Wiggins, Substances, and Sortals

The discipline of sortal identification

There are certain kinds of counter-example that Wiggins does not discuss in print. There might, for example, be a sword-stick, which has its blade removed and the inside of the cane filled with resin, so that it ceases to be a sword but remains the same walking stick. Walking stick and sword are perfectly good concepts for picking out objects, if any artefactual terms are, and, on pain of excessive artificiality, a sword-stick is both a sword and a walking stick. This kind of example does not appear to occur amongst natural objects, but, as a sword-stick is a perfectly good reidentifiable object, this fact about natural objects would seem to be a contingent truth about them. Of course, it is not an accident that nature works that way, but neither is it a conceptual requirement. Wiggins’s original proof was a priori, and it should allow no exceptions. Wiggins’s response to this example (in personal communication) is that the sword-stick ceases to exist when it loses its ability to function as a sword and is replaced by a walking stick. But this response too is ad hoc. It embodies the principle that if anything is both an F and a G, where F and G are normally ordinary sortals, then it is really an F/G and ceases to exist if it loses either its F or its G features and is replaced by something that is either just an F or just a G.

One possible way out of this kind of case is to say that the sword is a phase of the walking stick, thereby introducing ad hoc phase sortals. By the expression ‘ad hoc phase sortal’ I mean a sortal that can be used sometimes as a phase sortal, designating an object only through part of its existence, and sometimes as an ultimate sortal, designating an object through the whole of its existence. Of course, even a normal phase sortal might, contingently, in a given instance, designate an object through the whole of its existence. One might say that the phase sortal baby could designate something through the whole of its existence if, for example, a human being died at the age of six months and hence never got beyond babyhood. But it remains the case that, by dint of the meaning of the term, a baby is a phase of a human being (or, perhaps, some other animal) even when a particular creature fails to get beyond that phase. A sword is not, however, in virtue of the meaning of the word ‘sword’, a phase of anything, and to use the term to name a phase of something in a given case, when it suits, is ad hoc. Allowing sortals of this kind would put the concept of sortal under pressure, for an ultimate sortal was originally thought to be a kind of concept that necessarily characterises an object present-tensedly throughout its existence, not a concept that sometimes does and sometimes does not. If it were possible for a given sortal, such as sword, sometimes to be an ultimate sortal and sometimes a phase sortal, it is not clear how such an expression would differ from an expression such as brown thing, which may or may not characterise something through the whole of its existence. But it is vital that the distinction between sortals, phase or ultimate, and expressions such as brown thing be clearly maintained, if the notion of sortal is to serve any formal purpose.

More importantly, that there are no ad hoc sortals is essential to the significance of the formal proof that there is no such thing as relative identity. In logic and in the application of Leibniz’s Law, ‘a is F’ is normally equivalent to ‘a was, is or will be F’, otherwise the Law would not apply to such accidental properties as ‘is brown’. This is also the way phase sortals work: a human being is, was, or will be a baby. The argument against relative identity works by arguing that, if one allowed relative identity, a contradiction would follow, namely that one would get a situation in which a is G, a = b and b is not G. For this to be a contradiction, ‘is G’ must be univocal in both cases as either ‘—was, is or will be G’ or ‘—is at all times G’. For there is no inconsistency in a is, was, or will be G, a = b, and b is not at all times G. But if, whenever a contradiction is generated, one deems one of the sortals to be a phase sortal, and so to fall under the ‘is, was, or will be’ rubric, and the other to be the ultimate sortal which applies at all times, no contradiction will ever arise. All the cases of putative relative identity could be reconciled with Leibniz’s Law by deeming one of the sortals to be operating as a phase sortal in this instance.

Another possible line is that a sword-stick is not one object, but two objects that share some of their matter. This introduces a category of what one might call Siamese objects. It can be argued, however, that allowing this kind of entity undermines Wiggins’s opposition to those, like Ayers, who think that the concept for reidentifying objects is, or often is, something more generic than sortal concepts; something akin to material body. To see how this may come about, we must consider the rationale for Ayers’s theory.

The fact that sortals do not seem to follow the discipline that Wiggins wishes for them might be taken to support the view that substances can be individuated under much more generic notions, such as same body or same material thing (Ayers 1991a). On this view, material cohesion is what picks out paradigmatic physical things. Wiggins regards these ideas as too generic to be adequate on their own. Such a concept cannot be “understood except as determinable that has dog, horse, ball, [etc] among its determinations” (1997: 417–8).

Ayers, on the other hand, thinks that Wiggins takes the notion of body too loosely, because he [Wiggins] classifies as ‘lump-mass terms’ everything from bars of soap and pats of butter to pools of water and pots of stew (Ayers 1991b: 229–30). Wiggins, in other words, does not take seriously enough the cohesiveness of real bodies, conflating them too easily with looser masses of matter. One natural thought is that we can reidentify middle-sized physical bodies that have fairly stable properties, irrespective of whether there is any interesting sortal term under which they fall. This is not to say that they could be reidentified under the purely generic notions body or physical thing, if there were no continuity of manifest properties.

That this may be a powerful criticism of Wiggins’s view can be seen by considering the notion of a Siamese object, which seemed to be necessary to answer the kind of problem posed by the sword-stick. The physical mass that houses both the sword and the walking stick can be identified independently of either. If this were not the case it is difficult to see how one could even make the mistake of thinking of it as one thing. The composites Siamese entities form are quite identifiable, and yet that entity is not supposed to fall under a sortal in its own right.

The ontological status of complex bodies and ‘masses of matter’ (in Locke’s phrase) is an issue very much under dispute and we shall return to it below.

The ‘is’ of constitution

A statue and a lump of clay occupy the same place at a given time. What is their relation to each other? The apparent options are (i) they are identical (ii) they are not identical, but the clay constitutes the statue. (i) appears to be ruled out because they have different identity conditions. (ii) has seemed to many philosophers to be the natural solution to the problem, but it, too, faces difficulties. First, it has the intuitive disadvantage that it allocates two solid physical objects to the same place. Each of them weighs, say, ten pounds, yet the total of their weight is only ten pounds. It might seem natural to think—and it was formerly a well established maxim—that there can be only one solid physical thing at one place at a given time. Someone impressed by the idea that two bodies cannot be in the same place at the same time might think it more natural to say that there are two different ways of conceptualising the material presence at that point, than that there are two material things. That way it is easy to see why two ten pound objects need not add up to twenty pounds when put together.

Second, the language of constitution is more natural if the situation is described in some ways rather than others. It is natural to say that the statue is made of clay or even from a piece of clay. But suppose one characterises the clay more exactly, in terms of the particular atoms in a particular arrangement. Strictly, on modal grounds, this structured collection and the statue are different. The statue could have been made of a collection of atoms with at least some different members, but the entity defined as containing just those atoms could not. This entity—atoms A₁…A_n in given spatial arrangement S—is not a very natural kind of object, but it is a real body, in a way that something arbitrarily composed of, for example, half of this table and two toes from President Bush’s left foot is not. This collection of atoms in this structure is what investigation would show to be really there. Though it is natural to say that the statue is constituted by the atoms, it is less natural to say that the atoms and the structure taken together, are what it is made from: rather it might seem natural to say that that is what it is. To use the Aristotelian terminology, there is strong pressure to say that atoms and structure together are matter and form, and hence are the complete individual.

All these issues are very controversial, and different philosophers have different intuitions (see, for example, Rea 1997). But, if one were to conclude that the statue and the lump are neither identical nor stand in the constitution relation, what else could one say? One strategy is to take the notion of body or material object as basic. In the next section, this possibility is compared with other options.

A possible reconciliation of Wiggins and Ayers

As we saw above, for Wiggins the concept ‘body’ is always generic, never sufficient in its own right to sustain identification, needing to be filled out by appeal to a more determinate sortal, such as ‘dog’ or ‘table’. Call this ‘sortalism’.

For Ayers, on the other hand the notion of a coherent, unified body or material object is the basic notion for individuating objects and is presupposed by sortal concepts. It is only in so far as dogs and tables are unified bodies that these notions can be used to individuate objects. Call this ‘somatism’.

We saw, briefly, in section 3.3.1, why Wiggins and Ayers think as they do. Although van Inwagen’s position is different from both, his reasons for thinking that the concept of a complex body is, of its own, an inadequate concept, are consistent with Wiggins’s claim that the idea is too determinable to function in its own right. Van Inwagen, therefore, more directly challenges Ayers. (For a brief discussion of van Inwagen’s argument, see section 3.4 below.)

How might we choose between sortalism and somatism? The dispute between them can seem difficult to pin down. Perhaps an irenic compromise is possible. Metaphysically, this compromise favours the somatist, but seems to give the sortalist everything he should want. The principle of the compromise is that Wiggins’s formal argument is correct: and hence it is necessarily true that Relative Identity is not possible. But it is only a contingent truth that the terms that can substitute for F in his formal proof are generally—but not always—sortals of an Aristotelian kind. Anything can be substituted for F that picks the object out as a unified body.

Take Wiggins’s formula, a =_F b, where it is assumed that the F is a material object (not God or a spirit etc). The following theses might plausibly be maintained.

The account given in these five points has the advantage that it is compatible with the fact that most identities involving reidentification are categorisable under sortals, but that there are other cases—such as ‘piece of…’, ‘hunk of…’—where this is not so. It also avoids the need to employ the ‘“is” of constitution’ to link sortals and particulars, like lumps and hunks, rather than just mass terms, such as ‘clay’ or ‘gold’. The case where the lump and the sortally individuated object do not coincide, applies only to some problematic artefactual cases, and in those cases the sortal name of the artefact will not be suitable substitute for F, but the ‘lump’ expression will be. In that way, it will be possible to avoid the need to have two material objects in the same place.