philosophy of cognition and psychology, particularly cognitive developmental psychology. Among others, sortal-related issues in these fields include how sortals contribute to cognitive development, specifically in humans (though also in non-human primates), their role in perception, and their connection to language, object-based attention, and the elements and structure of the (human) mind in its cognitive function.

10.1 The concept of physical object

A central issue in development psychology involves understanding when and how individuals develop the ability to recognize, identify and determine the persistence of objects over time and space. Some argue that the concept of a physical object plays a crucial role in this ability, serving as foundation for forming sortal concepts.

Ayers (1974), for instance, argued that the concept of a physical object is crucial for human cognition and its construction, as it provides criteria for counting and persistence. According to him, a physical object is a discrete entity, a natural unit or structure that exists, continues to exist, and ceases to exist independently of our conceptualization. Its unity is defined by causality. Moreover, a physically object is not simply matter filling a continuous space-time region; it exists as a maximal entity. This means that we typically do not regard any proper part of a physical object as an object on its own. This characteristic allows us to identify, count, and track the persistence of object over time and space.

Despite the above, Ayers does not regard the concept of a physical object as a sortal concept. He argues that a sortal concept must provide the essential features that define an object. While the concept of a physical object enables individuation and identification, it does not explain the unity and continuity of objects based on their essential features. In this regard, Ayers aligns with the view of sortals as concepts that provide the essence of the objects they apply to.

In contrast to Ayers, Xu (1997) views the concept of a physical object as a sortal, emphasizing that it includes counting and persistence criteria. This differentiates her perspective from Ayer’s. She understands the concept of a physical object as a bounded, coherent, three-dimensional entity that moves as a whole. Because the nature of such entities, Xu suggests that physical objects can persist through substantial transformations, citing the Biblical example of Lot’s wife turning into a pillar of salt (Xu 1997), a view that Ayers would reject. But, in an line similar to Ayers, she thinks that the concept of physical object persists in adults’ and can be applied to unfamiliar objects.

She also argues that the concept of physical object is integral to cognitive development and appears in infants at an early stage. Based on her research and that of others (Xu & Carey 1996,1999 Spelke 1996), she suggested that acquiring the concept of a physical object represents a key milestone in cognitive growth, paving the way for more sophisticated sortal concepts associated with language development. Sarnecki (2008) concurs, proposing that a general sortal concept is a necessary step toward acquiring language-based sortals.

In addition to the concept of physical object, Xu (2002) has suggested that linguistic labels may influence the acquisition of sortal concepts in infants as young as 9-months. Quine (1960) had already highlighted this crucial role of language in developing sortal-like predicates, proposing that the ability to distinguish the world into objects only develops with language and the conceptual framework of identity and quantification. However, experimental evidence from Soja et al. (1991) challenges Quine’s perspective. Moreover, research results in primates, such as those presented in Phillips and Santos (2007), and Mendes et al.(2008), provide additional empirical support against Quine’s claim. Nonetheless, a nuanced version of Quine’s view, particularly regarding quantitative distinctions, has found empirical backing in research by Imai and Genter (1997) and Yoshida and Smith (2003).

Xu’s interpretation of the concept of physical objected as a sortal has faced significant criticism. Critics argue, for example, that it excludes stationary objects, does not adequately express the nature of objects, and it is not maximal as she intends a physical object to be. Additionally, the experiments supporting Xu’s claims have been challenged. Critics have suggested that these findings may instead reflect infants’ perceptual ability to attend to and track objects using spatiotemporal information, even before fully developed system of concepts is in place. For further details on these critiques, see Ayers (1977), Casati (2004), Hirsch (1977), Rips and Leonard (2019), and Wiggins (1977). It is important to note that these different papers reveal the discrepancy that pervades the several interpretations of the nature of a sortal.

Finally, given the importance of object knowledge in navigating the environment, it is plausible that other species share some aspects of the concept of physical object. There is some preliminary evidence of this in primates, and recent findings suggest that young chickens may also possess such a concept (Fontanari et al.2014).

10.2 Essentialist cognition, basic level categorization, and sortals

Gelman (2003,2013) and others have provided evidence suggesting a mode of cognition of an essentialist character already operative in children. According to this view, specific categories of object and substances — such as natural and social kinds, artifacts and those represented by mass terms and sortals—are assumed to possess an underlying, unobservable reality. This assumption explains and grounds children’s inductive inferences based on the categories in question. It also accounts for children’s tendency to assign causal, non-obvious properties, and fixed, immutable boundaries to these categories. Children view some of these properties as innate. Research results (Caccione et al. 2016; Mendes et al.2018, 2011; and Santos et al.2002) suggest that essentialist thinking may emerge in humans at a pre-linguistic stage, particularly through the process of sortal object individuation. This phenomenon may also be evident in certain primates (Phillips et al.2010).

A related line of research, initiated by Rosch (1973) and Rosch et al. (1976), suggests that there is a category of basic level objects. While the specificity of classification can vary with context, there is a tendency to prefer a particular in most situations. For example, while we might generally describe something as a mammal or a poodle, the most common and natural noun would be “dog”. Rosch found considerable cross-cultural agreement on what constitutes as basic-level objects, although some variation exists. Basic-level categories are characterized by being the most informative, with features such such as shape, color, form of movement providing key information about other properties of the object. For example, a self-moving and dog-shaped it is likely to bark, eat meat, chase cats, etcetera.

Although Rosch’s basic-level categories offer useful answers to the question “What is it?” they do not provide the traditional essences philosophers and psychologist often discuss. Traditional essences are typically viewed as necessary and sufficient conditions for being a member of that kind. From this perspective, learning a new sortal requires knowing the defining features and how they combine to create the kind. However, according to Rosch’s conception, sortal words are learned through exposure to families of prototypes, with the primary learning experience involving familiarization with prototypical examples of the kind. Prototypes are the most representative examples, elicit the fastest responses when queried, and are the most frequently cited when asked for examples of a category. For example, in the category of birds, robins are one of the most prototypical, swans are intermediate, and penguins are very unprototypical. Evidence supporting Rosch’s theory, including the failure to produce adequate necessary and sufficient conditions for many common sortals, as well as the positive experimental evidence, suggest that categories function more fluidly that traditional essence-based account. This view aligns with Wittgenstein’s conception of categories.

In relation to the idea of essence, Markman (1989) and Markman et al. (2003) have argued that children’s early language learning is guided by several principles, one of which is the mutual exclusivity constraint. This principle suggests that when learning words, a guiding assumption is that distinct words refer to distinct things. While this assumption is not always true, Markman and others provide evidence that this constraint is operative, and that in the language learning environment of young children it is a very helpful, if imperfect constraint. If Rosch is correct about the existence of a preferred basic level of objects, it may be that speakers generally use words at that level of objects and thus the exclusivity constraint may be supported by the basic level object hypothesis. However, experimental data on these issues appear to be conflicting (Mervis et al. 1994). Scholl (2008) offers a useful discussion of whether and how philosophy and psychology can interact to deepen our understanding these issues.

10.3 Sortalism

The idea that entities require sortals for their individuation and identity is a broad position known as sortalism. Various forms of sortalism have been developed from either a metaphysical or psychological perspective, as mentioned in section 5.2 . When the focus is metaphysical, the view is referred as metaphysical sortalism. In this case, sortals are the metaphysical conditions for the identity, individuation, and essence of entities. (For instance, see Wiggins 2001 and Loew 2009). If sortalism is addressed from a psychological perspective, it is referred as psychosortalism or sortalism of thought.

Psychosortalism starts with the clear idea that human perception necessitates the individuation and differentiation of the perceived entities. In other words, when one encounters an object in the perceptual space—whether through sight, hearing, touch, smell, taste or any other sense—one must identify it as an individual and distinguish it from others in the same context in order to perceive it. Several philosophers and psychologists claim that this process of individuation and differentiation relies on sortal concepts (see Mcnamara 1986; Carey and Xu 1996 and 1999; Clark 2006; and Quine 1950 and 1960). Based on this claim, a second claim is upheld: sortals constitute the necessary elements to determine the persistence of objects and allow us to track them across space. Both of these two claims summarize the main tenets of psychosortalism or sortalism of thought.

While possessing sortal concepts enables effective perception (and so are sufficient for this task), their role as necessary conditions is contentious. Several arguments suggest that individuation and differentiation can occur without sortal concepts, relying instead on mechanisms that delineate and direct conscious attention to objects based on spatiotemporal and property information. This form of individuation is shared by animals, such as cats and dogs. (See Campbell 2002 and 2006, Raftopolous and Muller 2006).

Other arguments have challenged the evidence or pointed to linguistic phenomena that would be inexplicable if sortalism were correct. For example, the ability to refer to an object with a demonstrative without invoking a sortal concepts poses an important challenge (Goodman 2012). Experimental findings also indicate that psychosortalism fails to accurately predict how people judge individual artifacts and natural kinds. These results suggest that relying on sortal concepts alone cannot fully account for our ability to individuate and identify objects (Leonard and Rips 2015) or that such concepts may not be necessary for individuation (Tiago 2009).

Finally, it is important to distinguish perception and metaphysical sortalism from predication sortalism. The latter posits that predication is a cognitive act in which an entity (the subject of the predication) is classified and cognitively singled out. Predication sortalism claims that this act originates from the application of sortal concepts. This view is compatible with anti-psychosortalism, which holds that perception does not require sortal concepts. (For predication sortalism, see Freund 2021).

11. Sortals and logic

11.1 Sortals and standard logic

Some philosophers, perhaps most notably Carnap (1950) have used a concept closely akin to sortals in formulating many-sorted logics. There is a technical point to be explained and a controversy to be discussed in relation to these.

Sometimes in applications of first order logic, i.e., when we are dealing at length with a specific class of interpretations the domain divides into intuitively disparate kinds of objects, e.g., people and numbers. In the usual formulation, one has predicates, e.g., \(Px\) and \(Nx\) which are true of those kinds of things respectively, and so one translates the English sentence “All numbers are odd” as \((\forall x)(Nx \rightarrow Ox)\) and “Some person is tall” as \((\exists x)(Px \mathbin{\&} Tx)\). In a many-sorted logic distinct variables are used for the different kinds of objects, perhaps \(m\), \(n\),… for numbers and \(p\), \(q\),… for people. In this language combinations of variables with predicates are sometimes restricted so that \(Nm\) and \(Tp\) are well-formed but \(Np\) and \(Tn\) are not. If one does not make this restriction, then the notation is exactly equivalent to standard first-order logic. A many-sorted language is expressively equivalent to a single sorted one which has additional predicates for the various sorts of things (cf. Quine 1966).

From a purely technical point of view, one can introduce different kinds of variables to reflect any distinction one wants, e.g., there could be distinctive styles of variables for even numbers as opposed to odd ones, or for left-handed people as opposed to right-handed. However, Carnap and others who advocated a many-sorted logic for reasons that were more ontological than pragmatic introduced different variables only for what they believed were metaphysically distinct kinds of entities, e.g., numbers, physical objects, sense data. In this respect, there is some parallel with ultimate sortals as discussed above, although Carnap does not make an explicit connection with earlier writers.

A related use of many-sorted logic is to provide a kind of translation from second-order logic into a first-order logic. In this case instead of having second-order quantification over sets (or properties), one stays with a first-order language which is supplemented with a predicate true of all and only sets (or properties), a distinct style of variables for those entities, and with a two-place relation of either membership or instantiation.

11.2 Logics of sortals

Standard logic treats all predicate expressions alike—the predicates can be interpreted as any subset of the domain of quantification. If any of the claims discussed above about sortals are correct, then the sortal predicates have distinctive properties, and a more sophisticated logical treatment might provide philosophical illumination. One obvious and agreed on principle is that in general the negation of a sortal predicate is not a sortal. This contrasts with the predicates of standard logic where if \(F\) is a predicate, so is \(\neg F\), (not-\(F\)).

This principle holds regardless of which interpretation of “sortal” you take. Not only is “is not a cat” not a substantive sortal (Wiggins), but you also cannot count the non-cats since they include dogs, table, molecules, et cetera. However, for two of the other logical operators, disjunction and conjunction, the situation seems more complex. The expressions “dog or cat”, “apple or orange” and “fork or spoon” all seem to be well-behaved with respect to counting and identifying; we can easily imagine a city ordinance forbidding homeowners to have more than four dogs or cats. On the other hand, “dog or natural number” and “cat or clock” seem to provide methods of counting but seem unnatural as sortals.

The first “sortal logic” was developed in Stevenson (1975). Stevenson develops an account in which he says “We use ideas of Geach, Wallace and Wiggins, although we depart from each in certain respects” (1975: 186). Although the formalism follows Wallace in some respects, the main ideas seem to be those of Wiggins rather than Geach. Specifically, his theorem 3.4.5 affirms that for any sortals F, G, if b and c are the same F, and b is a G, then b and c are the same G, which is a denial of Geach’s relative identity thesis.

Two principles that Stevenson adopts following Wiggins are:

(i)
For every sortal F, either F is an ultimate sortal, or there is an ultimate sortal G such that F is a restriction of G.
(ii)
If two sortals F and G intersect, i.e., they are both true of at least one object, then there is a common sortal H of which both F and G are restrictions.

Stevenson proves the formal consistency and completeness of his set of axioms. It should be noted that completeness here is with respect to the language used. Since this is a minor adaptation of standard logic, there is no treatment of tense or modality, some essential elements of Wiggins’s notion of sortal cannot be expressed, e.g., if a sortal F applies to b at one time, then it applies to b at all times at which b exists, and if a sortal F applies to b, then F necessarily applies to b.

Stevenson does not permit combinations of sortal expressions, presumably because there is no easy way to deal with disjunctions and conjunctions of sortals in his formulation. However, a slight complication of his language would suffice to handle the problem. He uses “\(uS\)” for the ultimate sortal which governs sortal “\(S\)”. If instead he introduced a set of letters \(U'\), \(U''\) … for ultimate sortals, he could then superscript sortal expressions to indicate the ultimate sortal that governs them. He could then permit the disjunction of \(S^{U'}\) and \(T^{U'}\) since they are governed by the same ultimate sortal, but forbid the disjunction of \(S^{U'}\) and \(T^{U''}\) since they are governed by different ultimate sortals.

Cocchiarella (1977) presents a formal language, though no axioms or rules, for a logic of sortals which includes both tense and modal operators. His approach, like Wiggins, considers sortals to be concepts. Unlike Wiggins he gives a definition of “sortal concept”: as a socio-genetically developed cognitive ability or capacity to distinguish, count and collect or classify things (1977: 441). He disagrees with Wiggins on both principles (i) and (ii) above, arguing that while they may be true for natural kind terms, there are no reasons to believe that there are ultimate sortals of which various artifact sortals are restrictions, nor that every intersection of sortals must fall under an ultimate sortal. Cocchiarella’s approach also goes beyond Stevenson’s in that it involves second-order logic, i.e., it includes quantification over sortal concepts.

Cocchiarella’s ideas have been presented in more rigorous formal detail with axioms and consistency and completeness results for second-order logic in Freund (2000), tense logic (2001) and modalities (2004). More recently, Freund (2019) has formulated several bidimensional logics for sortals that consider modal, tense, and epistemic modalities, as well as complex sortals (i.e., sortals that involve logical combinations of other sortals). These systems presuppose a conceptualist philosophical background closely related to Cocchiarella’s but somewhat more general.

Belnap and Müller develop an alternative account of sortals within a non-standard formal logic for tense and modality. Unlike the usual background of possible worlds for modality, they use ideas from Bressan (1972) and adopt cases as the fundamental background notion They define a sortal as a predicate which is modally constant and provides separability. A predicate is modally constant iff it applies necessarily to something whenever it possibly applies. The idea is that while someone might possibly be a student without necessarily being a student, if they are human, they are necessarily human. Thus “student” is not a sortal but “human” is. A predicate is modally separated just in case it is necessarily true that if any two things having the property are possibly identical, then they are in fact necessarily identical. Using their technical terminology of cases, if two things which have a modally separated property coincide in any case, then they coincide in every case. Belnap and Müller are explicit that they are providing a formal framework for classifying predicates, but that applications will require other kinds of thought:

whether a particular predicate is absolute is assumed to be not a matter of logic, but rather of science and metaphysics. (Belnap & Müller 2014: 397)

12. Sortals and artificial intelligence

Guarino, Carrara, and Giaretta (1994) develop an account of sortals within knowledge representation, a subfield of artificial intelligence intended to bridge the gap between abstract formal logics and natural languages. Their definition of a sortal is that it is a predicate that provides countability and is temporally stable. A predicate provides countability if it does not apply to any proper part of what it applies to. As they explain this, “student” provides countability because no proper part of a student is a student; but “red” does not provide countability because parts of red things are also red. Temporal stability means that if the predicate applies to something at one time, then it must at some other times as well. This is approximately the concept Strawson had in mind. They go on to distinguish a subset of these, the substantial sortals. A substantial sortal is one that, if it applies at all, necessarily applies all times. This is in close agreement with Wiggins’ use of the term. So while “student” provides countability and is temporally stable, it is not ontologically rigid, so it is a sortal but not a substantial sortal. On the other hand, a cat is always necessarily a cat.

Although there are obvious affinities with Strawson and Wiggins, it should be noted that Guarino et al. (1994) are primarily concerned with the distinction between kinds and properties of kinds, while the philosophers were more concerned with things and the stuff they are made of.

We should also note that there is a shared core of concerns in these last two approaches, it is clear that in addition to the superficial difference that Belnap and Müller restrict “sortal” to approximately the substantial sortals as defined in Guarino et al. (1994), there are differences even in the area of overlap. Modal rigidity and modal constancy are very similar. (Some caution is necessary here since the modal logic frameworks differ.) But Belnap and Müller emphasize modal separability and do not mention a counting requirement, Guarino et al. (1994) require countability but are not concerned with modal identities.

In addition to Guarino et al. (1994), computational applications of the notion of sortal can be found recently in upper ontology, a relatively new field in computer sciences. For example, Guizzardi and Wagner (2010) make central use of the notion of sortal in a conceptual framework they call Unified Foundational Ontology (UFO). This framework can be used in the design and evaluation of conceptual modeling languages. In UFO, the focus on sortals is on the identity criteria they provide, which contrasts with Guarino et al. (1994) where the emphasis is put instead on countability and persistence. Besides, UFO makes a distinction, among sortals, between rigid and anti-rigid sortals. An instance of a rigid sortal S will be an instance of S in every possible world in which it exists. Anti-rigid sortals will not comply with this feature. From the authors’ examples and further claims, it is clear that rigid sortals correspond to substance sortals and anti-rigid to phase sortals. Because possible worlds are involved, UFO’s framework seems to be committed to individual essentialism. One will then ask whether UFO’s general goal is achievable, given the critique of such essentialism by philosophers of biology. We should finally note that one can also appeal to a tense logic framework to illuminate the distinction between substance and phase sortals, in contrast with UFO’s modal approach. (See Rybola and Pergl (2016a, 2016b), and Miletic and Sariyar (2022), for further examples of recent applications of the notion of sortal in computational ontology.)

13. Conclusion

A large number of thoughtful philosophers have believed that the category of sortal was philosophically significant and this is a strong indication that there is something important they are attempting to delineate and analyze. In the last two decades cognitive psychologists and formal ontologists have applied the term in their research. However, our dissection of the definitions and discussions show that there are numerous distinctions in question and while these distinctions have significant overlap, they are not identical. It remains to be seen whether the sortal/non-sortal distinction marks one very important difference, or numerous less important distinctions related in complex ways.

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