Spinoza’s Political Philosophy

First published Mon Apr 21, 2008; substantive revision Mon Sep 30, 2024

At least in anglophone countries, Spinoza’s reputation as a political thinker is eclipsed by his reputation as a rationalist metaphysician. Nevertheless, Spinoza was a penetrating political theorist whose writings have enduring significance. In his two political treatises, Spinoza advances a number of forceful and original arguments in defense of democratic governance, freedom of thought and expression, and the subordination of religion to the state. On the basis of his naturalistic metaphysics, Spinoza also offers trenchant criticisms of ordinary conceptions of right and duty. And his account of civil organization stands as an important contribution to the development of constitutionalism and the rule of law.

1. Historical Background

To appreciate the significance of Spinoza’s political philosophy, we must situate it in its particular theologico-political context as well as its broader intellectual context.

1.1 Theological and Political Background

Despite being one of the most tolerant countries in early-modern Europe—a sanctuary for free thinkers and members of religious minorities—the United Provinces were riven by religious conflict, as the Dutch sought to establish their identity after gaining independence from Spain. The confessional rifts of the seventeenth century were an important part of context in which Spinoza composed his Tractatus Theologico-Politicus [hereafter: TTP].

The early decades of the seventeenth century were marked by a deep religious schism that took on political import. In 1610, forty-four followers of liberal theologian Jacobus Arminius wrote a formal “Remonstrance” that articulated the ways in which they broke with orthodox Calvinism. These Arminians, or Remonstrants, as they came to be known, defended religious toleration on the grounds that faith concerns only the conscience of the individual and so is not subject to the coercive power of the state. The Remonstrants were opposed by conservative Gomarists (followers of Franciscus Gomarus), or so-called “Counter-Remonstrants”. For a little over a decade (roughly 1607–1618), the dispute raged on, expanding outward from Holland and Utrecht. In 1618, a national synod (the Synod of Dort) convened to define the public faith more explicitly. The fallout from the Synod of Dort was disastrous for the tolerant Arminians. The Advocate of the States of Holland, Johan Oldenbarnevelt, a staunch defender of the Remonstrants, was put to death. And Arminians were purged from town councils and universities throughout the republic (Israel 1995).

The middle of the century witnessed its own major theologico-political dispute in the United Provinces. Once again, at the center of the dispute were two theologians: Johannes Cocceius, a liberal theology professor at the University of Leiden, and Gisbertus Voetius, Dean of the University of Utrecht. Disputes between Cocceians and Voetians began over abstruse theological matters, but expanded into a larger political and cultural affair. The Voetians led an assault on the Cartesian philosophy taught in the universities. They thought that the new science advocated by Descartes, with its mechanistic view of the material world, posed a threat to Christianity (Nadler 1999 [2018]). This episode, like the earlier theological crisis, shows that the freedom of philosophizing remained under perpetual threat even in this relatively tolerant republic.

Spinoza was no stranger to this threat. Growing up as a member of Amsterdam’s Jewish community, Spinoza was under the careful watch of rabbinical authorities who notoriously cast him out of this community in 1656 for his “abominable heresies” and “monstrous deeds”. While Spinoza apparently endured this cherem (roughly: excommunication) with characteristic equanimity, fellow Dutch apostate Jew, Uriel da Costa, was unable to bear the indignity of a similar fate. In 1640—when Spinoza was only eight years old—da Costa, was the target of a cherem for denying the immortality of the soul and challenging the status of the Torah as divine revelation. Da Costa took his own life shortly after being ignominiously readmitted (according to one account, he was forced to lie at the threshold of the synagogue where congregants tread upon him while exiting).

The da Costa affair surely made a lasting impression on Spinoza, but it did not affect him as personally as the treatment of his friend Adriaan Koerbagh at the hands of Dutch authorities. In 1668 Koerbagh published two treatises that provoked the wrath of the Calvinist clergy. In the more scandalous of the two—Een Bloemhof van allerley lieflijkheyd (A Flower Garden of all Kinds of Loveliness)—Koerbagh ridiculed several traditional religious doctrines and practices, and, in the process, articulated his own religious and metaphysical views. Among the shocking views that he advanced were that Jesus is not divine, that God is identical with nature, that everything is necessitated by the laws of nature (the laws of God), and that miracles are impossible. These are all positions that Spinoza endorsed. However, while Spinoza was famously cautious, Koerbagh was not, publishing the works in Dutch (thereby making them accessible to the general literate public) under his own name. Koerbagh was tried and sentenced on charges of blasphemy. During his subsequent imprisonment under squalid conditions Koerbagh became ill. He died soon thereafter, in 1669. It is generally supposed that Koerbagh’s imprisonment and death precipitated the publication of the TTP (Nadler 1999 [2018]).

Things would only get worse for liberal republicans like Spinoza. In 1672, the so-called “disaster year” (rampjaar), French troops under the command of Louis XIV invaded the United Provinces, capturing several Dutch cities. Grand Pensionary (chief statesman and legal advisor) Johan de Witt shouldered much of the blame for this military embarrassment. De Witt was the leader of the States of Holland for much of the republican period that followed the death of Stadholder William II in 1650. After the French invasion, the stadholdership (a quasi-monarchical post) was reinstituted in the person of William III, and de Witt was forced to resign. Shortly afterward he and his brother Cornelis were brutally killed by a zealous mob. This incident evoked uncommon outrage in Spinoza, a supporter of de Witt and the republican ideals for which he stood. According to one famous account, Spinoza had to be restrained by his landlord from taking a sign reading ultimi barbarorum [“ultimate of barbarians”] to the site of the massacre (Freudenthal 1899: 201). Spinoza’s Tractatus Politicus [Hereafter: TP] was composed in the aftermath of, and perhaps prompted in part by, the events of 1672.

1.2 Intellectual Background

In terms of the broader intellectual background to Spinoza’s political thought, Thomas Hobbes figures prominently (for a recent comparative study, see Field 2020). Spinoza’s work in relationship to Hobbes’s will be discussed in some detail below (§2.1 and §2.2, below). It is important to mention the impact of Dutch Hobbesians on Spinoza. Hobbesian thought was introduced into Dutch political discourse by Lambert van Velthuysen, an anti-clerical, liberal physician (Tuck 1979; Blom 1995). Velthuysen’s Dissertatio is an unabashed defense of Hobbes’s thought, in which the duty to preserve oneself is given pride of place (see esp. §13). Spinoza read Velthuysen and admired him as a “man of exceptional sincerity of mind”, and he was thus disconcerted when Velthuysen denounced the TTP as the work of a dangerous atheist (Epistles 42 and 43).

Aside from Velthuysen, the other primary Dutch conduits for Hobbesian thought prior to Spinoza were the De la Court brothers, Pieter and Johan (Petry 1984; Kossmann 2000). The De la Courts were ardent republicans who maintained good relations with Johan de Witt. Indeed, de Witt is thought to have written two chapters in the second edition of their book Interest van Holland (see Petry 1984). The De la Courts accepted the basic features of Hobbesian anthropology, while eschewing juridical concepts like “right” and “contract” (see Malcolm 1991), opting instead to analyze the civil condition in terms of the competing interests of participants. According to them, the aim of the state is to ensure that the interests of rulers are tied to the interests of the ruled, which is possible only if one adopts a series of institutional measures, including blind balloting, the removal of hereditary posts, and the rotation of offices. Republics, they argued, are marked by greater checks against self-interested legislation than monarchies (see Blom 1993). Spinoza evidently read these works carefully, and his institutional recommendations in the TP reflect a debt to the De la Courts (Petry 1984; Haitsma Mulier 1980).

It might well have been the writings of the De la Courts that impressed upon Spinoza the perspicacity of Niccolò Machiavelli. The notion of balancing the interests of competing parties was ultimately derived from Machiavelli (Haitsma Mulier 1991; Del Lucchese 2004 [2009]). Spinoza’s TP is shot through with Machiavellian insights and recommendations. Right at the outset of the work, Spinoza parrots Machiavelli’s critique of utopian theorizing, elevating statespeople over philosophers, since only the former begin with a realistic conception of human psychology (TP 1.1; cf. Machiavelli, The Prince I.15). Machiavellian realism pervades Spinoza’s political writings, playing a particularly significant role in the constitutional theorizing of the TP.

2. Basic Features of Spinoza’s Political Philosophy

Spinoza’s commitment to metaphysical naturalism, according to which all things act in accordance with the pervasive, immutable, and non-teleological laws of nature (EIII Preface), forms an important part of the backdrop of Spinoza’s political philosophy. It leads him to reject traditional (Thomistic or Protestant) natural law theory, which is predicated on a natural normative order of things (discernible by right reason) distinct from the actual order of things. According to traditional natural law theory, humans act contrary to nature when they act contrary to the precepts of right reason. Spinoza skewers this view, according to which “the ignorant disturb the order of nature rather than follow it”, claiming that it implies that humans are “a dominion within a dominion [imperium in imperio]” (TP 2.6). Against this view, Spinoza insists that all human action, no matter how irrational, follows from the “laws and rules of nature” (TP 2.5). This is, arguably, a direct rebuke of the natural law tradition (see Curley 1991; Steinberg 2018a: Ch. 2; but see Miller 2012 and A. Garrett 2003 for different assessments).

2.1 Hobbes and Spinoza on the Right of Nature

Spinoza’s naturalism profoundly shapes his views of right and obligation, which can be illuminated through a contrast with Hobbes.

One of the most notorious features of Spinoza’s political thought is his account of natural right. He introduces this concept in TTP 16, where he boldly writes:

By the right and established practice of nature I mean nothing but the rules of the nature of each individual, according to which we conceive each thing to be naturally determined to existing and having effects in a certain way. For example, fish are determined by nature to swimming, and the large ones to eating the smaller. So it is by the supreme right of nature that fish are masters of the water, and that the large ones eat the smaller. For it’s certain that nature, considered absolutely, has the supreme right to do everything it can, i.e., that the right of nature extends as far as its power does. For the power of nature is the power of God itself, and he has the supreme right over all things. But the universal power of the whole of nature is nothing but the power of all individuals together. From this it follows that each individual has a supreme right to do everything it can, or that the right of each thing extends as far as its determinate power does. (TTP 16.2–4; cf. TP 2.4)

In claiming that the right of nature is coextensive with the power of nature and that this applies mutatis mutandis to individuals in nature, Spinoza is rejecting a moral conception of right, rather than making a positive normative claim (for a careful analysis of this passage, see Grey 2021). So although Spinoza is sometimes presented as subscribing to the view that “might makes right” (Barbone & Rice 2000; McShea 1968), in fact he is not so much advancing a normative claim of right as denying the existence of normative rights (see Curley 1996; Balibar 1985 [1998]). Consequently, even if Spinoza’s account implies that Cortés conquered the Aztecs by right, it does not follow that it was the right, proper, or best thing to do (see TP 5.1 and TTP 20.6–7; see §2.3). Actions are good only insofar as they empower (see, e.g., E4p8d), but one can perfectly well do things—and so, according to the reasoning above, do things by right—that are in fact disempowering (to be sure, though, these do not count as actions in the strict sense laid out in the Ethics of producing effects from one’s nature alone [E3D1–3]).

Spinoza’s account of natural right is often regarded as broadly Hobbesian. And yet there are important differences. Hobbes’s account of natural right changed somewhat between his early political writings and Leviathan. In De Cive, for instance, Hobbes defines right as “the liberty each man has of using his natural faculties in accordance with right reason” (DCv 1.7). Natural right is the liberty to do anything consistent with the natural law (DCv 2.1), including the liberty to do anything that one judges to be necessary for one’s preservation (DCv 1.8–1.9). Hobbes adds a proviso here, namely that one must sincerely believe that the act contributes to one’s preservation (DCv 1.10n). Consequently, since “drunkenness and cruelty” cannot sincerely be thought to contribute to self-preservation, drunken and cruel actions are not performed by right, even in the state of nature (DCv 3.27).

In Leviathan, Hobbes seems to jettison these normative constraints (for the “de facto” turn in Hobbes’s thought, see Hoekstra 2004 and Field 2014). But this does not mean that he disavows a normative conception of right. On the contrary, the concept of right as an alienable title is absolutely essential to his account of the formation of sovereign authority in Leviathan. Spinoza seizes on this distinction in his response to Jarig Jelles’s question of how his view differs from Hobbes. He writes:

As far as Politics is concerned, the difference you ask about, between Hobbes and me, is this: I always preserve natural Right unimpaired, and I maintain that in each State the Supreme Magistrate has no more right over its subjects than it has greater power over them. (Epistle 50)

On Spinoza’s thoroughgoingly naturalistic account, natural right is not a title that can be given away. It is—or is coextensive with—one’s power. Still, Spinoza does allow for a sense in which one can cede right to another and even seems to adopt his own version of a social contract in the TTP. We will consider below (§3.6) how his conception of a social contract, and the transfer or cessation of right on which it depends, can be made compatible with his strict naturalism about right.

2.2 Hobbes and Spinoza on Obligation

The difference between Hobbes and Spinoza on right bears directly on their distinct accounts of obligation. Hobbes thinks that we incur binding obligations when we make pledges under the appropriate conditions. By contrast, Spinoza maintains that

a contract can have no force except by reason of its utility. If the utility is taken away, the contract is taken away with it, and remains null and void. (TTP 16.20; cf. TP 2.12)

Elsewhere, he clarifies that the validity of an agreement depends not so much on utility as perceived utility, proceeding to argue that since men are psychologically bound to choose what appears to be the greater good or lesser evil, it would be absurd to claim that they have an obligation to do otherwise.

By adhering to a strict naturalism about right and obligation and maintaining that “the sovereign power in a State has right over a subject only in proportion to the excess of its power over that of a subject” (Epistle 50), Spinoza places the burden of political stability on the sovereign rather than the subject (see Wernham 1958). The commonwealth must be structured so as to promote compliance; and where there is excessive vice or non-compliance, this is to be “imputed to the Commonwealth” (TP 5.3). And if a sovereign is to maintain its right, it must legislate wisely, so as not to rouse the indignation of the people (TP 3.9). Arguably, then, while Spinoza does not accord to the people a proper right of revolution, he proposes a naturalistic equivalent, since the right of the state is essentially constituted, and consequently limited, by the power of the people (TP 2.17) (see Sharp 2013).

Thus, when Spinoza points to the differences between his view of natural right and Hobbes’s in his letter to Jelles, differences that might seem negligible to the casual reader, he is identifying a significant break. Spinoza’s naturalism leads him to reject the Hobbesian distinction between the artificial civil state and the state of nature, as well as the notion of a notion of (non-prudential) obligation that arises with the construction of the commonwealth. But given his repudiation, or at least radical revision, of rights and obligations as traditionally understood, one might be left wondering how or even whether Spinoza could offer a normative political theory at all.

2.3 Spinoza and Normativity

Lest one think that Spinoza’s accounts of right and obligation eliminate any basis for normative evaluations of political affairs, he clarifies:

It’s…one thing to defend oneself, to preserve oneself, make a judgment, etc., by right, and another to defend oneself, preserve oneself, and make a judgment in the best way. (TP 5.1; cf. TTP 20.6–7)

The goodness or badness of an action in political affairs, as in ethics, is determined by how the action affects a thing’s striving or one’s power (see EIVP18S; TP 2.8; TTP 16.10). Things are good for a state to the extent that they conduce to the power of the people as a corporate whole. And from the perspective of the individual subject, the state can be judged to be good, fulfilling its purpose as it were (see §4.3), to the extent that it liberates or empowers.

3. The Tractatus Theologico-Politicus

As noted in §1.1, the United Provinces were torn apart in the seventeenth century by disputes concerning, among other things, the political role of the Calvinist church. Spinoza’s Tractatus Theologico-Politicus can be seen as an intervention in this broad dispute. The stated goals of this work were to dispel charges of atheism, to oppose the prejudices of the theologians, and to defend the freedom to philosophize (Epistle 30). Setting aside the first aim, which was a spectacular failure (see §6), we will focus on Spinoza’s critique of superstition and his arguments for the freedom of philosophizing.

3.1 Countering the Social Roots of Superstition

The TTP opens with a trenchant analysis of fear’s role in engendering superstition (Preface.1–6). Put simply, Spinoza thinks that fear makes one credulous and so prone to superstitious thinking. The powerful exploit this condition, using the levers of religion (e.g., fear of damnation, hope of salvation) to inspire anxiety and breed dependence, shoring up their own power (Preface.9–10). An empowered clergy are among those who contribute to this unhappy condition by encouraging ambitious people, rather than those motivated by loving-kindness (caritas), to join their ranks, turning “the temple” into a “Theater” (Preface.15), and channeling widespread anxiety into a resentment towards religious dissidents. While there is much more to say about Spinoza’s account of the social roots of superstition in the TTP (see James 2020: Ch. 3; Steinberg 2018a: Ch. 6), the crucial point here, which sets the agenda for much of the work, is that Spinoza takes an empowered clergy to be the primary source of a politically debilitating superstition.

3.2 The Separation Thesis

Chapters 1–15 of the TTP can be seen as constituting the first plank of a two-plank argument against clerical power. These chapters, though full of self-standing arguments, can be seen as working towards a single primary claim: the separation of faith from philosophy. The claim that faith and philosophy are distinct (hereafter: Separation Thesis) is politically significant in a couple of ways. First, it is based in a deflationary conception of faith as that set of beliefs, whatever its contents, that conduce to piety, loving-kindness, and obedience (TTP 14). By denying that faith requires true beliefs about God’s nature, and by treating the essential moral content of Scripture as simple and directly accessible to all readers, Spinoza effectively undercuts clerical claims to intellectual authority. Second, by separating faith and philosophy, Spinoza allows that philosophical inquiry, however bold, cannot be contrary to faith unless it results in impious motivations or works. This is a crucial step in the direction of defending the freedom to philosophize (§3.5; Lærke 2021).

One could divide the argument for the Separation Thesis into five stages. The first stage (Preface) consists of reading Scripture “with an unprejudiced and free spirit” (TTP Preface.20). Rather assuming ex ante the truth of Scripture, Spinoza vows “to affirm nothing about it, and to admit nothing as its teaching, which it did not very clearly teach me” (ibid.). This minimal, though not uncontroversial, methodological principle makes possible stage two (Ch. 1–6), in which Spinoza directly critiques the view that Scripture is the source of metaphysical insight into God’s nature and actions. In these chapters, Spinoza denies the possibility of miracles and treats prophetic claims to knowledge as mere products of lively imaginations. Still, it would be a mistake to think that Scripture is simply a confused philosophical text. To block this inference, Spinoza needs a robust interpretative method, which he supplies in TTP 7 (stage three). In this chapter, he advances a naturalistic exegetical method, according to which to understand a text, we must inquire into “life, character and concerns of the author” (TTP 7.23) and the conditions of its composition. And we must start our analysis with what is “universal and common to the [text as a] whole” (TTP 7.27), that is, with those claims that are most pervasive and immediately evident. He then applies this naturalistic approach to Scripture, first in order to reject decisively the view of Scripture as divine revelation (stage four: Ch. 8–12), and then, in the fifth and final stage of the argument (Ch. 13–15), to show that what is pervasive to Scripture—the “common notions” of the text, as it were—is nothing other than a set of simple moral truths encouraging obedience and the love of God and one’s neighbor. Unlike philosophy, which aims at metaphysical truth, faith aims only to promote obedience and good works.

By separating religion and philosophy, faith and reason, Spinoza distances himself both from those who—like Maimonides and Spinoza’s friend Ludwig Meyer—twist Scripture to make it conform to reason, and those who claim that where Scripture conflicts with reason we must renounce reason (TTP 15.1–22). The Separation Thesis has profound political import, since it undercuts the grounds for many theological disputes that were the source of considerable unrest in the Dutch Republic. And by showing that Scripture is not the source of great mysteries that must be interpreted by a clerical vanguard, but is rather a repository of simple moral lessons that are immediately comprehensible to all, Spinoza undercuts much of the basis for ecclesiastical authority.

3.3 The Single Authority Thesis

While the Separation Thesis undercuts clerical claims to epistemic authority, the next block of block of chapters (TTP 16–19) undercuts clerical claims to political authority (the second plank of the argument), by establishing that “authority in sacred matters belongs wholly to the sovereign powers ” (Ch. 19, title). The claim that the civil sovereign holds authority over (external) matters of religion—a view referred to as Erastianism after theologian Thomas Erastus—turns on an analysis of the conditions of sovereign authority. Spinoza accepts, with Bodin and Hobbes, that sovereignty consists in the absolute authority to legislate (Prokhovnik 2001). If it were not within the sovereign right to determine what counts as divine law (TTP 19.1) or what counts as pious (with respect to external expressions of religion) (TTP 19.3), then the “sovereign” would not in fact have absolute authority to legislate, the “sovereign” would not be sovereign (TTP 19.41–42). Where authority is divided, there is no sovereignty. This is a kind of analytical argument from the concept of sovereignty as absolute legislator. In order, then, for the sovereign to be a sovereign, and for the state to be guided as if by a single mind, the civil sovereign must retain authority over (external manifestations of) religion.

Of course, a sovereign could delegate authority to religious functionaries, while still maintaining ultimate authority; but Spinoza cautions against this, using the case of the Hebrews to illustrate the dangers of priestly authority. What precipitated the decline of the first Hebrew state was the ascendance of a priestly order. On Spinoza’s account, under Moses, civil law and religion “were one and the same thing” (TTP 17.31) and the Jews lived peaceably. However, when the priests were given the right to interpret divine law,

each one began to seek the glory of his own name both in religion and in other matters, determining everything by priestly authority and daily issuing new decrees…The result? Religion declined into a deadly superstition. (18.8–9)

The message here had palpable application in the Dutch context, where Calvinist theocrats were increasingly wielding power to the detriment of peace and stability (§1.1).

On Spinoza’s account, the history of the Hebrew state reveals that civil stability requires the limitation of ecclesiastical power, and that it is disastrous for clerics to exercise coercive power over matters of religion (TTP 18.22–27). This is another step in the direction of defending the freedom to philosophize (§3.5).

3.4 Positive Civil Function of Religion

Despite its potential for harm, Spinoza thinks that religion can perform a positive political function. It can help to promote obedience and civic-mindedness (e.g., TTP 14; cf. discussion of Moses and state religion in TTP 5). For instance, the ceremonial laws and practices of the Jews helped to foster and preserve cohesion among an ignorant, nomadic populace (TTP 3 and 5). The central moral message of religion—namely, to love one’s neighbor (e.g., TTP 14.9)—may be understood through reason; but Scripture presents this same message in a manner that is suited to the understanding of the masses (TTP 14.36; see Strauss 1930 [1965: Ch. 9]; Smith 1997: Ch. 2). Religion might also play a role in promoting compliance with the law. Michael Rosenthal has suggested that, on Spinoza’s account, “transcendental beliefs” assist in overcoming free rider problems; defections from agreements and non-compliance with the law would likely be widespread among human beings were it not for religion (Rosenthal 1998).

The salutary function of religion is undermined when sectarianism emerges. To diminish the threat of sectarianism, Spinoza advances a universal or civil religion that captures the moral core of religion, to which all citizens can subscribe, irrespective of what other private beliefs they hold (TTP 14.22–34). Like Rousseau after him, Spinoza seeks to promote a universal civic religion that can bolster solidarity, channeling religious passions into social benefits.

3.5 Toleration

Spinoza is often regarded as a liberal, due, in large part, to his defense of the freedoms of thought and speech in TTP 20. However, the tolerationism expressed in TTP 20 might seem to stand in tension with the Erastian claim of TTP 19. How can Spinoza be a liberal about religious practice while also defending the view that the state maintains full right over matters of religion? There are three things worth noting here. First, unlike Locke’s tolerationism, Spinoza’s defense of civil liberties in TTP 20 is not fundamentally a defense freedom of worship (Israel 2001: 265–266). Rather, it is essentially a defense of the freedom to philosophize (for a comprehensive account of what this consists in, see Lærke 2021); religious freedom is at best a byproduct of this primary aim. Second, Spinoza distinguishes between outward expressions of faith and one’s inward worship of God. Sovereign authority extends only to the former, leaving the latter to the individual, for reasons that we will examine in a moment. Both of these positions can be understood as lending support to the Arminian cause against Calvinist Theocrats. Finally, Spinoza’s Erastianism points to the limited character of his brand of toleration. The sovereign retains full discretion to determine which actions are acceptable and which forms of speech are seditious. As Lewis Feuer ruefully notes, Spinoza does not offer anything resembling Oliver Wendell Holmes’s standard of “clear and present danger” to constrain sovereign intervention (Feuer 1958 [1987: 114]).

Spinoza advances several arguments in defense of the freedom to philosophize. The first argument is that it is strictly impossible to control another’s beliefs completely (TTP 20.1–6). Since right is coextensive with power, lacking the power to control beliefs entails lacking the right to do so. However, because Spinoza admits that beliefs can be influenced in myriad ways, this argument only takes one so far in a defense of the freedom of thought.

To expand the case, Spinoza turns from considering what the sovereign can do to what it would be practical or prudent for a sovereign to do (TTP 20.6), offering a battery of prudential arguments in defense of non-interference. He argues that because people are prone to express what they think, the strict regulation of speech will be perceived as violent or oppressive (TTP 20.8–9), provoking instability and resentment. And even if a state were able to prevent people from speaking their minds, this would only result in the erosion of good faith [fides] on which civil associations depend, since people would “think one thing and say something else” (TTP 20.27).

Spinoza also argues that in general the more oppressively a sovereign governs, the more rebellious the citizens will be, since most people become resentful when their views are regarded as criminal (TTP 20.28–29). Legislative persecution and civil resistance have a common root on Spinoza’s account, namely, ambition, or the desire that others judge things as we do (EIIIP31S, EVP4S) (see Rosenthal 2001 and 2003). People are so constituted that when differences of opinion arise—as they inevitably do—they are inclined to foist their views on others and to resist others’ attempts to do the same. But however natural the ambitious impulse to compel others’ beliefs and expressions may be, if incorporated into law, the result is catastrophic. Moreover, since it is often the ignorant and vicious who initiate moral crusades, and the wise and peace-loving who are the targets, we ought to be especially wary of political restrictions of belief and speech (TTP 20.33–36).

These arguments in defense of civil liberties are, by and large, prudential. They are not principled arguments that depend on rights or the intrinsic value of such liberty, much to the disappointment of some commentators (Feuer 1958 [1987]; Curley 1996). The defense is also notably restricted. While it is imprudent to seek to use state power to control thought and speech, it is also “disastrous” to grant unlimited freedom of speech (TTP 20.10). Specifically, the sovereign must stamp out seditious speech (TTP 20.20–21), which includes not only the denial of sovereign supreme authority (TTP 20.21; cf. TP 19.34), but also, apparently, forms of speech marked by pronounced anger, hatred, or deception (TTP 20.14, TTP 20.12, TTP 20.21), which divide the commonwealth. Far from being a free speech absolutist, Spinoza defends freedom of speech just insofar as, and to the extent that, it promotes civic harmony and flourishing (Steinberg 2010b). We should not, then, conflate the freedom of philosophizing that Spinoza so staunchly defends, with the liberty to say whatever one wishes (see Lærke 2021).

3.6 Social Contract in the TTP

Scholars have long puzzled about how to understand Spinoza’s account of the social contract in the TTP. Spinoza introduces the contract in Chapter 16, claiming that in order to overcome pre-civil strife, “[people] had to make a very firm resolution and contract to direct everything only according to the dictate of reason” (TTP 16.14), transferring one’s right to determine how to live and defend oneself to the sovereign (TTP 16.25–26); cf. EIVP37S2). Later, Spinoza points to the establishment of the Hebrew state, with Moses as the sovereign, as an historical example of a social contract (TTP 19.12). The social contract seems to confer nearly boundless authority on the sovereign. At least as long as we are rational, “we’re bound to carry out absolutely all commands of the supreme power—even if it commands the greatest absurdities” (TTP 16.27).

It is hard to see how to square Spinoza’s contractualism with his naturalism. What is this right that is surrendered or transferred? And how can one transfer away one’s right, if one’s right is coextensive with one’s power? Some commentators take these problems with Spinoza’s social contract to be insurmountable, seeing his abandonment of contract-talk in the TP as an acknowledgment of the inconsistency of the TTP (Wernham 1958). Others interpret the contract in a way that is makes it consistent with his naturalism. This requires distinguishing between two Latin concepts are rendered in English as “power” (Negri 1981 [1991]; see also Curley’s Glossary [entry: “Power”] in Spinoza [CWS]). On the one hand there is one’s potentia, which is the (non-transferrable) power that is essential to the individual (Barbone & Rice 2000). One the other hand, there is one’s potestas, one’s authority (Barbone & Rice 2000) or coercive power (Blom 1995). Arguably, Spinoza operates with two corresponding concepts of right, one of which is co-extensive with one’s causal power (potentia) and the other of which corresponds to one’s potestas (see Steinberg 2008). One can cede one’s right insofar as one puts oneself under the other’s potestas. And, on Spinoza’s account, one is under another’s potestas insofar as one strongly depends upon and defers to the other (TTP 17.5–8; TP 2.9–10). Spinoza seems to be arguing in these passages that power is not transferred by way of a speech act, but through an ongoing pattern of (psychological) deference.

To be sure, there remain passages that are difficult to square with the naturalistic reading of the contract, passages that imply that we have obligations arising from the transfer of right, even when we are not motivated to obey (TTP 16.27)—this suggests that the legitimacy of the contract and the obligations to which it gives rise do not depend on deference alone. However, defenders of the naturalistic reading have sought to explain away these cases, for instance by arguing that civil obligations are rooted in deference but that there is a distinction between the kind of ongoing patterned dependence in virtue of which one stands under the right of another and incurs obligations and particular instances of compliance (Steinberg 2018a: Ch. 2).

4. The Tractatus Politicus

One might wonder why, having published the TTP in 1670, Spinoza decided shortly thereafter to start working on a second political treatise. It is tempting to suppose that he must have come to reject many of his earlier views. However, with the possible exception of his view of the social contract (see §4.1), there is little evidence that Spinoza came to reject any of the central claims of his earlier treatise. Rather, the TP is distinguished from the earlier treatise chiefly by its aims and rhetorical style. Whereas the TTP was written for an audience of liberal Christian theologians to address the problems posed by officious Calvinist theocrats, the TP is concerned with the general organization of the state and was written for philosophers. In the later treatise, Spinoza abandons what has been described as the “theological idiom of popular persuasion” (Feuer 1958 [1987: 151]) in favor of the dispassionate style of a political scientist (Balibar 1985 [1998: 50]).

The TP is a fitting sequel to the Ethics (Matheron 1969). Whereas the Ethics reveals the path to individual freedom, the TP reveals the extent to which individual freedom depends on civil institutions (Matheron 1969). We should not be surprised to find Spinoza’s philosophy taking a civic turn near the end of his life. From his earliest writings, he claims that he is concerned not just to perfect his own nature but also

to form a society of the kind that is desirable, so that as many as possible may attain [a flourishing life] as easily and surely as possible. (Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, §14, in Spinoza [CW])

The TP may be seen as Spinoza’s attempt to articulate some of the conditions for the possibility of such a society.

The work can be divided into three sections. In the first section (roughly Chs. 1–4), Spinoza discusses the metaphysical basis of the state and the natural limits of state power. In the second section (Ch. 5), Spinoza lays out the general aims of the state. And in the third section (Ch. 6 to Ch. 11), Spinoza advances and justifies institutional recommendations for different regime forms: monarchy, aristocracy, and democracy.

4.1 Metaphysical Basis of the State

In the early chapters of the TP, Spinoza puts forth his naturalistic program, including the thesis that the state, like everything else, is a natural thing (res naturalis), governed by the laws of nature (TP 4.4) (see Bartuschat 1984). As for its origin, Spinoza insists here, apparently in contrast to the contractual account of the TTP (Wernham 1958; Matheron 1990), that one

must seek the causes and natural foundations of the state, not from the teachings of reason, but from the common nature or condition of men. (TP 1.7)

Specifically, Spinoza claims that since humans are individually weak and effectively powerless on our own (TP 2.15), they will be driven by common affects to enter into a commonwealth (TP 3.9; TP 6.1) (see Matheron 1969 and 1990). While scholars have sought to flesh out Spinoza’s analysis of the genesis of the state in the TP (Den Uyl 1983, 1985; Matheron 1969, 1990), the account that Spinoza advances is quite thin, leaving much room for conjecture.

4.2 General Aim of the State

Having argued in the preceding chapters that anything that can be done is done by right, in TP 5 Spinoza distinguishes sharply between doing something by right and doing something in the best way. The central question going forward is not about the right of the state, but about “the best condition of each state” (TP 5.1). And in order to determine this, we must first identify the “end” [finis] or fundamental aim of the state, which Spinoza claims is “peace and security of life” [pax vitaeque securitas] (TP 5.2). To fully appreciate what Spinoza means, we must explicate Spinoza’s conception of peace. He rejects Hobbes’s definition of peace as the “absence of war” (De Cive 1.12), claiming instead that peace consists in the “union or harmony of minds” (TP 6.4), which arises from “from strength of mind [ex animi fortitudine]” (TP 5.4), or rational affects (E3p59s). It is one thing, then, for a state to persist or to avoid the ravages of war, it is quite another for the state to flourish or exhibit peace (TP 5.5).

But if the aim of the state is peace, and peace consists in the “harmony of minds” arising from rational affects, one might think that the state cannot accomplish its ends, since it is unrealistic to expect most people to be rational (TP 1.5; TP 2.5; TP 2.18; TP 6.1). It is worth bearing in mind here that “agreement” or “harmony of minds” comes in degrees (see Blom 1993). Total agreement is possible only insofar as people are fully rational (EIVP31–EIVP35). The state cannot reasonably hope to promote total rationality and agreement; but it can diminish fear and divisive forms of ignorance and foster psychological security [securitas] and trust [fides], resulting in a next-best level of agreement. (For tensions between idealist and realist features of Spinoza’s political thought, see Armstrong 2009). To see more precisely how Spinoza thinks that the state can foster agreement, peace, and security (TP 5.2, TP 5.3), we must turn to his institutional recommendations.

4.3 Constitutionalism and Model Regimes

Spinoza seems to think that institutional structures and procedures channel the natural passions of men towards the common good. The vision here is one of mechanizing reason in much the same way the Venetian Republic is said to have mechanized virtù (Pocock 1975: 284). Civil rationality is the product of republican institutions that encourage broad participation, public deliberation, and the adoption of a variety of accountability-promoting mechanisms. A rationally organized state will not only promote the common good, in so doing it will also strengthen the civic commitment of its citizens; this is one way in which the state contributes to the reorientation of the affects of its citizens and fosters agreement between citizens (Steinberg 2009).

4.3.1 Monarchy

In chapters 6 and 7, Spinoza sets out to show how a monarchy is to be organized to promote peace. Crucially, he argues that the more unchecked a monarch is, the worse off everyone is, including the monarch (TP 6.8). This does not mean, however, that absolute monarchies are unstable or can’t endure. On the contrary “no state has stood so long without notable chance as that of the [despotic] Turks” (TP 6.4). But mere endurance is not the same thing as peace, and when people are “terrified from fear” the resulting condition is more aptly described as a “wasteland than a Commonwealth” (TP 5.4).

A well-structured monarchy will thus include constitutional checks on the monarch. These foundational laws [fundamenta] are to be understood as the king’s “eternal decrees” [aeterna decreta], expressing his real interests, which are not to be contravened. Spinoza likens these “decrees” to Ulysses’s binding himself to the mast of his ship so as not to yield to the Sirens’s song (TP 7.1). One of the central constitutional checks is that the King be responsive to a large council of citizens (TP 6.15–30). In a properly constituted state:

whether the King is led by a fear of the multitude, perhaps to bind the greater part of the armed multitude to himself, or led by a nobility of spirit, to consult the public advantage, either he’ll always endorse the opinion which has the most votes, i.e., (by §5), which is more useful to the majority, or he’ll be anxious to reconcile, if possible, the inconsistent opinions brought to him, so that he draws everyone to himself. (TP 7.11)

In this way, a good monarchy will function like a homeostatic system, ensuring that the interests of all members are held in check and that the whole remains in a state of equilibrium (McShea 1968; cf. Field 2020). Ultimately, a model monarchy will be a constitutional monarchy that will strongly resemble a democracy (Balibar 1985 [1998]), and those states that deviate least from democracy will be most powerful (Matheron 1997). Nevertheless, the fact that Spinoza countenanced the possibility that “a multitude can preserve a full enough freedom under a King” (TP 7.31), can be seen as a resignation to the reality of Orangism after the events of 1672 (Blom 2007).

4.3.2 Aristocracy

Spinoza discusses the best forms of two types of aristocracy. The first is a centralized aristocracy, apparently modeled on the Venetian Republic (Haitsma Mulier 1980). The second is a decentralized aristocracy, in which sovereignty is held in common by several cities. This type of aristocracy, which Spinoza takes to be superior (TP 9.15), is evidently modeled on the United Provinces. While Spinoza’s recommendations vary between these two types of aristocracy, many of the general features remain the same. In proto-Madisonian fashion, Spinoza argues that that the council of patricians should be sizable so as to reduce the potential for factionalism (e.g., TP 8.1; TP 8.38). A large council will protect against selfish or irrational governance (TP 8.6; 9.14). The emphasis once again is on mechanisms that keep private and public interest in balance and encourage agreement (e.g., TP 8.19–8.24). One important way in which agreement is encouraged is through the promulgation of the “universal faith” or civil religion (TP 8.46) (see §3.4)

Given that there will be more formal checks on authority and a greater diffusion of political power in aristocracies than in monarchies, we should not find it surprising that Spinoza claims that aristocracies are likely to be more absolute than monarchies (TP 8.7), “absolute” here meaning not “unchecked” but fully functioning as one (Steinberg 2018b).

While Spinoza clearly indicates that aristocracies are generally superior to monarchies, a more interesting and somewhat more vexed question is how aristocracies compare with democracies. Raia Prokhovnik, for example, has claimed that aristocracy is “the form of government [Spinoza] on mature reflection prefers” (2004: 210; cf. Feuer 1958 [1987] and Melamed 2013). Spinoza does contend that the fact that patricians are elected in an Aristocracy, as opposed to the birthright privileges of members of a Democracy, would seem to make them superior. But he proceeds to argue that this advantage is offset by the biased, self-serving behavior of patricians (TP 11.2). And since he claims that democracy is the most absolute form of regime (TP 11.1), absolutism in this context picking out a clear merit (Steinberg 2018b), there is reason to doubt that he regards Aristocracies as superior (Balibar 1985 [1998]). Ultimately, though, Spinoza is less interested in rank ordering regimes than he is in determining how each regime-type should be organized so as to maximize peace and freedom.

4.3.3 Democracy

Spinoza had just begun the first of what would likely have been two chapters on democracy when he died on February 21, 1677. Democracy, as he understands it, is a system of popular governance in which civil status alone confers the right to participate. While Spinoza allows that some democracies will be more inclusive than others (TP 11.2), his own model democracy excludes not only foreigners, but also those who are not sui iuris—e.g., women, children, and servants (servos)—as well those who do not lead “respectable lives” (honesteque vivunt) (TP 11/3). Contemporary readers rightly find these exclusionary aspects of Spinoza’s model democracy to be deplorable (Gatens 1996: Ch. 9), especially his sexist attempt to justify the exclusion of women from a democracy in part on the basis of their “natural” inequality (TP 11.4), a thesis that seems somewhat in tension with claims that he makes elsewhere (Sharp 2012)

The merits of democratic government can be gleaned from his analyses of monarchy and aristocracy, both of which include strong democratic elements. Democracies have epistemic advantages over other forms of government due to the size of the governing body, since larger councils are more likely to be rational because participants in a large collective body will aim only what is “honorable” [honestus] or at least appears so (TP 8.6). The deliberative aspect of large governing bodies also improves competency, since

human wits are too sluggish to penetrate everything right away, but by asking advice, listening, and arguing, they’re sharpened. (TP 9.14; cf. TTP 16.30)

As for the worry that that there is “neither truth nor judgment” in the common people (TP 7.27), Spinoza responds that since “everyone shares a common nature”, differences in competency are explained largely from the fact that “rulers manage the chief business of the state secretly” (TP 7.27; cf. TP 7.4). These claims belie Feuer’s contention (1958 [1987]) that the murder of the de Witts resulted in an anti-democratic turn in Spinoza’s thought. While the explicit discussion of democracy in the TP was largely preempted by the author’s death, and the remaining fragment contains little more than the lamentable attempt to justify the exclusion of women and others from participation, the work as a whole remains a significant and underappreciated contribution to democratic theory (for a recent monograph on Spinoza and popular power, see Field 2020).

5. The Place of the State in Spinoza’s Ontology

There is a lively discussion in the scholarly literature concerning whether Spinoza’s state is an individual with its own conatus (this is sometimes framed as a debate between “realist” and “antirealists” about the state—see LeBuffe 2021). The answer to this question is thought to carry implications for how we conceive of Spinoza’s relationship to liberalism.

The most elaborate discussion of individuals and individuation in Spinoza corpus is found in the “physical digression” between EIIP13 and EIIP14, where he articulates an account of the individuation of bodies. Here, Spinoza tells us that an individual is a composite body whose parts “communicate their motion to each other in a certain fixed manner” (G ii.100, A2, def, A3). The parts of an individual may be replaced, but the individual will persist, provided that the “same ratio of motion and rest” is retained (ibid., L5, L4). Crucially, an individual’s “nature” (L4–L7) is retained if and only if (or insofar and only insofar as) its ratio of motion and rest is preserved. While this discussion focuses only on bodies, one can reasonably infer that a parallel account of individuation would apply mutatis mutandis to ideas, since “the order and connection of ideas is the same as the order and connection of things” (EIIp7). A generalized version of this account would be that an individual persists just insofar as its parts remain in the same patterned relation (D. Garrett 1994).

This account allows for the possibility of “social individuals” or individuals composed at least in part of human individuals. Spinoza makes this explicit when, of humans, he writes

if two individuals of entirely the same nature are joined to one another, they compose an individual twice as powerful as each one. (EIVP18S)

And the account scales up, so that we can think of individual nested inside of other individuals, all the way up to the “whole of nature” (i.e., of natura naturata), which is “one individual, whose parts, that is, all bodies, vary in infinite ways, without any change of the whole individual” (Physical Digression L7 Schol). Still, the question remains: is the state such a higher-order social individual?

Alexandre Matheron’s Individu et Communauté chez Spinoza contains the most influential realist interpretation of Spinoza on the state (1969, esp. Ch. 3). Matheron identifies political societies as individuals, characterized by their own “formal element”, i.e., their own unique ratio of motion and rest (1969: 42, 58). Etienne Balibar too argues that the state a highly composite individual, as an “individual of individuals, having a ‘body’ and a ‘soul’ or mind” (1985 [1998: 64]). Others who have espoused this view include Meinecke (1924 [1957]), Blom (2007), Steinberg (2019), and LeBuffe (2021)

Many are skeptical, though. Douglas Den Uyl points to the opening passages of TTP 17, where Spinoza claims that individuals always retain a “considerable part” of their own natural right, as evidence that human beings are never fully integrated into the super-individual, or state (Den Uyl 1983: 70). Still, the worry of imperfect integration would seem to apply to all individuals: there is always the potential for some parts to go rogue (EIIp24d) (see Matheron 1969: 58). A second objection to state realism is that whereas singular things can only be destroyed by external causes (IIIP4), “a Commonwealth is always put at greater risk on account of its citizens than on account of its enemies” (TP 6.6). And in fact if all individuals are singular things (for a defense of this view, see D. Garrett 1994), then the fact that states can ostensibly be destroyed by their parts (i.e., citizens) should lead us to deny state realism (Barbone & Rice 2000: 26–7). This is a forceful objection. However, there is no reason to think that an account of the apparent self-destruction of the commonwealth could not be offered that parallels Spinoza’s attempt to explain how suicide is possible in light of the conatus doctrine (EIVP20S). An apparently self-destructive state could be one that is so affected by “hidden external causes”, so overwhelmed by destructive passions, that it takes on a new nature that is contrary to its original nature (EIVP20S.). Apparent civil self-destruction might simply be the result of poorly-integrated individuals functioning as external causes.

A third challenge to state realism is that if the state is an individual, it should have a mind of its own. But Steven Barbone points out that references to the mind of the state are typically preceded by qualifying phrases like veluti (“as it were”) and quasi (“as if”), indicating that the state has a mind only metaphorically (Barbone 2002:104–105). This objection might be mitigated by arguing that individuality is itself a matter of degree and that states are at best “loose” individuals (Della Rocca 1996: Ch. 2), with limited cohesion or regularity of action. This is consistent with the preceding claim that integration into a larger union is itself a matter of degree.

What seems to be driving many of these antirealist objections is the worry that if the state is an individual, its interests might trump the interests of its constituents, particular human beings (see Rice 1990; Barbone 2002). Isaiah Berlin (1958 [1969]) condemned Spinoza precisely because he took Spinoza to be reifying the state and putting state interests above individual interests, echoing Popper’s critique of Hegel. But even if the state is an individual, it does not follow that its interests would supersede the interests of its citizens. Certainly, from the perspective of a citizen, there is no reason why one would have to put the interests of the state above one’s own interests if these two were genuinely to come into to conflict. Consequently, some of the worries of the antirealists might be misplaced. Indeed, Michael LeBuffe has recently defended a version of state realism, according to which it is precisely because the state is a complex individual whose power can come apart from the power of its constituents that we must guard against empowering it to our own detriment (LeBuffe 2021).

6. The Reception and Influence of Spinoza’s Political Philosophy

The extent of influence of Spinoza’s political thought is difficult to assess. Even when Spinoza’s influence on subsequent political thought is direct and indisputable, it is not always easy to tease out how much of this is due to his own political philosophy and how much is due to his metaphysics more generally. Further complicating the assessment is the fact that Spinoza and Spinozism remained a bugbear throughout Europe for much of the late seventeenth and eighteenth centuries. For this reason, even sympathetic philosophers often sought to distance their views from Spinoza’s, positioning themselves as critics or downplaying familiarity with his texts. Nevertheless, we find traces of the influence of Spinoza’s political writings throughout the Enlightenment, along with an array of hostile responses.

The publication of the unfinished TP in Spinoza’s posthumous Opera was met with relative indifference, upstaged as it was by the simultaneous appearance of Ethics (Lærke 2010). However, the TTP was read, discussed, and condemned in the decades following its publication in 1670. The critical reception tended to focus on the perceived irreligious features of the work—for instance, the refutation of miracles and the denial of the divine origin of the Pentateuch—but the naturalistic account of right and law and the arguments for the freedom to philosophize also provoked debate.

Jakob Thomasius, Leibniz’s teacher in Leipzig, composed a work, Adversus Anonymum, de Libertate Philosophandi, devoted entirely to refuting the TTP and its underlying naturalism. Leibniz too seems to have regarded Spinoza’s views on right and law as more dangerous even than Hobbes’s, for while Hobbes at least allowed conceptual space for a divine legislator, Spinoza did not (Lærke 2010). Even relatively liberal natural lawyers like Lambert van Velthuysen (1622–1685) and Samuel Pufendorf (1632–1694), regarded Spinoza’s treatment of right, law, and obligation as fundamentally dangerous. Velthuysen protests that, in the absence of a divine legislator, there is “no room left for precepts and commandments” (Ep. 42) in Spinoza’s philosophy. And Pufendorf maintains that Spinoza’s conception of right is defective in that it fails to produce a “moral effect” or to put others under obligations (Pufendorf 1672 [1934: 391]; see Curley 1995).

While Spinoza’s views on right and law were generally met with contempt, his views on the freedom to philosophize [libertas philosophandi] prompted a more mixed reaction. The doctrine had its critics (see Israel 2010: 81–2), but it also had its admirers, perhaps including some of the most prominent early-modern tolerationists. Bayle, Locke, and Toland, for instance, were familiar with Spinoza’s defense and likely found some inspiration in it, even while they denied deep acquaintance (Locke) or situated themselves as critics (Bayle and Toland). Toland’s use in Pantheisticon of the same epigram from the opening of Tacitus’s Histories—“rare are the happy times when we may think what we wish and say what we think [rara temporum felicitas ubi sentire quae velis et quae sentias dicere licet]”—that Spinoza alludes to in the title of TTP 20 indicates an affinity between the two thinkers on matters of freedom of speech and thought (for more on the use of this epigram in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries, see Paul Russell 2008: Ch. 7),

Later enlightenment thinkers embraced Spinoza’s thesis that whereas the freedoms of thought and expression should be protected, one ought to obey the sovereign’s decisions on matters of action (for worries about whether Spinoza’s metaphysics can permit this division, see Della Rocca 2008, 223–4). Echoes of this view can be found in Moses Mendelssohn’s separation of action and conviction in Jerusalem (Mendelssohn 1783 [1983: 40]; Gottlieb 2011: 50; Goetschel 2004: 168). This distinction was even adopted by Frederick the Great, whose policy that people may argue about whatever they wish, provided that they obey is famously celebrated in Kant’s essay “What is Enlightenment?” [Was ist Aufklärung?].

It is also worth mentioning Spinoza’s influence on the democratic thought of the French Enlightenment. Jonathan Israel has examined the myriad ways in which Spinoza’s philosophy shaped egalitarian political thought, including, perhaps most significantly, the political thought of the encyclopédistes (Israel 2011, 2023). Spinoza’s influence here is primarily due to his naturalism, which inspired the materialist metaphysics that underpinned French democratic thought, rather than to his political arguments. And Spinoza’s realist and arguably anti-revolutionary political method suggests that even if Spinoza’s philosophy influenced revolutionary democratic thought, it likely had little to do with his actual political philosophy. (For divergent assessments of Spinoza’s attitude towards revolution, see Rosenthal 2013 and Sharp 2013). Nevertheless, one finds more than a whiff of Spinoza’s absolutist conception of democracy in the accounts of the general will [volonté générale] found in Rousseau (see Eckstein 1944; Williams 2010) and Diderot (Israel 2011).

Spinoza’s thought was also briefly, but enthusiastically, taken up by Russian Marxists in the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries. Most notably, Georgi Plekhanov (1856–1918), one of the primary expositors of the philosophical basis of Marxism, claimed that Marxism was but a “variety of Spinozism” (cited in Kline 1952: 15) and reported that Engels told him in conversation that “old Spinoza was quite right” on matters of ontology (“Bernstein and Materialism”, in Plekhanov 1898 [1976: 339]). Lyubov Isaakovna Akselrod (1868–1946) and Abram Deborin (1881–1963) followed Plekhanov in defending Spinozism as the proper metaphysical foundation of Marxism (Steila 2022; Matysik 2022). But while these figures were all committed political thinkers, Spinoza’s influence on them, as with his influence on the French encyclopédistes, was due primarily to his metaphysics—specifically, his putative “materialism” (see Steinberg forthcoming).

More recently, Spinoza’s political philosophy has figured prominently in post-1968 leftist French political thought (for a survey, see van Bunge 2012). However, in Anglophone countries, few contemporary political philosophers seriously engage with Spinoza’s work, even while scholarly interest has grown. There is reason to hope, however, that as Spinoza continues to emerge from Hobbes’s shadow, Anglophone political philosophers may begin to appreciate the richness, originality, and systematicity of Spinoza’s political philosophy, and the ways in which it might illuminate theories of democracy, toleration, authority, social ontology, the relationship between civil institutions and social affects, and much more.

Bibliography

Primary Sources

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All English quotations are to:

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References to the Tractatus Theologico-Politicus and Tractatus Politicus:

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See also:

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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

I wish to thank Michael Della Rocca, Michael Rosenthal, Steven B. Smith for many helpful comments and suggestions.

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