Truthmakers

First published Sat Feb 23, 2013; substantive revision Mon Sep 23, 2024

This much is agreed: “x makes it true that p” is a construction that signifies, if it signifies anything at all, a relation borne to a truth-bearer by something else, a truth-maker. But it isn’t generally agreed what that something else might be, or what truth-bearers are, or what the character might be of the relationship that holds, if it does, between them, or even whether such a relationship ever does hold. Indeed sometimes there’s barely enough agreement amongst the parties to the truth-maker dispute for them to be disagreeing about a common subject matter. This makes navigating the literature about truth-makers a treacherous undertaking but a necessary one because of the significance the debate about truth-makers bears for contemporary metaphysics.

We can distinguish between the following questions that different approaches to truth-makers have been framed to answer:

What is it to be a truth-maker?
Which range, or ranges, of truths are eligible to be made true (if any are)?
What kinds of entities are truth-makers?
What is the motivation for adopting a theory of truth-makers?
What are truth-bearers?

These questions cannot be addressed in isolation from one another. Our thinking about what it is to be a truth-maker will have knock-on effects for how we answer the second and third questions. Our beliefs about which truths have truth-makers will likely shape our answer to the first and third. And the question of what our motivations are for positing truth-makers in the first place will no doubt exert a controlling influence upon our responses to the other questions.

The notion of a truth-maker cannot ultimately be understood in isolation from the notion of what it makes true, a truth-bearer. This is understandable: metaphysicians are typically interested in what there is rather than representations thereof. But truth-bearers are the elephant in the room during these discussions.We cannot avoid talking about them because what we think about truth-bearers will have consequences for what we think about truth-makers. So we cannot postpone indefinitely answering the fifth question. We’ll start with the issue of what it is to be a truth-maker.

1. What is a Truth-maker?
2. Which range of truths are eligible to be made true (if any are)?
3. What Motivates the Doctrine of Truth-makers?
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1. What is a Truth-maker?

Truth-makers are often introduced in the following terms:

(Virtue-T): a truth-maker is that in virtue of which something is true

The sense in which a truth-maker “makes” something true is said to be different from the causal sense in which, e.g., a potter makes a pot. It is often added that the primary notion of a truth-maker is that of a minimal one: a truth-maker for a truth-bearer p none of whose proper parts or constituents are truth-makers for p. (Whether every proposition has a minimal truth-maker is a further matter.) We are also cautioned that even though people often speak as if there is a unique truth-maker for each truth, it is usually the case that one truth is made true by many things (collectively or severally).

Now whether (Virtue-T) provides a satisfactory elucidation of truth-making depends on whether we have a clear understanding of “in virtue of”. Some argue in virtue of is an unavoidable primitive whilst others are wary. But even if it is primitive, we need to understand how the notions of truthmaking and in virtue of are related to other concepts we grasp in order to establish their significance for us. So to show that these are notions of sound theoretical standing it must be shown that they can at least be elucidated if not analysed in terms of notions that enjoy a life independently of the circle of notions to which in virtue of and truth-making belong.

1.1 Truth-making as Entailment

One proposal for improving upon (Virtue-T) appeals to the notion of entailment (Fox 1987: 189; Bigelow 1988: 125–7):

(Entailment-T): a truth-maker is a thing the very existence of which entails that something is true.

So x is a truth-maker for a truth p iff x exists and another representation that says x exists entails the representation that p. It is an attraction of this principle that the key notion it deploys, namely entailment, is ubiquitous, unavoidable and enjoys a rich life outside philosophy—both in ordinary life and in scientific and mathematical practice.

Unfortunately this account threatens to over-generate truth-makers for necessary truths—at least if the notion of entailment it employs is classical. It’s a feature of this notion that anything whatsoever entails a necessary truth p. It follows as a special case of this that any claim that a given object exists must entail p too. So it also follows—if (Entailment-T) is granted—that any object makes any necessary truth true. But this runs counter to the belief that, e.g., the leftovers in your refrigerator aren’t truth-makers for the representation that 2+2=4. Even worse, Restall has shown how to plausibly reason from (Entailment-T) to “truth-maker monism”: the doctrine that every truth-maker makes every truth true (whether necessary or contingent). Every claim of the form p ∨ ~p is a necessary truth. So every existing thing s is a truth-maker for each instance of this form (see preceding paragraph). Now let p be some arbitrary truth (grass is green) and s any truth-maker for p ∨ ~p (a particular ice floe in the Antarctic ocean). Now it is intuitively plausible that something makes a disjunction true either by making one disjunct true or by making the other disjunct true (Mulligan, Simons, & Smith 1984: 316). This is what Restall calls “the disjunction thesis”. It follows from this thesis that either s makes p true or s makes ~p true. Given that p is true, neither s nor anything else makes it true that ~p. So s (the ice floe) must make it true that p (grass is green)! But since s and p were chosen arbitrarily it follows that all truth-makers are on a par, making true every truth (Restall 1996: 333–4).

The unacceptability of these results indicates that insofar as we have an intuitive grip upon the concept of a truth-maker it is constrained by the requirement that a truth-maker for a truth must be relevant to or about what it represents as being the case. For example, the truths of pure arithmetic are not about what’s at the back of your refrigerator; what’s there isn’t relevant to their being true. So we’re constrained to judge that what’s there cannot be truth-makers for them. This suggests that operating at the back of our minds when we issue these snap judgements there must be something like the principle:

(Relevance): what makes something true must—in some sense—be what it is “about”.

Of course the notions of “about” and “relevance” are notoriously difficult to pin down (Goodman 1961). And a speaker can know something is true without knowing everything about what makes it true. Often it will require empirical research to settle what makes a statement true. Moreover, what is determined a posteriori to be a truth-maker may exhibit a complexity quite different from that of the statement it makes true (Mulligan, Simons, & Smith 1984: 299). Nevertheless, it is clear that unless (Entailment-T) is constrained in some way it will generate truth-makers that are unwanted because their presence conflicts with (Relevance).

One way to restore accord between them would be to abandon the Disjunction Thesis that together with (Entailment-T) led us down the path to Truth-maker Monism. Indeed isn’t the Disjunction Thesis dubious anyway? Consider examples involving the open future. Can’t we imagine a situation arising that makes it true that one or other of the horses competing in a race will win, but which neither makes it true that one of the horses in particular will win nor makes it true that another will (Read 2000; Restall 2009)? For further discussion of issues surrounding truthmaking entailment, the Disjunctive Thesis and the Conjunctive Thesis, i.e. the principle that a truthmaker for a conjunction is a truthmaker for its conjuncts, see Rodriguez-Pereyra 2006a, 2009, Jago 2009, Lopez de Sa 2009 and Talasiewicz (et al) (2012) and Briggs 2012.

But even if the Disjunction Thesis is given up still this leaves in place the embarrassing consequence of defining what it is to be a truth-maker in terms of classical entailment, viz. that any existing thing turns out to be a truth-maker for any necessary truth. Some more radical overhaul of (Entailment-T) is needed to avoid over-generation. One possibility is to redefine what is to be a truth-maker in terms of a more restrictive notion of “relevant entailment” (in the tradition of Anderson & Belnap) that requires what is entailed to be relevant to what it is entailed by (Restall 1996, 2000; Armstrong 2004: 10–12, Simons 2008: 13).

Nevertheless since truth-making concerns the bestowal of truth, entailment its preservation, there must at some level be an important connection to be made out between truth-making and entailment; the effort expended to make out such a connection will be effort spent to the advantage of metaphysicians and logicians alike. But even granted this is so there are reasons to be doubtful that any overhaul of (Entailment-T), however radical, will capture what it is to be a truth-maker. One vital motivation for believing in truth-makers is this. Positing truth-makers enables us to make sense of the fact that the truth of something depends on how things stand with an independently given reality. Truth-makers are posited to provide the point of semantic contact whereby true representations touch upon an independent reality, upon something non-representational. Since entailment is a relation between representations it follows that the notion of a truth-maker cannot be fully explicated in terms of the relation of entailment—regardless of whether representations are best understood as sentences or propositions or some other candidate truth-bearer (Heil 2000: 233–4; 2003: 62–5; Merricks 2007: 12–13). Ultimately (Entailment-T), or a relevance logic version if it, will leave us wanting an account of what makes a representation of the existence of a truth-maker—whatever it entails—itself beholden to an independent reality.

1.2 Truth-making as Necessitation

Appreciating that truthmaking cannot be entailment, Armstrong made a bold maneuver. He posited a primitive relation of metaphysical necessitation (1997: 151, 2004: 96)). The relation in question lights upon a portion of reality at one end and upon a truth at the other. Armstrong then defined what is to be a truth-maker in terms of this metaphysical bridging relation which relates portions of the world to truthbearers.

(Necessitation-T): a truth-maker is a thing that necessitates something’s being true.

In the simplest case that means that the truth making relation is one that “holds between any truthmaker, T, which is something in the world, and the proposition” that T exists (2004: 6). This conception of truth making avoids the “category” mistake that results from attempting to define truth-making in terms of entailment. It also makes some advance upon (Virtue-T) and its primitive use of “in virtue of” because at least (Necessitation-T) relates the notion of truth making to other modal notions, like that of necessity, upon which we have some independent handle.

But what is there to be said in favour of conceiving of truth-makers in terms of “necessitation”? Armstrong offers the following argument. Suppose that T is a candidate truth-maker for a truth p even though T fails to necessitate p. Then it is possible for T to exist even when p is false. Armstrong now reflects “we will surely think that the alleged truth-maker was insufficient by itself and requires to be supplemented in some way” (1997: 116). Suppose this supplementary condition is the existence of another entity, U. Then “T+U would appear to be the true and necessitating truth-maker for p” (2004: 7). Armstrong concludes that a truth-maker for a truth must necessitate the truth in question.

This argument takes us nowhere except around in a circle. (Necessitation-T) embodies the doctrine that it is both necessary and sufficient for being a truth-maker that a thing necessitates the truth it makes true. Armstrong’s argument for this doctrine relies upon the dual assumptions: (1) anything that fails to necessitate p (witness T) cannot be a truth-maker for p,whereas (2) anything that succeeds in necessitating p (witness T+U) must be. But (1) just is the claim that it is necessary, and (2) just the claim that it is sufficient for being a truth-maker that a thing necessitates the truth it makes true. Since it relies upon (1) and (2), and (1) and (2) are just equivalent to (Necessitation-T), it follows that Armstrong’s argument is incapable of providing independent support for the conception he favours of what it is to be a truth-maker.

Even though this argument is circular, does (Necessitation-T) at least have the favourable feature that adopting it enables us to avoid the other difficulty that beset (Entailment-T), viz. over-generation? Not if there are things that necessitate a truth whilst still failing to be sufficiently relevant to be plausible truth-makers for it. If the necessitation relation is so distributed that it holds between any contingently existing portion of reality, e.g., an ice-floe, and any necessary truth, e.g., 2+2=4, then we shall be no further forward than we were before. So Armstrong needs to tell us more about the cross-categorial relation in question to assure us that such cases cannot arise.

Smith suggests another problem case for (Necessitarian-T).

Suppose that God wills that John kiss Mary now. God’s willing act thereby necessitates the truth of “John is kissing Mary”. (For Malebranche, all necessitation is of this sort.) But God’s act is not a truth-maker for this judgement. (Smith 1999: 6)

If such cases are possible then (Necessitation-T) fails to provide a sufficient condition for being a truth-maker.

Smith endeavours to avoid such failures of sufficiency by appealing to a notion of projection, where the projection of a truth-bearer is, roughly speaking, the subject matter of the truth-bearer, what it is ‘about’. Then a truthmaker for a truth bearer p can be defined as something that necessitates p and falls within the projection of p (Smith 1999). For this solution to be effective we need to be given criteria for the notion of projection which ensure that it doesn’t also lead to an overgeneration of truthmakers. But it’s questionable whether this can be done without drawing on further notions that aren’t obviously clearer than truthmaking itself. (See Gregory 2001, Smith 2002 and Schnieder 2006b and Schipper 2020 for a related account of truthmaking in terms of ‘aboutness’).

Asay responds to failures of sufficiency by biting the bullet. Asay holds (2023: 8; 2020: 51) that an entity e’s necessitating the truth of a sentence s is necessary and sufficient for e to be a truthmaker of s. His response to apparent counterexamples, e.g., an ice floe’s making it true that 2+2=4, is to bite the bullet: these are genuine case of truthmaking (2020: 234). He argues that any impression to the contrary overlooks (1) the fact that ‘“truthmaking” is a term of art, employed for a certain theoretical purpose within metaphysics’ viz. ‘developing a proper harmony between’ truth and reality (2023: 8). And (2) that mathematics consists of ‘trivial truths’ – in fact, Asay claims, mathematical truths are analytic--and that numbers and functions are only ‘trivial objects’ whose significance for ontology is exhausted by their being truthmakers for ‘trivial truth’ (2020: 234). Asay’s responses invite the following rejoinders.

First: Asay’s attempt to dispel the counterexamples by claiming that “truthmaking” is a term of art, employed for a certain theoretical purpose within metaphysics’ is undermined by his own practice. He introduces the notion of truthmaking in a very informal fashion (2023: 2–3): he runs a thought experiment in which you exercise god-like powers of creating things while one bureaucracy keeps record of the increasing ontology and another keeps record of which sentences are made true. The theoretical purpose of truthmaking cannot be arcane if it can be illustrated by such a simple if fanciful hypothetical example. (Note too that, by following Asay’s lead, we could block any counterexample to any cherished philosophical theory that used some term t simply by declaring that our theory used t as a term of art to further some theoretical purpose.) Second: the claim that mathematics is, in general, analytic or trivial is a deeply controversial doctrine. So insofar as a theory of truthmakers relies upon the view that mathematics is analytic that raises a question about the tenability of that theory of truthmakers.

Returning to (Necessitarian-T) there is a further objection that bears on the question of truth-bearers. Armstrong conceives the necessitation relation it uses as internal: “An internal relation is one where the existence of the terms entails the existence of the relation”; otherwise a relation is external (Armstrong 1997: 87). Armstrong argues that the relation of truth-making has to be internal (in this sense) because if it weren’t then we would have to allow that, absurdly, “anything may be a truth-maker for any truth” (1997: 198). But then nothing but propositions—conceived in the self-interpreting sense—can be truth-bearers that are internally related to their truth-makers. Any other candidate for this representational role—a token belief state or utterance—could have been endowed with a different representational significance than the one it possesses. So the other eligible candidates, by contrast to propositions, aren’t internally related to what makes them true.

Armstrong’s commitment to the truth-making relation’s being internal clashes with his naturalism (David 2005: 156–9). According to Armstrong,

Truth attaches in the first place to propositions, those propositions which have a truth-maker. But no Naturalist can be happy with a realm of propositions. (1997: 131)

So Armstrong counsels that we don’t take propositions with “ontological seriousness”:

What exists are classes of intentionally equivalent tokens. The fundamental correspondence, therefore, is not between entities called truths and their truth-makers, but between the token beliefs and thoughts, on the one hand, and truth-makers on the other. (1997: 131)

But naturalistically kosher token beliefs and thoughts aren’t internally related to what makes them true. So Armstrong’s naturalism commits him to denying that the truth-making relation is internal after all. Heil has also inveighed in a naturalistic spirit against incurring a commitment to propositions that are designed to have their own “built-in intentionality” whilst continuing to maintain that truth-making is an internal relation (2006: 240–3). Since we have no idea of what a naturalistic representation would look like that was internally related to what made it true, this appears to be an impossible combination of views. Our inability to conjure up a credible class of truth-bearers that are internally related to their truth-makers provides us with a very strong incentive for supposing that the truth-making relation is external. The long and short of it: if we are wary, as many naturalists are, of the doctrine that truth-bearers are propositions, then we should also be wary of thinking that the truth-making relation is internal. This spells trouble for (Necessitarian-T) and any other account of truth making which invoke internal relations to propositions.

As an alternative to account of truthmaking in terms of necessitation, Mulligan and Lowe have suggested that truth-maker of a proposition is something such that it is part of the essence of that proposition that it is true if that thing exists. (Mulligan 2003: 547, 2006: 39, 2007; Lowe 2006: 203–10, 2009: 209–15. ). Lowe suggests that helps rules out spurious case of truth making--because it isn’t part of the essence of the proposition that John is kissing Mary that it is true if there exists an act of God’s willing it, or part of the essence of the proposition that 2+2=4 that it is true if there is a particular ice floe in the Antarctic, or part of the essence of the proposition that 2+2=4 that it is true if π exists (2006: 202–3). But, on the downside, it may be questioned whether our grip upon the notion of the essence of a proposition is any firmer than the notion of truth-maker for it and since relation of a proposition to its truthmakers is internal, the essentialist approach inherits the difficulties of (Necessitatian-T).

1.3 Axiomatic Truth-making

All this might be taken to show that the project of defining truth-making in more basic terms is misconceived, much as the project of defining knowledge in more basic terms has come to seem misconceived because e.g., of the Gettier cases. Of course there’s no gain to be had from, doing nothing more than declaring the notion of a truth-maker to be primitive. If it’s primitive then we also need to know how the notion may be fruitfully applied in association with other concepts we already deploy—entailment, existence, truth, etc. —to describe the interplay of truth-bearers and the world. As Simons remarks,

The signs are that truth-making is not analysable in terms of anything more primitive, but we need to be able to say more than just that. So we ought to consider it as specified by principles of truth-making. (2000: 20)

In other words, the notion needs to be introduced non-reductively but still informatively and this is to be achieved by appealing to its systematic liaisons with other concepts.

This is the approach of Mulligan, Simons and Smith’s 1984: 312–8. The principal schemata they employed to convey an articulate grasp of what truth-making means in non-reductive terms included:

(i): (Factive) If A makes it true that p, then p
(ii): (Existence) If A exists, then A makes it true that A exists
(iii): (Entailment) If A makes it true that p, and that p entails that q, then A makes it true that q

Each of these schemata specifies a definite linkage between the application of the notion of truth-making and some other condition. Truth-making is introduced as the notion that sustains all of these linkages. Putting the schemata together what it is to be a truth-maker is then definable intra-theoretically as follows,

(Axiomatic-T): A truth-maker is something x such that (i) if x makes it true that p then p, (ii) if x exists then x makes it true that x exists… and so on for each of the axiom schemata of our favoured theory of truth-makers.

It is important to appreciate that adopting this approach to truth-making doesn’t have the benefits of theft over honest toil. For one thing it doesn’t obviate the threat of superfluous truth-makers for necessary truths. (Entailment) is the principle that truth-making tracks entailment: if A makes p true then it makes all the consequences of p true too. It’s a principle that recommends itself irrespective of whether truth-making can be defined. This is because it dovetails smoothly with the idea that one truth-maker can make many truths true. For example, suppose that a particular a has some absolutely determinate mass. It is entailed by this description that various determinable descriptions are also truly predicable of a. Some of these truths say more than others, nonetheless they all have the same truth-maker. Why so? Because they are entailed by a’s having the mass it does (Armstrong 1997: 130; 2004: 10–11). To answer so is to appeal to (Entailment). But if the entailment that truth-making tracks is classical then we are back to flouting (Relevance). If q is necessary then any contingent p classically entails q. So if something at the back of your refrigerator makes it true that p then by (Entailment) it makes q true too. To avoid flouting (Relevance) in this way (Entailment) had better be a principle that links truth-making to a more restrictive, non-classical notion of entailment (Mulligan, Simons, & Smith 1984: 316).

So adopting the Axiomatic approach won’t save us the labour of figuring out which non-classical connective it is that contributes to capturing what it is to be a truth-maker. Nor will appealing to (Axiomatic-T) save us the hard work of figuring out what truth-makers and truth-bearers must be like in order to collectively realise the structure described by the axiom schemata for truth-makers we favour. But, on the other hand, there is nothing about these schemata that demands truth-bearer and truth-maker be internally related.

The Axiomatic approach to truth-making has proved less attention than other more metaphysically-loaded conceptions, in terms of necessitation, essence or grounding. But an attraction of the Axiomatic approach is its metaphysical neutrality. .

1.4 Truth-Making as Grounding

Can truth-making be defined in terms of grounding or what is sometimes described as non-causal metaphysical dependence? The notion of truth-making is typically introduced, as we have seen, in terms of the ideology of “in virtue of”. As we have also seen, many philosophers then ask: but what independent content can be given to this notion? In response to this challenge, a theory of grounding may be conceived as a general theory of “in virtue of” in terms of which truth-making may then be explained. A further consideration which motivates those already committed to grounding is the general methodological principle that favours theoretical unification. Their idea is that by conceiving of truth-making as a kind of grounding, we are able to understand truth-making better, i.e. not as an isolated phenomenon but as an instance of a more general pattern, thereby illuminating not only the nature of truth-making but grounding too.

How truthmaking is to be defined in terms of grounding depends upon how non-causal dependence is logically conceived, either as a predicate (‘grounds’) or a non-causal operator (‘because’). Consider the following alternatives:

(Grounding-Predicate-T): A truth-maker is an entity x which makes a proposition y true iff the fact that x exists grounds the fact that y is true.
(Grounding-Operator-T): A truth-maker is an entity x which makes a proposition y true iff y is true because x exists.

(For the former, see Rodriguez-Pereyra 2005, Schaffer 2009, Jago 2018: 184–202, for the latter, Correia 2005, 2014, Schnieder 2006a, Mulligan 2007, Caputo 2007).

One attraction of conceiving truth-making as based on grounding arises from taking grounding to be “hyperintensional”. Grounding is intended to be a notion that’s fine-grained enough to distinguish those entities, e.g., the cardinal numbers, that ground a necessary truth, such as 2+2=4, from those that don’t, e.g. a contingent existent such as the aforementioned ice floe. Because grounding is so fine-grained, the hope is that neither Grounding-Predicate-T or Grounding-Operator-T will give rise to the over-generation that beset Entailment-T and Necessitation-T but without having to appeal to an underdeveloped notion of “about” or “relevance”.

Of course, in light of sec, 1.2 and 1.3 above, we can foresee a downside to this. Both Grounding-Predicate-T and Grounding-Operator-T quantify over propositions that stand hyperintensionally to their truth-makers. It follows that both Grounding-Predicate-T and Grounding-Operator-T share a commitment with Necessitarian-T, viz. an ontology of abstract propositions which have their meanings essentially. Suppose grounding is, eo ipso, an internal or necessitating relation. Then if the truth of a proposition P is grounded in the existence of something G then in every world in which both G and P exists, P is true. Now this presupposes that P bears the same meaning in every world in which both P and G exists—because we don’t want G to make P true if P meant something different from what it first did. But if propositions are conceived, say, as sentence tokens, then there can be no guarantee that the presupposition will be met—since sentence tokens may be differently interpreted in different worlds. Of course the guarantee can be made if propositions are conceived as abstract things which have their meanings essentially. But this is a theoretical cost of the proposal. So the grounding theorists must either bear the cost or provide an alternative account of what propositions are such that they are hyper-intensionally related to their truthmakers. But, again, this may be a commitment many grounding theorists have already made or be willing to accept if it gives them a good account of truth-making.

So far we have considered efforts to define truth-making in terms of grounding. But there are other approaches in the literature which seek to endorse one notion at the expense of the other. One way accepts grounding as a welcome theoretical innovation but argues that we are better off without truth-making, at least in the forms which have become familiar to us. A second way continues to endorse truth-making whilst rejecting grounding. (Other available positions include: that truth making is a special kind of grounding which involves a unique form of dependence (Griffith 2013), that truth making isn’t grounding but that grounding is key to truthmaking (Saenz 2018) and that grounding obviates the need to appeal to truthmaking (Liggins 2012)).

The first approach, taken by Fine, involves keeping grounding but rejecting truth-making because grounding does a better job (Fine 2012; 43–6). Here truth-making is conceived as a relation between a worldly entity and a representation where the existence of the entity guarantees the truth of the representation. But, Fine argues, it is more theoretically fruitful to take grounding as the central notion for metaphysics. This is partly because, Fine maintains, grounding is a less restrictive notion than truth-making, because grounding does not require that the ultimate source of what is true should lie in what exists, rather we can remain open about what form grounding takes. Moreover, whilst there may be genuine questions about what the ground is for the truth of the representation that p there may be further questions about what makes it the case that p and these questions will typically have nothing to do with representation as such. Because truth-making is typically understood in modal terms, i.e. necessitation is conceived to be sufficient for truth-making, Fine is also sceptical that there is any way of avoiding the over-generation of truth-makers we have already discussed (see 1.1 and 1.2 above). Finally, Fine thinks that we should be able to conceive of the world hierarchically, whereby (e.g.) the normative is grounded in the natural, the natural in the physical and the physical in the micro-physical. But this is difficult to do if we think in terms of truth-making, because if (e.g.) we conceive of a normative representation being made true by the existence of something natural, that natural thing is just the wrong sort of thing to be made true by something at the physical level because it is not a representation.

Fine’s critique of truth-making presupposes that we can only avail ourselves of truth-making if we conceive of truth-making in monolithic terms, as providing a unique method for metaphysics. But whilst, for example, Armstrong may have had a tendency to think in such terms, this doesn’t appear to be mandated by the nature of truth-making itself. One might, as Asay (2017) argues, instead conceive of grounding and truth-making as complementary projects, whereby a theory of truth-making doesn’t purport to do everything a theory of grounding does and so reciprocal illumination remains a live possibility.

The second approach, outlined above, refusing grounding but favouring truth-making, is advanced by Heil (2016). Heil is generally suspicious of grounding because grounding is often characterized in different and incompatible ways, so he is sceptical that there is a univocal concept of grounding to be had. But, more specifically, Heil has long maintained that hierarchical conceptions of reality spell trouble because of the difficulties explaining the causal and nomological relationship between the layers (Heil 2003: 31–9). He argues that this was the problem identified for supervenience and realization in the ‘90s and it’s a problem inherited by the hierarchical conception of reality to which grounding gives rise. So Heil does a modus tollens where Fine does a modus ponens. Whilst Fine conceives of the hierarchical styles of explanation grounding provides as one of the principal virtues of grounding, Heil considers this is one of the deepest drawbacks of grounding. So Heil recommends seeking truth-makers as the proper methodology for metaphysics because it enables us to give a non-hierarchical description of reality whereby fundamental physics gives us the truth-makers for truths that have truth-makers.

Suppose, however, that the notion of truthmaking were to admit of a satisfactory analysis or elucidation in terms of grounding. It’s still further question whether this shows truthmaking to be a respectable notion. Because if grounding isn’t, truthmaking isn’t either and whether grounding is intelligible or an eligible candidate to serve a foundational role in metaphysics is controversial (Daly 2012, 2023, Wilson 2014, Miller and Norton 2017, MacBride and Janssen-Lauret 2022). It might be replied that even though grounding is controversial, if it it did help yield a satisfactory account of truthmaking that would have advanced our understanding of truthmaking and would be a point in grounding’s favour. But if grounding is dubious and controversial that undermines the prospects of it providing a satisfactory account of truthmaking (or, indeed, of anything else).

2. Which range of truths are eligible to be made true (if any are)?

Agreeing about what it is to be a truth-maker, isn’t eo ipso to agree about the range of truths that are eligible to be made true. There is potential for disagreement here because different ranges of truths appear to require different kinds of truth-makers and some may not appear to require any truth-makers at all. So, for example, an unwillingness to countenance one or other kind of truth-maker, may force a reconsideration of which truths really require truth-makers or even a reconsideration of what it is to be a truth-maker. We can get a sense of the complex interplay of forces at work here by starting out from the most simple and general principle about truth-making, i.e. maximalism, and then seeing what pressures there are to make us step back from it.

2.1 Maximalism

Truth-maker maximalism is the doctrine that no truth lacks a truthmaker, hence,

(Maximalism): For every truth, there must be something in the world that makes it true.

Maximalism lies at one end of the spectrum of positions potentially available to occupy. At the other end, lies truth-maker nihilism, the view that no truth needs to be made true because there is no such role as making something true for anything to perform. Truth-maker optimalism is the intermediate position that only some truths stand in need of truth-makers: not so few that truth fails to be anchored in reality but not so many that we strain credulity about the kinds of things there are.

What is there to be said in defence of maximalism? Even though he favours it, Armstrong finds himself obliged to admit that “I do not have any direct argument” for recommending the position (2004: 7). Instead he expresses the hope that ‘philosophers of realist inclinations’ will find the view ‘immediately attractive’. So instead let us follow Armstrong and treat maximalism as a “hypothesis to be tested”.

Maximalism needs to be distinguished from the even stronger claim,

(Correspondence): For each truth there is exactly one thing that makes it true and for each truth-maker there is exactly one truth made true by it.

There’s clear blue water between these claims because if we combine maximalism with (Entailment)—that whatever makes a truth p true makes what p entails true too. So p and all of its consequences are not only all made true (as maximalism demands) but they also share a truth-maker (as Correspondence denies). This takes us halfway to appreciating that so far from being an inevitably profligate doctrine—as its name suggests—maximalism is compatible with denying that some logically complex claims have their own bespoke truth-makers. (The inspiration for thinking this way comes from the logical atomism of Russell (1918–19) that admitted some logically complex facts but not others—it is to be contrasted with Wittgenstein’s version of the doctrine (1921) which admitted only atomic facts.)

Suppose, for the sake of expounding the view, that some truth-bearers are atomic. Also suppose that P and Q are atomic and t makes P true. Then, by Entailment, t makes P ∨ Q true too. Similarly, if s makes P true and s* makes Q true then, by Entailment, s and s* together make P & Q true. Since the task of making P ∨ Q and P & Q true has already been discharged by the truth-makers for the atomic truth bearers, there is no need to posit additional truth-makers for making these disjunctive and conjunctive truths true. Similar reasoning suggests that there is no need to posit bespoke truth-makers for existential generalisations or truths of identity either (Mulligan, Simons, & Smith 1984: 313; Simons 1992: 161–3; Armstrong 2004: 54–5). But maximalism is not thereby compromised: even though disjunctive and conjunctive truths lack specific truth-makers of their own, they’re still made true by the truth-makers of the basic or atomic claims from which they’re compounded by the logical operations of disjunction and conjunction.

But positing truth-makers for atomic truths doesn’t obviate the need—supposing maximalism—to posit additional truth-makers for negative and universal truths. This becomes apparent in the case of negative truths when we compare the truth-tables for conjunction and disjunction with the truth-table for negation. The former tell us that the truth of a disjunctive formula is determined by the truth of one or other of its disjuncts, whilst the truth of a conjunctive formula is determined by the truth of both its conjuncts. But the truth-table for negation doesn’t tell us how the truth of ~P is determined by the truth of some other atomic formula Q from which ~P follows; it only tells us that ~P is true iff P is false. The strategy for avoiding bespoke truth-makers for logically complex truths can’t get a grip in this case: there’s no Q such that supplying a truth-maker for it obviates the necessity of positing an additional truth-maker for ~P (Russell 1918–19: 209–11; Hochberg 1969: 325–7).

The problem is even starker for universal truths: there’s no truth-table for them because there is no set of atomic formulae whose truth determines that a universally quantified formula is true too. Why so? Because whatever true atomic formulae we light upon (Fa, Fb… Fn), it doesn’t follow from them that ∀xFx is true. To extract the general conclusion one would need to add to the premises that a, b… n are all the things there are; that there’s no extra thing waiting in the wings to appear on stage that isn’t F. But this extra premise is itself universally quantified, not atomic. So it can’t be argued that the truth-makers for Fa, Fb… Fn put together already discharge the task of making ∀xFx true because they entail it (Russell 1918–9: 236–7; Hochberg 1969: 335–7).

It follows that if maximalism is true then negative and universal truths have bespoke truthmakers, i.e., not just combinations of truthmakers for atomic truths. So what might the truthmakers be for such truths?

Before turning to consider answers to that question, note two other challenges to maximalism. (1) Take the most encompassing negative existential of all: absolutely nothing exists. Surely this statement is possibly true. But if it were true then something would have to exist to make it true if the principle that every truth has a truth-maker is to be upheld. But then there would have to be something rather than nothing. So combining maximalism with the conviction that there could have been nothing rather than something leads to contradiction (Lewis 1998: 220, 2001: 611). So unless we already have reason to think there must be something rather than nothing—as both Armstrong (1989b: 24–5) and Lewis (1986: 73–4) think they do—maximalism is already in trouble. (2) Milne raise the charge that the sentence (M): This sentence has no truthmaker, cannot have a truthmaker because if it had a truthmaker it would be true and if it was true it wouldn’t have a truthmaker because that’s what it says. Ergo it cannot have a truthmaker. But if it has no truthmaker (M) is true. So there is at least one sentence, (M), that lacks a truthmaker (Milne 2005). For further discussion, see Rodriguez-Pereyra (2006c), Milne 2013 and Barrio and Rodriguez-Pereyra 2015.

2.2 Truth-makers for Negative Truths

Russell’s favoured class of truthmaker for negative truths was negative facts, but, he reflected,

There is implanted in the human breast an almost unquenchable desire to find some way of avoiding the admission that negative facts are as ultimate as those that are positive. (1919: 287)

He was right that our desire for positive facts and things makes us awkward about acknowledging that negative facts or things are the truth-makers of negative truths. Nonetheless, discussions about whether there are positive or negative facts are fraught by the difficulty of telling whether a fact is negative or positive. This is because, as Russell noted, there is “no formal test” or “general definition” for being a negative fact; we “must go into the meanings of words” (1918–19: 215–6). Statements of the form “a is F” aren’t invariably positive, witness: “so-and-so is dead”, nor are statements of the form “a isn’t F” always negative, witness: “so-and-so isn’t blind”. But it doesn’t follow from the fact that a syntactic test cannot be given that there is nothing to the contrast between positive and negative. Molnar suggests that the contrast can be put on a sound scientific footing. For Molnar, natural kinds are paradigm instances of the positive, to be identified on a posteriori grounds (2000: 73). To say that a thing belongs to a natural kind identified in this way is to state a positive fact. To state a negative fact is to negate a statement of a positive fact.

It’s a very natural suggestion that if the negative claim that a isn’t F is true it’s made true by the existence of something positive that’s incompatible with a’s being F (Demos 1917). For example, the truth-maker for the claim that kingfishers aren’t yellow is the fact that they’re blue because their being blue is incompatible with their being yellow. But what makes it true that these colours are incompatible? The notion of incompatibility appears itself to be negative—a relation that obtains between two states when it’s not possible for them to obtain together. So this proposal threatens to generate a regress: we’ll need to find another positive truth-maker for the further negative claim that yellow and blue are incompatible, something whose obtaining is incompatible with the state of yellow and blue’s being compatible, and so on (Russell 1918–9: 213–5, 1919: 287–9; Taylor 1952: 438–40; Hochberg 1969: 330–1). There’s another worry: it’s not obvious that there are enough positive states out there to underwrite all the negative truths there are. Even though it may be true that this liquid is odourless this needn’t be because there’s something further about it that excludes its being odorous (Taylor 1952: 447; Mulligan, Simons, & Smith 1984: 314).

One could circumvent the threatened regress by denying that the incompatibilities in question require truth-makers of their own because they’re necessary truths and such truths are a legitimate exception to maximalism—because “they are true come (or exist) what may” (Simons 2005: 254; Mellor 2003: 213). There is some plausibility to the idea that tautologies don’t stand in need of truth-makers; their truth is settled by the truth-tables of the logical constants. But material necessary truths—such as that expressed by “yellow is incompatible with blue”—appear to make just as substantive demands upon the world as contingent truths do (Molnar 2000: 74). In a sense they appear to make even more of a demand since the world must be so endowed that it could not in any circumstances have failed to live up to the expectations of material necessary truths. It’s a peculiar feature of our philosophical culture that even though it’s almost universally acknowledged that Wittgenstein’s plan (1921: 6.37) to show all necessity is logical necessity ended in failure—indeed foundered upon the very problem of explaining colour incompatibilities—that so many philosophers continue to think and talk as though the only necessities were formal ones so that necessary truths don’t need truth-makers (MacBride 2011: 176–7).

Russell reluctantly chose to acknowledge negative facts as truth-makers for negative truths (but see Veber 2008 for a defence of the incompatibility view of negative truths). He just couldn’t see any way of living without them. But negative facts are an unruly bunch. Try to think of all the ways you are. Contrast that with the even harder task of thinking of all the ways you aren’t! If negative truths are acknowledged as truth-makers they will have to be indefinitely numerous, unbounded in their variety; choosing to live with them is a heavy commitment to make (Armstrong 2004: 55). What’s worse, if negative facts are akin to positive facts—as their name suggests—then they must be made up out of things, properties and relations arranged together. But, prima facie, many of these things, properties and relations aren’t existing elements of reality. So unless, like Meinong, we believe in the non-existent, we’ll have to admit that negative facts aren’t configurations of their constituents and so an entirely different kind of entity from positive facts altogether (Molnar 2000: 77).

It is for such reasons that Armstrong counsels us to adopt a more parsimonious account of what makes negative truths true (2004: 56–9). Armstrong’s own account lies at the opposite extreme to Russell’s. Whereas Russell posited indefinitely many negative facts to make negative truths true, Armstrong posits just one thing that’s responsible for making them all true, what he calls a ‘totality fact’. Since Armstrong also posits totality facts as truthmakers for general truths, let us turn to the matter of truthmakers for general truths.

2.3 Truthmakers for General Truths

Armstrong’s grand design is to sweep away the difficulties that attend the admission of negative facts by positing a special kind of general fact that also serves as the truth-maker for general truths. Russell admitted general facts too but he acknowledged that, “I do not profess to know what the right analysis of general facts is” (Russell 1918–9: 236–7). But Armstrong has gone further and assigned to general facts the following structure: a general, or totality fact consists in a binary relation T of totality that holds between an aggregate on the one hand and a property on the other when the aggregate comprises all the items that fall under the property in question (Armstrong 1989b: 93–4, 1997: 199–200, 2004: 72–5).

Consider the following example to get a sense of what Armstrong has in mind. China, France, the Russian Federation, the U.K. and the U.S.A. comprise the permanent membership of the UN Security Council. So the aggregate (A) of them bears the totality relation T to the property (P) of being a permanent member of the Council (T(A, P)). Since the aggregate bears that relation to that property, there can be no other permanent members of the Council who aren’t already included in it. So the totality fact T(A, P) suffices for the general truth that China, France, the Russian Federation, the U.K. and the U.S.A are all its members. It also suffices for the truth of the negative existential that there are no other members of the Council. So once we’ve recognised that T(A, P) exists, there’s no need to recognise additional bespoke truth-makers for these negative truths.

Now, according to Armstrong, we can avoid the need to posit negative facts by affirming “the biggest totality state of all, the one embracing all lower-order states of affairs”, i.e., the existence of a totality state that consists in an aggregate of all the (1^st order) states of affairs there are related by T to the property of being a (1^st order) states of affairs (2004: 75). It’s a defining feature of Armstrong’s metaphysics that the world is “a world of states of affairs, with particulars and universals only having existence within states of affairs” (1989: 94). Consequently this totality state, the biggest one, comprises a vast swathe of what exists—whether particulars, universals or states of affairs that consist in particulars having universals. So it follows from the existence of this totality fact that there are no more (1^st order) states of affairs that are not already included in the aggregate of states that T relates to the property of being a (1^st order) states of affairs. Nor are there any particulars or (1^st order) universals had by those particulars that are not constituents of the state of affairs included in that aggregate. It also follows that there are no more particulars or (1^st order) universals. So this totality fact serves as truth-maker for all these negative truths.

It is sometimes objected that such totality facts are just negative facts in disguise: “Totality statements state the non-existence of certain entities, they state ‘no more facts’”; so we should reject totality facts if we are dissatisfied with negative ones (Molnar 2000: 81–2). Armstrong responds to this charge with equanimity: “It is not denied, of course, that the totalling or alling relation involves negation. It sets a limit to the things of that sort” (2004: 73). But if negation has indeed been smuggled into the description of the role that T performs in comprising a totality state then it is difficult to avoid the suspicion that Armstrong has simply exchanged many negative facts for one big one. But we may think of Armstrong’s contribution in a different way. There are two ostensible concerns that negative states of affairs present. First, there is a concern about their number. Second, there is a concern about, so to speak, their negativity. Armstrong has addressed the first concern by showing how we may reduce the number of negative states of affairs. Armstrong judges that the second concern doesn’t need to be addressed—because, as Armstrong reflects, we cannot eliminate negation from our description of the world.

According to C.B. Martin, Armstrong’s proposal conflicts with common sense because we already recognise in ordinary discourse that different negative truths have different truth-makers—not just one as Armstrong proposes (1996: 59). For example, we recognise that what makes it true that there is no oil in this car’s engine is different from what makes it true that there are no dodos left. What makes claims like these true are absences, lacks, limits, holes and voids, where these are conceived not as things but as “localised states of the world”, robustly first-order and “causally relevant” to what goes on (Martin 1996: 58, 65–6; Taylor 1952: 443–5). But, as many philosophers have argued, when we talk about an absence having causal effects what we’re really saying can be understood without reifying negative states and appealing instead to the actual effects, or the counterfactual effects, of a positive state (Molnar 2000: 77–80; Armstrong 2004: 64–7; Lewis 2004; Beebee 2004)

It has also been objected that Armstrong’s position gives rise to a “paradox of totality” (Armstrong 1989: 94, 1997: 198–9, 2004: 78–9; Cox 1997: 53–60; Molnar 2000: 81). Take the totality state of affairs that comprises all the (1^st order) state of affairs. Since this (2^nd order) state is itself a state of affairs it follows that the initial aggregate of (1^st order) states of affairs failed to comprise all the states of affairs there are. So there must be a further totality state that comprised the aggregate of all of them. But this (3^rd order) state is also a state of affairs so it will need to be added to the mix too, and so ad infinitum.

Armstrong responds to this objection with equanimity too:

we can afford to be casual about this infinite series. For after the first fact of totality these “extra” states of affairs are all supervenient. As such, we do not have to take them with ontological seriousness. (1989b: 94)

To understand this we need to appreciate that Armstrong’s notion of supervenience is non-standard. For him: “an entity Q supervenes upon entity P if and only if it is impossible that P should exist and Q not exist” or, in other words that the existence of P entails the existence of Q. (Armstrong 1997: 11). He also holds a non-standard conception of ontological commitment, viz. that “What supervenes is no addition of being” (Armstrong 1997: 12, 2004: 23–4). Armstrong’s idea is (roughly) that to be a genuine addition to being is to be a net (indispensable) contributor to the schedule of truth-makers for all the truths. But supervenient entities are superfluous as truth-makers. If the existence of an R entails the existence of a certain S which in turn entails the truth of P, then R already makes P true so there is no need to include S in the inventory of truth-makers. It follows that supervenient entities, like S, are no addition of being (Lewis 1992: 216).

Now bring this non-standard conception of ontological commitment to bear upon the envisaged infinite series of totality facts. It is impossible that the 2^nd order totality fact comprising all the 1st order states of affairs exist and the 3^rd order totality fact comprising all the 1^st and 2^nd order states not exist. So the 3^rd totality fact—or any other state higher-order than it—is entailed by the existence of the 2^nd order totality state. So all of these n > 2 higher-order totality states supervene on it. That’s why Armstrong doesn’t think we need to take any of them with ontological seriousness.

What should we make of this non-standard conception of ontological commitment in terms of truth-making: that to be is to be a truth-maker? An argument is owed that we can’t legitimately commit ourselves to the existence of things that perform theoretical roles outside the theory of truth-makers. Why shouldn’t we allow that there are other theoretical roles for existing things to perform? Indeed it’s a very real possibility that when we come to understand the capacity of the truth-makers to make truth-bearers true we will find ourselves embroiled in commitment to the existence of other things in their explanatory wake that aren’t truth-makers themselves (MacBride 2011: 169). In fact Armstrong himself should have been one of the first to recognise this. For it has been an abiding feature of Armstrong’s world view that we are obliged to acknowledge not only states affairs, which are truth makers, but also properties and relations, constituents of states of affairs, which aren’t. Cameron (2008c) has proposed that Armstrong’s conception should replace the standard one that to be is to be the value of a variable. But there’s the further difficulty that this threatens to cut off the branch the advocates of truth-maker theory are sitting on: if they disavow that existential quantification is ontologically committing then they will be left without a means of expressing what, according to truthmaker theory, are the existing truthmakers (Schaffer 2010: 16–7).

More generally still, can we make any sense of the idea of “an ontological free lunch”? Why is something supervenient no addition to being? Even if we only ever came to recognise the existence of one supervening entity would we not thereby have added at least one extra item to our inventory of things that exist? Of course in the special case where the supervening entity is constituted by the entities it supervenes upon—i.e., the things that are already there—it makes some sense to say that it’s not adding anything new; but what Armstrong et al. declare to be ontological free lunches aren’t typically constituted from the entities upon which they supervene (Lewis 1992: 213, Melia 2005: 74–5). Accordingly Schulte (2011a, 2011b) argues that no necessitarian or grounding account of truth-making can make sense of the notion of an ontological free lunch, maintaining instead that truthmaker theory needs to be augmented with the idea that we are offering a reductive explanation when we make an explanation in terms of truthmakers. Where does this leave us? So long as Armstrong’s non-standard conception of ontological commitment remains controversial, it also remains controversial whether the infinite series of totality facts to which Armstrong is “committed” may be welcomed as an ontological free-lunch.

2.4 Optimalism

One way to respond to these difficulties is to abandon maximalism in favour of optimalism, to deny that universal and negative statements need truth-makers. But Merricks argues the optimalist “way out” is blocked. Negative truths need truth-makers if any truths do, but they can’t have them. So, according to Merricks, we must give up thinking that truths need truth-makers in the first place (2007: 39–67).

Here’s why Merricks thinks so. In order to avoid the over-generation of truth-makers for necessary truths (etc.) Merricks imposes a relevance constraint : “a truth-maker must be that which its truth is about”, so akin to Smith’s requirement that a truthmaker fall within the subject matter of the proposition it makes tree (Smith 1999, Merricks 2007: 28). But can this constraint be satisfied in the case of negative existentials, such as the statement there are no hobbits? This statement isn’t about hobbits, because there aren’t any, and other apparent candidates, such as the universe’s exhibiting the global property of being such that there are no hobbits in it, appear hoaxed up and artificial (2007: 43–55). Even if one follows Merricks this far, one may still think that negative existentials are the principled exception that proves the rule that a truth-maker for a positive truth must be what its truth is about. But, so far as Merricks is concerned, this is throwing the baby out with the bathwater:

I deny that if we set aside the intuition that “a truth, any truth” depends on being we are left with the equally compelling intuition that all truths except negative existentials depend on being. (2007: 41)

He further suggests that this position is theoretically disingenuous because no one would consider retreating to it from full-blown maximalism unless he or she had already been “spooked” by his or her failure to find truth-makers for negative truths; or if they held onto the view that truth is correspondence (Merricks 2007: 40–1; Dodd 2007: 394; Cameron 2008a: 411). Merricks surmises that if we have any reason to commit to truth-makers, we have only reason to commit outright to a truth-maker for every truth (maximalism). But since maximalism cannot be sustained because of the lack of things for negative existentials to be about, Merricks recommends the rejection of truth-makers altogether.

But optimalists aren’t just “spooked” or “timid” maximalists. They stand on their two feet with a principled position of their own that need neither be based upon “gerrymandered intuition” nor adopted as a consequence of a forced retreat from maximalism. If maximalism is intellectual heir to Russell’s logical atomism, then optimalism (at least in the form under consideration) is heir to Wittgenstein’s version of the doctrine according to which it is only atomic propositions that represent the existence of states of affairs. The optimalists’ idea is that once truth-makers have been supplied for the atomic truths there is simply no need to posit further truth-makers for the molecular ones. All we need to recognise is that an atomic statement P is true whenever a truth-maker for P exists, that P is false if and only if no truth-maker for P exists. Once the existence and non-existence of the truth-makers has settled the truth-values of all the atomic statements, the logical operations described by the truth-tables then settle the truth and falsity of all the molecular statements (another story must be told about what the truth-makers are for the non-extensional constructions—another elephant in the room). In particular, the truth-table for negation—that tells us what “~” means—assures us that if P is false then ~P is true. So all it takes to make ~P true is that no truth-maker for P exists. Thus Mulligan, Simons, and Smith:

it seems more adequate to regard sentences of the given kind as true not in virtue of any truth-maker of their own, but simply in virtue of the fact that the corresponding positive sentences have no truth-maker. (1984: 315; see also Mellor 2003: 213–4, 2009; Simons 2000:7–8, 2005: 255–6)

Optimalists also think that general truths are true without need for bespoke truth-makers (like totality facts) because they are logically equivalent to truths that don’t need truthmakers. For example, a universal quantification ∀xFx is logically equivalent to the negative statement ∼∃x∼Fx. Since the latter is negative, it’s true, if it is, because no truthmaker exists for ∃x∼Fx. Then because the former is logically equivalent to the latter, the optimalists concludes that ∀xFx isn’t true in virtue of a bespoke truthmaker of its own but simply because no truthmaker for its negation exists (Mellor 2003: 214; Simons 2008: 14–5).

Jago (2012, 2018: 81–102) presents a dilemma against non-maximalists (optimalists). Here’s a sketch. The non-maximalist will accept (at least) two types of true proposition: those requiring truthmakers (‘positive’ propositions saying how reality is) and those that don’t (‘negative propositions’ saying how reality isn’t). (Some true propositions may be a mix of the two. These are true derivatively). Now consider proposition P: <Jo knows that Shamima doesn’t have an aunt>. Suppose P is true. Here’s the first horn of the dilemma. P is a true positive proposition, so there must be a truthmaker T for it. By necessitation and the factivity of knowledge, whatever T might be, it must necessitate the nonexistence of Shamima’s aunt. But a truthmaker which necessitates the nonexistence of something, so is a ‘negative fact’, belongs to a maximalist ontology – an ontology the non-maximalist purportedly eschewed. Here’s the second. If the non-maximalist can provide truthmakers for P that aren’t negative facts then the maximalist can use the same truthmakers for negative propositions. So either the non-maximalist doesn’t evade the negative facts of the maximalist or the maximalist can adopt the non-maximalist strategy in order to avoid negative facts whilst continuing to hold that every truth has a positive truthmaker. Further defences of and challenges for the optimalist or non-maximalist are discussed in Simpson 2014, Skiles 2014, Griffith 2015, Schipper 2018, Asay 2020: 71–91, Jago 2020.

2.5 Truth Supervenes Upon Being

Optimalism retains the original demand for truth-makers but restricts it to atomic statements. Optimalism accordingly disavows a commitment to truth-makers for negative statements and statements of generality. But Bigelow⎯also wary of the commitments that maximalism engenders to negative and totality facts⎯ weakens what truth-making means to a point where negative and general statements don’t require bespoke truth-makers of their own (1988: 131–3). He offers the following principle to capture the kernel of truth in truth-making worth saving.

(Truth Supervenes on Being): If something is true then it would not be possible for it to be false unless either certain things were to exist which don’t, or else certain things had not existed which do (Bigelow 1988: 133).

This principle allows atomic truths to have truth-makers⎯because it would only be possible for them to be false if certain things had not existed: their truth-makers. But it also allows negative truths to be true without them. The statement that there are no dragons gets to be true because it would only be possible for that statement to be false if something which hadn’t existed (dragons) did exist. Such statements are true not because they have truth-makers but because they have no counterexamples, “they lack false-makers” (Lewis 1992: 216, 2001: 610).

General truths are also true for lack of false-makers. The statement that everything is physical (if true) is true because it would only be possible for the statement to be false if something that hadn’t existed did, viz. something that wasn’t physical. So when truth-making is understood in this weakened sense there is no need to acknowledge, e.g., an additional totality fact to make it true that there are only five coins in my pocket; it’s enough that if I hadn’t stopped adding coins that statement would have been false because then there would have been at least one other coin in my pocket (Heil 2000: 236–240; Bricker 2006).

Despite their differences, optimalism and (Truth Supervenes Upon Being) share a key idea in common—that a negative existential truth isn’t true because something exists, but because something doesn’t, viz. a truth-maker for its contradictory, a false-maker for it. C.B. Martin has objected that this doesn’t obviate the need to posit truth-makers for negative existentials. This is because a statement that there are no false-makers for a negative existential truth is itself a negative existential truth. So this statement “can’t be used to explain or show how the latter needs no truth-making state of the world for it to be true” (1996: 61). Lewis takes Martin’s objection to be that this account of the truth of negative truths isn’t informative. Take the statement that there are no unicorns. Why is it true? Well because there are no unicorns. That’s not much of an explanation! But, Lewis retorts, the positive existential statement that there is a cat is true because there is a cat. That’s “No explanation at all, and none the worse for that” (Lewis 2001: 611–12).

Lewis argued that the doctrine that truth supervenes upon being is an uncomfortable halfway house. He began by arguing that the retreat from maximalism was always necessary. He pointed out how deeply counterintuitive it is to suppose that negative existentials are true because their truth-makers exist. It seems, offhand, that they are true not because some things do exist but because some don’t. “Why defy this first impression?” (1992: 204). But, more importantly, Lewis pointed out that maximalism was incompatible with what he took to be the Humean principle governing our thought about modality: that anything can co-exist with anything else that’s distinct. But it is the raison d’être of any truth-maker for the negative existential truth that there are no unicorns—if there is one and whatever else it is like—that even though it is distinct from all unicorns it cannot co-exist with any of them. Why? Because otherwise it would make it true that there are no unicorns even in circumstances where unicorns existed. Alternatively, suppose that any putative truthmaker is not distinct from all unicorns but shares some common part with them. But even allowing this would not explain why the truthmaker excludes the existence of unicorns. If anything, the sharing of a common part would make it more mysterious why the truthmaker excludes their existence. Similarly it is the raison d’être of any truth-maker for a general truth that such-and-such are all the facts there are that it refuses to co-exist with any other facts even though it is distinct from them. So if we’re to hang onto the Humean principle that anything can co-exist with anything else, we’d better give up the demand for truth-makers for negative and general truths—in other words, give up maximalism (Lewis 1992: 205, 2001: 610–11).

Lewis also argued that we can’t stop here—just giving up maximalism—because even the truth-makers for atomic statements conflict with his Humeanism. An atomic, contingent statement ‘a is F’ isn’t made true by a or F or even the mereological fusion a+F because they can exist even in circumstances where a and F are unrelated, say when a is G rather than F whilst b is F instead. For this reason, many maximalists make common cause with optimalists and posit another fundamental kind of thing to perform the truth-making role for contingent predications: facts that consist in objects, properties and relations inhering together; in this case the fact that a is F (Armstrong 1989a: 41–2, 1997: 115–6; Mellor 1995: 24).

Now facts aren’t mereological fusions, Lewis argued, because facts require more for their existence than the existence of their constituents, its also being required that their constituents inhere together for facts to exist. Assuming that only mereological fusions have parts, it follows that the constituents of facts aren’t parts of facts, hence that facts are entirely distinct from their constituents. But even though a and F are entirely distinct from a is F, the existence of a is F necessitates the existence of a and F. More generally, the obtaining of a fact necessitates the existence of its constituents even though the fact and its constituents are entirely distinct. So facts conflict with Lewis’s Humeanism according to which any distinct things may coexist or fail to coexist. So we cannot posit facts as truth-makers for contingent statements without going against Humeanism (Lewis 1992: 200, 1998: 215–6, 2001: 611). Armstrong replied that mereology isn’t the only form of composition, i.e. the constituents of facts are parts of them in a non-mereological sense, hence facts aren’t distinct from their constituents after all (Armstrong 1997: 119–122). Lewis’s reply was that the only way to make sense of something’s being a constituent of a state of affairs, without being a mereological part, was that it lies in a necessary connexion to that state of affairs; but necessary connexions are what we should seek to avoid (Lewis 2001: 611; MacBride and Janssen-Lauret 2022: 79–83).

Other maximalists and optimalists, posit tropes rather than facts as truth-makers for contingent predications (Martin 1980; Mulligan, Simons, & Smith 1984: 295–304, Lowe 2006: 186–7, 204–5) Tropes, in the non-transferrable sense, are particular instances of properties that are existentially dependent upon their bearers. But Lewis’ reasoning can be easily extended to show that non-transferrable tropes cannot serve as the truth-makers for contingent statements without contradicting Humeanism. If trope f is a property that a bears rather than a part of a, then f is wholly distinct from a. Nevertheless, the existence of f necessitates the existence of a even though they are distinct Alternatively if f is a part of the bundle of tropes that constitute a and f is non-transferrable, then the existence of f necessitates the existence of some other distinct tropes that are also parts of this bundle. So Humeanism is violated either way.

In order to avoid contradicting Humeanism, Lewis recommended a further weakening of (Truth Supervenes upon Being). According to Lewis, the kernel of truth in truth-making is the idea that propositions have a subject matter. They are about things so whether they are true or false depends on how those things stand. This led Lewis to endorse (2003: 25):

(Subject matter): Any proposition has a subject matter, on which its truth value supervenes.

Equivalently, there cannot be a difference in the truth-value of a proposition without a difference in its subject matter. This might consist in (1) an increase or decrease in the population of things that fall within the subject matter; or (2) a shift in the pattern of fundamental properties and relations those things exhibit (Lewis 2001: 612). Now the truth value of “a is F” supervenes upon its subject matter without there needing to be any existing thing distinct from a or F that necessitates their existence; it is enough that the statement would have been false if a had been something other than F. So it also follows, although Lewis didn’t explicitly trace out this consequence, that we can avoid contradicting Humeanism by abandoning optimalism in favour of (Subject matter).

In an intriguing twist to the plot, Lewis subsequently appeared to withdraw his doubts about truth-makers and embrace them after all (2003: 30, Lewis & Rosen 2003: 39). Here’s a rough sketch to get across the idea. There is a way of interpreting ‘fact’ talk that doesn’t embroil speakers in a commitment to necessary connexions between distinct existences. To talk about the fact that a is F isn’t to talk about something distinct from both a and F. It’s talk about a itself, albeit in a qualified way, namely as F or ‘qua F’ as Lewis puts it. So a qua F qualifies as a truthmaker for the statement that a is F because a qua F cannot exist unless a is F. So if a qua F exists then the statement that a is F is true. But there are no restrictions thereby imposed on what can or cannot coexist. That’s because whilst a qua F cannot exist unless a is F, a without the qualification ‘qua F’ can exist even if a isn’t F, for example as a qua G. So we can have truthmakers for contingent predications like a is F after all because a can just be an ordinary thing. In the same way that ordinary objects like a can serve as truth-makers for contingent predications, Lewis & Rosen (2003) suggest that the entire world—“the totality of everything there actually is”—can serve as the truth-maker for negative existentials. Take the world qua unaccompanied by unicorns. In the conversational context just set up, the world has no counterparts that are inhabited by unicorns. So the world qua unaccompanied by unicorns is essentially lacking in unicorns and therefore qualifies as a truth-maker for the statement that there are no unicorns. When building the case for (Subject Matter) Lewis had deliberately remained neutral about the metaphysics of modality (2001: 605). But to explain what ‘qua F’ constructions mean, Lewis broke his neutrality and availed himself of his favoured theory of counterparts according to which ‘a is essentially F just in case all of a’s counterparts (including a itself) are F’ (2003: 27). So, roughly, ‘a qua F’ stands for all of a’s counterparts that are F.

Has Lewis shown how it is possible to garner truth-makers for contingent predications and negative existentials without positing totality facts or tropes that ensnare us in a web of necessary connections? We need to be clear about what Lewis was doing. He wasn’t belatedly recognising what he had previously denied, that the truth-making role is genuine, but then ingeniously coming up with the idea that qua-versions of things perform this role just as effectively as states of affairs, only without necessary connections between distinct existences. Rather, Lewis’ aim in this paper is to damn the very idea of truth-makers with faint praise. By showing how qua versions of things performed the truth-making role just as effectively as facts or tropes Lewis aimed to show how explanatorily light weight the truth-making role truly was.

There are various criticisms of detail to be made. MacBride (2005: 130–2) points out that Lewis failed to provide truthmakers for relational predications and argues that it is very difficult to see how the lacuna can be filled when the class of eligible truthmakers is restricted by Lewis to the class of ordinary things. So, for example, sequences cannot serve as truthmakers for relational predications because sequences aren’t ordinary things. Bricker (2015: 178–9) raises a difficulty with Lewis’s use of counterpart theory. Lewis maintains that whether a is a truthmaker for a is F will depend upon whatever counterpart relation is evoked in context. Bricker argues that this is incompatible with interpreting the maximalist principle that every truth has a truthmaker as a single assertion--because it will only be a single assertion if there is a uniform interpretation in terms of a single privileged counterpart relation. Lewis might reply that the maximalist principle needn’t be taken as a single assertion but as a schema where different instances evoke different counterpart relations even if we didn’t appreciate this hitherto. But, in fact, there seems no reason for Lewis to make that concession because he is able to say what the maximalist principle amounts to in one closed formula which Bricker (2017: 174) provides: (TMC) For every true proposition P, there exists some entity T and some admissible counterpart relation such that, for every world W, if T has a counterpart (under that relation) in W, then P is true in W. Nonetheless Bricker’s own proposal (2017: 177–80) about how to provide an account of truthmaking in terms of a single counterpart relation is of independent interest.

3. What Motivates the Doctrine of Truth-makers?

3.1 To catch a cheater

What is the motivation for adopting a theory of truth-makers, whether maximalist or optimalist? Sider describes the “whole point” of adopting a theory of truth-makers thus: to “Catch the cheaters” who don’t believe in truth-makers (Sider 2001: 40–1; see also Merricks 2007: 2–3). But this is a bit like saying that the point of a benefit system is to catch out benefit frauds. It’s only if there is some antecedent point in favour of truth-makers that there can be anything wrong with leaving them out. Nonetheless, it is possible that we can come to appreciate the need for truth-makers by appreciating what is lacking in theories that neglect them. This is how C.B. Martin and Armstrong came to recognise the necessity for admitting truth-makers (Armstrong 1989b: 8–11, 2004: 1–3). Consider phenomenalism: the view that the physical world is a construction out of sense-impressions. One obstacle for this view is the need to make sense in sense-impression terms of true claims we make about the unobserved world. Martin noticed that the phenomenalist could only appeal to brute, ungrounded counterfactuals about possible experience to do so. But counterfactuals do not float free in a void. They must be responsive to an underlying reality, the reality that makes them true. For Martin this was the phenomenalists’ fatal error: their inability to supply credible truth-makers for truths about unobserved objects. The same error afflicted Ryle’s behaviourism with its brute counterfactuals about non-existent behaviour and Prior’s presentism according to which there is nothing outside the present and so there is nothing for past-tensed and future-tensed truths to be held responsible to. We come to appreciate the need for truth-makers as the common need these different theories fail to fulfil.

According to Lewis, this demand for truth-makers represented an overreaction to what was undoubtedly a flaw in phenomenalism (1992: 217). We can already understand what’s wrong with phenomenalism when we appreciate that it fails to provide an account of the things upon which the truth of counterfactuals about sense impressions supervene, i.e., when we see that it fails to satisfy (Subject Matter). This leaves under-motivated the claim that phenomenalism should also be faulted for failing to supply truth-makers to ground counterfactuals about sense-impressions. The same reasoning applies to behaviourism and presentism; they also fail to satisfy (Subject Matter). So there’s no need to adopt truth makers to catch cheats. All we need to do is to recognise the strictures (Subject Matter) places upon us.

It’s a further flaw of Martin and Armstrong’s reasoning that even if we accede to the demand for truth-makers it doesn’t follow that even idealism is ruled out. According to Armstrong if we forsake the demand for truth-makers we thereby challenge “the realistic insight that there is a world that exists independently of our thoughts and statements, making the latter true or false” (1997: 128). But even an idealist could accept that there are truth-makers whilst thinking of them as mind-dependent entities. So acceding to the demand for truth-makers doesn’t tell us what’s wrong with idealism (Daly 2005: 95–7). Bergmann, the grandfather of the contemporary truth-maker movement, was explicit about this: “the truth of S must be grounded ontologically. On this first move idealists and realists agree” (Bergmann 1961: 229). The realist-idealist distinction cuts across the distinction between philosophers who admit truth-makers and those that don’t (Dodd 2002: 83–4).

The demand for truth-makers doesn’t help “catch cheaters” at all. Just acknowledge, e.g., some brute counterfactual facts about sense data, or brute dispositions to behave in one way or another, or brute facts about what happened in the past or will happen in the future. What’s unsatisfactory about these posits isn’t that if they existed they’d fail to make true statements about unobserved objects or statements about mental states that failed to manifest themselves in actual behaviour or statements about the past or future. The problem is that we have difficulty in understanding how such facts or dispositions could be explanatorily sound (Horwich 2009: 195–7). Whatever we find lacking in theories that posit such items, it isn’t that they fail to provide truth-makers, because they do.

Here’s another way to make the point. The demand for truthmakers turns out to be vacuous. Are the facts the “cheater” posits questionable in some further way as ‘metaphysically strange’ or ‘spooky’? Those facts are specified in terms of counterfactual or dispositional truths, so those facts are questionable if and only if truths of these kinds are. If there is some reason to find such truths questionable, then that alone is the reason for querying behaviourism or phenomenalism; the demand for truth-makers was extraneous.

An alternative line is this: ‘One must approach the question of which truths have truthmakers on a case-by-case basis’ Asay (2020: 23–7, 2023: 24). One consequence is that a philosophical theory is not immediately open to criticism on the ground that it allows truths which lack truthmakers. The ‘catching cheaters’ strategy is thereby weakened: it is not a default assumption that any given truth has a truthmaker and so the burden of argument does not lie with (say) the phenomenalist or the behaviourist. Whether their theories are at fault in not positing truthmakers for certain truths becomes a matter of debate and lacks easy resolution.

3.2 Truth Depends on Being

Armstrong’s original motivation for introducing truthmakers involved appeal to the following intuition.

It seems obvious that for every true contingent proposition there must be something in the world (in the largest sense of “something”) which makes the proposition true. For consider any true contingent proposition and imagine that it is false. We must automatically imagine some difference in the world. (Armstrong 1973: 11; c.f., Bigelow 1988: 126)

Armstrong assumes that the word ‘some’ in ‘some difference’ should be interpreted objectually, i.e. as having the function of ranging over a domain of a entities which are such that their presence and absence corresponds to the truth and falsity of continent propositions. With this assumption in place it is easy to think that there must be some things that we’re quantifying over when we say that there’s some difference in the world that constitutes the difference between these circumstances, viz. truth makers. However, it shouldn’t be assumed without argument that quantifier words are objectual, i.e. range over an associated domain of entities (Prior 1971: 31–4). Williamson argues in particular that that the truth maker principle in fact involves irreducible quantification into sentence position and ‘we shouldn’t assume that quantification into sentence position is objectual ‘For “value” is a noun, not a sentence’ (1999: 263) So one might acknowledge the intuition that there is some difference between the circumstances in which a proposition is true and the circumstances in which it is false but without our having to think that there exists something that we’ve quantified over that makes it so.

There’s another logical presupposition made by Armstrong and other proponents of truthmakers that’s relevant here. The use of the truthmaking idiom is often conceived as equivalent to the use of a non-causal ‘because’. So saying: S is made true by T, is equivalent to saying: S is true because T exists. The logical presupposition made by Armstrong et al is that the relevant use of ‘because’ expresses a relation between a truthbearer and some worldly item, a fact or a trope. But this presupposition is challenged by philosophers who hold that “because” so-employed is a connective conceived on the model of logical operators (“&”, “∼” etc.) i.e., as an expressions that link sentences but without expressing a relation between things picked out by those sentences. But, they reason, if ‘because’ is connective then so is the ‘makes true’ construction because they are equivalent. But then, they reason, there’s no need to introduce truth-makers as items that stand at one end of the truth-makingof relation with true statements at the other, no need to because it’s only superficial features of the grammar of our language that suggest there is a truth-making relation to stand at the ends of. (Künne 2003: 150–; Hornsby 2005: 35–7; Melia 2005: 78–9; Schnieder 2006a: 29–37; Mulligan 2007).

Typically philosophers who maintain that “makes true” is a connective do not argue for this conclusion directly but encourage us to dwell upon the fact that it natural to hear the “because” that occurs in equivalent constructions as a connective. When we hear, e.g., “It is true that the rose is red because the rose is red” we don’t naturally hear it as expressing a binary relation between two things. So we shouldn’t hear, or at least don’t have to hear, “It’s true that the rose is red in virtue of the rose’s being red” or “the rose’s being red makes it true that the rose is red” as a expressing a binary relation between a truth and truth-maker either. Künne has gone further and suggested that the truth-making connective is really the “because” of conceptual explanation (2003: 154–5; Schnieder 2006a: 36–7). He hears the equivalence between,

(R): He is a child of a sibling of one of your parents, which makes him your first cousin

and,

(R*): He is your first cousin because he is a child of a sibling of one of your parents.

Künne tells us that the “because” in (R*) is the “because” of “conceptual explanation”. Since (R) and (R*) are equivalent, he concludes that the “makes” construction in (R) is just a cumbersome way of expressing the “because” of conceptual explanation in (R*). Künne then invites us take the use of “makes” in (R) as a model for understanding the truth-making construction,

(S): The fact that snow is white makes the statement that snow is white true.

This enables us to see that (S) does “not affirm a relation of any kind between a truth vehicle and something in the world” (Künne 2003: 155). Why? Because it is equivalent to,

(S*): The statement that snow is white is true because snow is white.

a claim that makes no (explicit) mention of facts.

Does all this mean that we should join Bigelow in his retreat to (Truth Supervenes Upon Being) or step back with Lewis to (Subject Matter)? The problem is that these supervenience principles don’t seem a satisfactory resting place either, not if our concern is to understand how true representations can touch upon an independent reality, i.e., something non-representational. First, it is familiar point that just appealing to a systematic pattern of modal co-variation between truths and their subject matters—so that there is no difference in the former without a difference in the latter—doesn’t provide us within any insight into the underlying mechanism or mechanisms that sustains this dependency (Molnar 2000: 82–3; Heil 2003: 67; Daly 2005: 97–8; Melia 2005: 82–3). Second, if possible worlds are conceived as maximal representations then these supervenience principles (understood in the idiom of possible worlds) fail to articulate what it is for a representation to touch upon being, something non-representational: “For the idea that every truth depends on being is not the idea that every truth is entailed by propositions of a certain sort” (Merricks 2007: 86).

A third reason for being unsatisfied with Lewis’ (Subject Matter) is based upon the observation that the supervenience involved is symmetric. Just as there is no difference in the distribution of truth-values amongst the body of propositions without a reciprocating difference in their subject matter, there is no difference in their subject matter without a difference in the distribution of their truth-values (Armstrong 2004: 7–8). But we also have the firm intuition that the truth or falsity of a proposition depends upon the state of the world in a way in which the state of the world doesn’t depend upon the proposition’s truth or falsity. This means that a supervenience principle like (Subject Matter) cannot be used to articulate the asymmetric way in which truth so depends upon being; for this, it is argued, we need to rely upon a robust asymmetric notion of truth-making (Rodriguez-Pereyra 2005: 18–19). Bricker (2015: 180–183) replies on Lewis’s behalf that the oft-heard complaint that supervenience by itself is not a dependence or ontological priority relation is besides the point. Rather, Bricker argues, the metaphysical punch of Lewis’s doctrine that truth supervenes upon being “has little to do with the ‘supervenience part’ and everything to do with the ‘being’ part and the conception of fundamentality that informs it”, where by ‘fundamental’ Bricker means Lewis’s theory of natural properties and relations.

But is there really anything so mysterious about the asymmetric dependence of truth upon being that we need anything as heavy duty as truth-making or supervenience+naturalness to explain it? A number of proposals have been made for explaining the felt asymmetry in other terms. Horwich (1998: 105; 2008: 265–66) argues that asymmetric dependence of truth upon being arises from the fact that we can deduce p from the proposition that p is true. But we can equally deduce p from p is true so this fails to establish an asymmetric dependence (Künne 2003: 151–52; Rodriguez-Pereyra 2005: 27).

Hornsby argues instead that there is explanatory asymmetry between its being the case that p and the proposition that p is true, because the latter requires more to be the case than the former, (e.g.) that there are propositions (Hornsby 2005: 44). Dodd suggests a cognate alternative: that the felt asymmetry of truth upon being arises from the fact that the identity of the proposition that p is partially determined by the worldly items it’s about, so we can’t understand what is required for the proposition that p to be true without already having an understanding of what it is for p to be the case (Dodd 2007: 398–400). More radically, Tallant (2018) seeks to entirely replace truthmaker theory with explanatory considerations: every truth is explained without appeal to any truthmaker: <p> is true because p and <p> is true iff p.

MacBride (2014) offers a semantic account of the felt asymmetry in terms of the interlocking mechanism of reference and satisfaction that explains the truth of a proposition. Whilst we can deduce from the truth of the proposition that p that p is the case, MacBride argues that we can’t (ultimately) explain its being the case that p in terms of the truth of the proposition that p because its being the case that p is already assumed by the truth of that proposition, that is, has already performed a role in the semantic mechanism whereby the truth-value is determined. By contrast, its being the case that p isn’t determined by a semantic mechanism but by whatever worldly factors, if any, that gave rise to p’s being the case. Saenz (2018) replies that whilst reference and satisfaction may be used to explain that propositions are true, they still “do not, in any sense, account for the world ‘making it’ [sic] that propositions are some way” (a similar point is made by Mulligan et al 1984: 288, see sec. 3.5 below for further discussion). But Saenz risks begging the question by making the additional demand on the character of the felt asymmetry of truth and being that it consists in more than an asymmetric relationship between truth and being. Saenz holds that the felt asymmetry consists in the requirement that the world makes propositions true but whether we need to appeal to the idea of the world making propositions true in the first place is the point at issue. Finally, Liggins (2012) argues that the felt asymmetry between truth and being is best explained in terms of the asymmetry of grounding, although the asymmetry of grounding is contested as is grounding itself.

3.3 Truth: Correspondence and Deflationism

An alternative motivation for adopting the truth-maker principle is that it inherits whatever the attractions where for the correspondence theory of truth.

Anybody who is attracted to the correspondence theory of truth should be drawn to the truth-maker [sic]. Correspondence demands a correspondent, and a correspondent for a truth is a truth-maker. (Armstrong 1997: 14; see also 1997: 128–9, 2004: 16–7)

According to Armstrong, the “truth-maker principle” (aka maximalism) just is what we are left with once we drop the assumption from the correspondence theory that the relation between truth bearers and truth-makers is one-one. Of course, the truth-making relation, however it is explicated, cannot be the relation of correspondence in terms of which truth is defined—for whereas the latter is symmetric, the former isn’t (Beebee & Dodd 2005b: 13–4). But this doesn’t prevent truth being defined using the truth-making relation, albeit in a more roundabout way according to the following pattern,

(C): S is true ⇔ (∃x)(S is-made-true-by x).

Of course such a definition will only succeed if the relation expressed by “is-made-true-by” can itself be explicated without relying upon the notion of truth itself or other notions that implicitly presuppose it, e.g., entailment (Merricks 2007: 15). This is no doubt one of the reasons that principles of truth-making are typically not put forward as definitions of truth (David 2009: 144). Another objection made by Horwich is that it is implausible to suppose that an ordinary person understands the notion of truth via the heterogeneous principles that govern the provision of truth-makers for different types of propositions. It’s more plausible to suppose that we first grasp what truth is, and only subsequently figure out what truth-makers are required for the various kinds of propositions there are (Horwich 2009: 188).

Several philosophers have argued that the kinds of truthmaking we have been considering don’t presuppose the notion of truth but operate at a far more subterranean level. Bigelow writes, “The force behind Truth-maker lies deeper than worries about the nature of truth and of truth-bearers” (Bigelow 1988: 127, 2009: 396–7; Robinson 2000: 152; Lewis 2001: 605–6; Horwich 2009: 188–9, Bricker 2015: 169). Here’s their reasoning. Suppose we understand what it is to be truth-maker in terms of entailment. Then whatever the range of truths we think are capable of being rendered true, the “guts” of our truth-maker principle can be stated using the schema,

(Schema): If P, then there must be something in the world whose existence entails that P.

This schema is equivalent to the infinitely many conditionals that fall under it:

(i1): If the donkey is brown, then there must be something in the world whose existence entails that the donkey is brown;
(i2): if the Parthenon is on the Acropolis then there must be something in the world whose existence entails that the Parthenon is on the Acropolis; and so on.

Note that neither “true” nor “truth” shows up anywhere in the schema or its instances. Arguably the only role that the notion of truth performs is the one that minimalist or deflationary theories of truth emphasize, that of enabling us to capture all of that unending string of conditionals in a single slogan,

(Slogan): For any truth, there must be something in the world whose existence entails that truth.

But since truth is serving here only as a device of generalization, the real subject matter of (Slogan) is already expressed by the conditionals (i1), (i2) etc. Since they make no explicit mention of either propositions or truth, a theory of truth-makers is neither a theory about propositions nor a theory about truth. If so, then the theory of truth-makers can neither gain inspiration from, nor be tarred by the same brush as the correspondence theory of truth. Nor need the theory of truth-makers be bedeviled by concerns about the nature of truth bearers.

One may nevertheless wonder whether Bigelow and Lewis have thrown the baby out with the bathwater. MacBride (2013a) argues that if we do not allow ourselves the general thought that truth-bearers are true or false depending upon how things stand in the world then it is unclear what, if any, credibility (i1), (i2) etc. have. For why should there be something in the world whose existence necessitates that (e.g.) cats purr? Why can’t cats purr, even though there is nothing whose existence entails that truth? Since Slogan is intended to be just shorthand for its instances, (i 1), (i 2) etc. it follows Slogan can’t be any more credible or motivated than its instances. If, however, we allow ourselves a conception of truth which isn’t deflationary, i.e. a substantial conception whereby truth is conceived as a relation borne by a truth-bearer to something worldly that exists independently of us, then, MacBride argues, we will have an independent reason for positing something worldly the existence of which necessitates the truth that cats purr etc.

Asay draws another connection with minimalism or deflationary theories of truth. He argues that truthmaking should not be used in the service of defining truth because, “As on deflationary accounts (e.g., Horwich 1998), it may be that all there is to the property of truth is that it is the property that a sentence ‘p’ has if and only if p” (2023: 14). But, as Alston (1996: 37–8) thought, some kind of deflationism might be the correct theory of the concept of truth, whilst leaving open the possibility that there is more to be said about the property of truth than the concept of truth supplies—which truthmaking might supply. Moreover, unless Asay thinks the truthmaker principle analytically follows from minimalism about truth, he is committed to saying that, at least in many instances, there is more to be said about the property of truth than what Horwich allows. (For further discussion of deflationism in connection with truth-making see McGrath 2003, Vision 2005 and Thomas 2011).

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Acknowledgments

This entry was originally based upon a course on truth makers that Macbride gave in Cambridge, Michaelmas 2012. For subsequent revisions he is grateful to Helen Beebee, John Bigelow, Jeremy Butterfield, Ross Cameron, Julian Dodd, Dominic Gregory, Ghislain Guigon, Jane Heal, John Heil, Herbert Hochberg, Jennifer Hornsby, Frédérique Janssen-Lauret, Nick Jones, David Liggins, Jonathan Lowe, Mike Martin, Hugh Mellor, Peter Milne, Kevin Mulligan, Laurie Paul, Bryan Pickel, Stephen Read, Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra, Jonathan Schaffer, Jeroen Smid, Peter Simons, Tim Williamson, Ed Zalta and two anonymous referees for SEP.

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Truthmakers