Wittgenstein’s Aesthetics

Given the extreme importance that Wittgenstein attached to the aesthetic dimension of life, it is in one sense surprising that he wrote so little on the subject. It is true that we have the notes assembled from his lectures on aesthetics given to a small group of students in private rooms in Cambridge in the summer of 1938 (Wittgenstein 1966, henceforth LA) and we have G. E. Moore’s record of some of Wittgenstein’s lectures in the period 1930–33 (Moore 1972). Of Wittgenstein’s own writings, we find remarks on literature, poetry, architecture, the visual arts, and especially music and the philosophy of culture more broadly scattered throughout his writings on the philosophies of language, mind, mathematics, and philosophical method, as well as in his more personal notebooks; a number of these are collected in Culture and Value (Wittgenstein 1980a). In another sense, it is not surprising at all, precisely because of the central position he gave to the aesthetic: in writing about questions of meaning, as he did throughout his life from the earliest pre-Tractatus (Wittgenstein 1921/1922, 1971) writings to the remarks from the last weeks of his life in On Certainty (Wittgenstein 1969), in writing about perception, as he did in Part II of Philosophical Investigations (Wittgenstein 1953, 2009, henceforth PI), Remarks on the Philosophy of Psychology, Volumes I and II (Wittgenstein 1980b, 1980c), and Last Writings on the Philosophy of Psychology, volume I (Wittgenstein 1982), and in writing about the contextual prerequisites to the emergence of sense in his philosophy of mind and language (in PI as well as his writings on the philosophy of mathematics), he was writing—if at one remove—about aesthetics. For questions of meaning, of perception, and of sense are all clearly central to aesthetic experience, and the writing he undertook on these subjects holds significance for questions of artistic meaning and interpretation that are still being explored and articulated (Lewis 2004; Dauber & Jost [eds] 2003; Gibson & Huemer [eds] 2004; Hagberg 2017). Wittgenstein placed the aesthetic, not on a distant periphery of philosophical subjects, but then not at the center of a grouping of such interests either—for then it would still be a subject area unto itself. Rather, Wittgenstein interweaves the subject’s various and variegated strands throughout his writing in a way that in some cases shows explicitly, and in many more cases suggests implicitly, the layered interconnections between aesthetic considerations and every other area of philosophy upon which he wrote. So this article will primarily look into the details of the record we have of his lectures on the topic (which, predictably, take up many connections to extra-aesthetic issues along the way), but throughout try to offer a reading of them that situates them into the larger context of his philosophical work. And in his writings on aesthetics, one can glean a good deal concerning his overall approach to philosophical problems and issues: while previous work in aesthetics (and much work since the time of Wittgenstein’s writing) often pursued an essentialist strategy, that is, it tried to identify the essence of, e.g., beauty or the single defining feature of art, his approach is rather to assemble particular cases of aesthetic perception, judgment, understanding, and response, and learn from those without the kind of reductionism that is endemic to essentialist methodological presuppositions.

• 1. The Critique of Traditional Aesthetics
  • 1.1 Properties and Essence
  • 1.2 Predicates and Rules
  • 1.3 Culture and Complexity
• 2. The Critique of Scientism
  • 2.1 Aesthetic Reactions
  • 2.2 The “Click” of Coherence
  • 2.3 The Charm of Reduction
• 3. The Comparative Approach
  • 3.1 Critical Reasoning
  • 3.2 Seeing Connections
  • 3.3 The Attitude Toward the Work of Art
• 4. The Aesthetic Significance of the Later Writings
  • 4.1 The Blue Book, Meaning, and the Arts
  • 4.2 Philosophical Investigations, the Mind, and the Arts
  • 4.3 The Philosophy of Culture
• 5. Conclusion
• Bibliography
  • Wittgenstein’s Work: Primary Sources
  • Secondary Literature
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. The Critique of Traditional Aesthetics

Wittgenstein’s opening remark in his lectures on aesthetics (LA) is double-barreled: he states that the field of aesthetics is both very big and entirely misunderstood. By “very big”, Wittgenstein means both that the aesthetic dimension weaves itself through all of philosophy in the manner suggested above, and that the reach of the aesthetic in human affairs is very much greater than the far more restricted reach of the artistic; the world is densely packed with manifestations of the aesthetic sense or aesthetic interest, while the number of works of art is very much smaller. It is clear throughout these lectures that he means that any comprehensive account of the aesthetic would acknowledge the former, and not just—as a good number of philosophical accounts have so restricted themselves—the latter. By “entirely misunderstood”, it emerges in these lectures that he means both (1) that aesthetic questions are of a conceptual type very distinct from empirical questions and the kind of answer, or conceptual satisfaction, we want is very unlike what we might get from an experiment in empirical psychology, and (2) that the philosophically traditional method of essentialistic definition—determining the essence that all members of the class “works of art” exhibit and by virtue of which they are so classified—will conceal from our view more than it reveals.

In addition, Wittgenstein does not share the widespread methodological assumption that the question “Why is that a work of art?” will automatically apply to all cases generically, where the answer would always be to simply name the essence of art and then point out its presence in that particular case. Such questions do arise, but he shows that they arise only in particular contexts. He does not mention these cases, but for us such cases might be found art, driftwood art, multiple radios playing on a stage, specific-duration silence with a closed keyboard, nothing but black paint on a canvas, and so forth. And in those cases, the criteria for their answers will emerge in a context-specific way, often by revealing connections between the work in question and previous works in its genre, or by articulating the significance of the work in question for both works that preceded it and works that followed it. Similarly, he does not put forth general claims concerning, for example, the way that music in general is like language in general; instead, he observes particular cases in which one piece, or a movement, or a melodic phrase or rhythmic pattern, has more in common with spoken language than does another. Such analogies, for him, draw their life from the detailed consideration of particular cases, not from overarching generalities. In the case of music, any such aesthetic approach would require as a precondition both a cultivated grasp of the intricate details of a wide range of musical examples or cases, and a philosophical sensibility attuned to the conceptually clarifying role of particularity—both of which Wittgenstein himself possessed to an extraordinarily high degree.

1.1 Properties and Essence

It is also vividly apparent from the outset of his lectures on aesthetics that Wittgenstein is urging a heightened vigilance to the myriad ways in which words that function aesthetically can, on their grammatical surface, mislead. If, right at the beginning of an inquiry into the features of a work of music that most captivate us, we see that we use the word “beautiful” as an adjective, we may well very shortly find ourselves asking what is the essence of the property beauty that this particular case exhibits. This, in microcosm, is indicative of the larger Wittgensteinian approach: rather than moving from a particular case in front of us to a general or universal issue believed to be conceptually residing above it, we turn from the particular to the ever more particular. That is, by analogy, we move from the magnifying glass not to the telescope, but to the microscope. This kind of redirection is present throughout his writings on language, on mind, on perception, and indeed here on aesthetic perception and understanding. Imagining a book of philosophy investigating parts of speech (but very many more parts than we find in an ordinary grammar book) in which we would give very detailed and nuanced attention to “seeing”, “feeling”, along with other verbs of personal experience, and equally lengthy studies of “all”, “any”, “some”, numerals, first person pronoun usages, and so forth, he suggests that such a book would, with sufficient attention paid to the contextual intricacies of the grammar of each usage, lay bare the confusions into which language can lead us—where the way out of those confusions is always to move in the direction of detail, not generality. Later, in his Philosophical Investigations (1958, 2009), he will go on to develop the analogy between tools and language as a way of breaking the hold of the conceptual picture that words work in one way (by naming things—including the naming of properties, as in the way we too-quickly think of the problem of beauty above), showing the extensive diversity of kind and of use among the various things we find in the tool box (e.g., hammer, glue, chisel, matches). If we redirect our attention, away from the idée fixe of the puzzle concerning the common property named by the word “beauty” or the description “beautiful”, and look to the actual use to which our aesthetic-critical vocabulary is put, we will see that it is not some intrinsic meaning carried internally by the linguistic sign (BB: 4–12) that makes the word in question function as an aesthetic or critical interjection or expression of approval. We will, rather, be able to focus our redirected attention on what actually does make the word in question function aesthetically, i.e., “on the enormously complicated situation in which the aesthetic expression has a place”. And he adds that, with such an enlarged vision, we will see that “the expression itself has almost a negligible place” (BB: 2). He here mentions (seeing aesthetic issues as interwoven with the rest of philosophy) that if he had to identify the main mistake made in philosophical work of his generation, it would be precisely that of, when looking at language, focusing on the form of words, and not the use made of the form of words. He will go on to imply, if not quite to directly assert, that the parallel holds to the work of art: what we need, against contrary and methodologically entrenched intellectual impulses, is to see that work of art within a larger frame of reference, to see it in comparison to other works of the artist in question, and to see it juxtaposed with still other works from its cultural context. Taken together, this is to see what role the work of art played in the dialogically unfolding artistic “language-game”^[1] of its time and place. In using language, he says next in the lectures, in understanding each other—and in mastering a language initially—we do not start with a small set of words or a single word, but rather we start from specific occasions and activities. Our aesthetic engagements are occasions and activities of precisely this kind; thus aesthetics, as a field of conceptual inquiry, should for Wittgenstein start not from a presumption that the central task is to analyze the determinant properties that are named by aesthetic predicates, but rather from a full-blooded consideration of the activities of aesthetic life. It is instructive in this sense to consider the large number of musical experiences that are documented in his own remarks as they are woven throughout all of his life’s writings and the frequent mentions of those experiences in his correspondence with others and in the writings, diaries, and notebooks of his close friends and companions (Pinsent 1990: passim); taken together, these give a good picture of the deep well of musical and aesthetic experience from which Wittgenstein was drawing. Reading these lectures, one can come away with the idea that they are about, exclusively, his thoughts and remarks on aesthetics as a sub-discipline of philosophy. They are not: they are, in fact and beyond what they explicitly say, articulating an entire approach to the philosophy of culture, our understanding and absorption of it, and the way we cultivate a sensibility within it.

1.2 Predicates and Rules

But the adjectival form of many—not all—critical predicates quickly reinforces the “property-with-name” model, and against this Wittgenstein places examples from musical and poetical criticism, where we simply call attention to the rightness of a transition or to the precision or aptness of an image. And it is here that Wittgenstein reminds us that descriptions such as “stately”, “pompous”, or “melancholy” (where the latter is said of a Schubert piece) are like giving the work a face (see Shiner 1978), or we could instead (or in further specification of such descriptions) use gestures.^[2] In cases of re-construing a work (e.g., resituating the emphases in the meter of a poem as we read it) so that we understand its rhythm and structure anew, we make gestures, facial expressions, and non-descriptive-predicate based remarks, where aesthetic adjectives play a diminished role—or no role at all. And we show our approval of a tailor’s work not by describing the suit, but by wearing it. Wittgenstein’s fundamental point here is that occasions and activities are fundamental, descriptive language secondary. In these lectures Wittgenstein needs more examples than he gives (although he does give many throughout other writings), but one could capture the point here by considering the example of a conductor showing the thematic force of the opening of Beethoven’s Fifth Symphony, and being fully understood by the orchestra, without ever using the word “forceful.” Similarly, one can imagine Morandi completing a painting, and that painting’s distinctive atmosphere being comprehended by viewers of it, without anyone ever using the word “timeless.” Indeed, one might use those words later, but the conveyed sense of the work is not invariably dependent on a “word first, then perception” model of aesthetic responsiveness. Aesthetic words can, of course, open avenues of perception, but the implicit point at this stage in these lectures is that the relations between words and perceptions are not reducible to a uniform formula. Always aware of contextual variance, Wittgenstein is reminding us that some cases, however uniform, do not predict all cases.

Wittgenstein turns to the subject of rules, and rule-following, in aesthetic decision-making. This stems from his reflection on the word “correct” in aesthetic discourse, and he mentions the case of being drilled in harmony and counterpoint. Such rule-learning, he claims, allows what he calls an interpretation of the rules in particular cases, where an increasingly refined judgment comes from an increasingly refined mastery of the rules in question. It is of particular interest that a qualification is entered here, that such rules in contexts of artistic creativity and aesthetic judgment, “may be extremely explicit and taught, or not formulated at all” (LA: 5 n. 3). This strongly suggests that, in this way too, actions come first, where these actions may (to invoke Kant’s famous distinction) either explicitly follow from the rule, or stand in accordance with them but (for Wittgenstein) in an inexplicit way. The mastery of a practice can be, but need not be, characterized as a cognitive matter of rule-following. Here we thus find one of the points of intersection between Wittgenstein’s work in aesthetics and his work in the philosophy of language: the rule-following considerations (Holtzman & Leich 1981; McDowell 1998b) and the debate concerning non-cognitivism (McDowell 1998a) link directly to this discussion. These issues also connect to questions concerning creativity in language (where such creativity is often aesthetic in nature) and how that form of creativity can cast light on artistic creativity (Grève & Mácha [eds] 2016). This in turns opens up another way of seeing the connection between the arts, particularly music, and language: it is not necessarily only that a theme must exhibit a linguistically expressive character for the art-language analogy to hold, but also that the creativity that occurs within spoken and written language may be parallel to the kinds of creativity that manifest within the creative aesthetic imagination. For one example, the creative flair that one finds in some works of serial or twelve-tone composition (Hagberg 2011) can stand parallel to the creativity one recognizes in a poet working within the constraints of a rhyme scheme, or on a broader scale, a novelist finding an inventive way of putting words together while still working inside the constraints of coherence-preserving syntax.

Regrettably, Wittgenstein closes this matter prematurely (somewhat implausibly claiming that this issue should not come in at this point); the linkage between rule-following in language and in aesthetics is still to this day too little investigated. Yet there is a sense in which Wittgenstein extends the discussion, if only implicitly. In investigating the kinds of things meant by aesthetic “appreciation”, he does say that “an appreciator is not shown by the interjections he uses” but rather by his choices, selections, and his actions on specific occasions. To describe what appreciation consists in, he claims, would prove an impossibility, for “to describe what it consists in we would have to describe the whole environment” (LA: 7), and he returns to the case of the tailor—and thus implicitly to rule-following. Such rules, as we discern them in action ranging on a continuum from the cognitively-explicit and linguistically encapsulated to the non-cognitively implicit and only behaviorally manifested, have a life—have an identity as rules—within, and only within, those larger contexts of engagement, those “whole environment[s]”. And those environments, those contexts, those language-games, are not reducible to a unitary kind which we then might analyze for essential properties: “correctness”, for example, plays a central role in some cases of aesthetic appreciation and understanding, and it is irrelevant in others, e.g., in garment-cutting versus Beethoven symphonies, or in domestic architecture versus the Gothic cathedral. And he explicitly draws, if too briefly, the analogy that emerges here between ethics and aesthetics: he notes the difference between saying of a person that he behaves well versus saying that a person made a great or profound impression. Indeed, “the entire game is different” (LA: 8). It is important to see here that, for Wittgenstein, the relation between aesthetics and ethics is not additive in character, that is, it is not that one first has a hermetically sealed aesthetic act and then one superadds ethical content to it, or one layers over it merely superadded ethical content. Rather, the ethical and the aesthetic are for Wittgenstein intertwined from the outset, where ethical content may be integral to the aesthetic act from its inception and inseparable from the context within which that aesthetic act has its meaning, its life. And so aesthetic descriptions and the language we use to interact with, to appreciate, to understand, or to create works of art may intrinsically house ethical aspects, just as our ethical language may inseparably interweave aesthetic aspects.

1.3 Culture and Complexity

The central virtue of these lectures is that Wittgenstein never loses a sense of the complexity of our aesthetic engagements, our language attending those engagements, and the contextually embedded nature of the aesthetic actions he is philosophically working to elucidate. Nor does he lose a sense of the relation—a relation necessary to the meaning of the aesthetic language we use—between the aesthetically-descriptive expressions we employ within highly particularized contexts and the much larger intellectual and cultural atmosphere surrounding those contexts, “what we call the culture of the period” (LA: 8). Of those aesthetic words, he says, “To describe their use or to describe what you mean by a cultured taste, you have to describe a culture” (LA: 8). That is, the one resides within the other. And once again making the relation between his work in the philosophy of language and his work in the philosophy of art explicit (if again too briefly), he adds, “What belongs to a language game is a whole culture” (LA: 8). And here the link to the irreducible character of rule-following is made once again as well: “To describe a set of aesthetic rules fully means really to describe the culture of a period” (LA: 8, n. 3). If our aesthetic engagements and the interrelated uses of our aesthetic terms are widely divergent and context-sensitive, so are our aesthetic actions and vocabularies context-sensitive in a larger sense or within a larger frame as well: comparing a cultured taste of fin-de-siecle Vienna or early-twentieth-century Cambridge with the Middle Ages, he says—implicitly referring to the radically divergent constellations of meaning-associations from one age to the other, “An entirely different game is played in different ages” (LA: 8). Of a generic claim made about a person that he or she appreciates a given style or genre of art, Wittgenstein makes it clear that he would not yet know—stated in that generic, case-transcending way—not merely whether it was true or not, but more interestingly and more deeply, what it meant to say this. The word “appreciates” is, like the rest of our aesthetic vocabulary, not detachable from the particular context within which it has its life.^[3] If, against this diversity or context-sensitivity, we seek to find and then analyze what all such cases of aesthetic engagement have in common, we might well focus on the word “appreciation”. But that word will not have meaning with a bounded determinacy that is fixed prior to its contextualized use—which means that we would find ourselves, because of this philosophical strategy (recall he claimed that the entire field “is very big and entirely misunderstood”), in a double bind: first, we would not know the meaning of the term upon which we were focusing; and second, we would, in trying to locate what all cases of aesthetic engagement have in common, leave out of view what he calls in this connection “an immensely complicated family of cases” (LA: 10), blinding ourselves to nuance and complexity in the name of a falsifying neatness and overarching generality.

In order to get clear about aesthetic words you have to describe ways of living. We think we have to talk about aesthetic judgments like “This is beautiful”, but we find that if we have to talk about aesthetic judgments, we don’t find these words at all, but a word used something like a gesture, accompanying a complicated activity. (LA: 11)

The reference to gesture is illuminating, because a gesture is relationally constituted, that is, the significance of any given gesture is determined by the context of its usage. Waving one’s arm, for example, can have a hundred different meanings depending on what the waving is for, what its pragmatic force is. The idea that all arm wavings must have the same meaning because they are physically indistinguishable from context to context is not only obviously and glaringly false. It is also an idea that would systematically omit everything of communicative interest. For Wittgenstein, the innumerable words of aesthetic appreciation and artistic creativity function in the same deeply contextualized, pragmatic, and culture-saturated way.

2. The Critique of Scientism

Wittgenstein turns to the idea of a science of aesthetics, an idea for which he has precious little sympathy (“almost too ridiculous for words” [LA: 11]). But as is often the case in Wittgenstein’s philosophical work, it does not follow from this scornful or dismissive attitude that he has no interest in the etiology of the idea, or in excavating the hidden steps or components of thought that have led some to this idea. Often in his philosophical work, verifying or falsifying an idea is the easier part; understanding in conceptually-microscopic detail how one might be led into the idea is for him both far more demanding and far more interesting. In the ensuing discussion he unearths a picture of causation that under-girds the very idea of a scientific explanation of aesthetic judgment or preference. And in working underground in this way, he reveals the analogies to cases of genuine scientific explanation, where the “tracing of a mechanism” just is the process of giving a causal account, i.e., where the observed effect is described as the inevitable result of prior links in the causal chain leading to it. If, to take his example, an architect designs a door and we find ourselves in a state of discontentment because the door, within the larger design of the façade (within its stylistic “language-game”, we might say), is too low, we are liable to describe this on the model of scientific explanation. Then, we make a substantive of the discontent, see it as the causal result of the lowness of the door, and in identifying the lowness as the cause, think ourselves able to dislodge the inner entity, the discontent, by raising the door. Some might see this reduction to a simple cause-and-effect model (indeed many modern experimental-psychological studies of aesthetic responses are based on this model) as conceptual clarification, but in truth this only mischaracterizes our real aesthetic reactions, or what we might call, by analogy to moral psychology, our actual aesthetic psychology.

2.1 Aesthetic Reactions

The true aesthetic reaction—itself rarely described in situ in terms of a proximate cause (“In these cases the word ‘cause’ is hardly ever used at all” [LA: 14]) is far more immediate, and far more intertwined with, and related to, what we see in^[4] the work of art in question. “It is a reaction analogous to my taking my hand away from a hot plate” (LA: 14). He thus says:

To say: “I feel discomfort and know the cause”, is entirely misleading because “know the cause” normally means something quite different. How misleading it is depends on whether when you said: “I know the cause”, you meant it to be an explanation or not. “I feel discomfort and know the cause” makes it sound as if there were two things going on in my soul—discomfort and knowing the cause. (LA: 14)

But there is, as he next says, a “Why?” to such a case of aesthetic discomfort, if not a cause (on the conventional simplified-scientific, cause-and-effect model). But both the question and its multiform answers can take significantly different forms in different cases. Again, if what he suggested before concerning the importance of context for the determination of meaning is correct, the very meaning of the “Why?”-question will vary case to case. It is important to note that this is not a weaker thesis concerning variation on the level of inflection, where the underlying structure of the “Why?”-question is causal. No, here again that unifying, model-imposing manner of proceeding would leave out a consideration of the nuances that give the “Why?”-question its determinate sense in the first place. The meaning of the “Why?” question, indeed like the meaning of the word “why”, is not invariant across differing contexts and cases of its employment. Similarly, the criteria to which we appeal in any such particular case will not prove invariant either. And of his phrase, “makes it sound as if there were two things going on in my soul”, the discomfort as one psychic entity, and the knowledge of the cause as another: that bifurcation does invite the causal model, and it invites a question about the relation between the two psychic entities along with a correlative explanatory system that would try to explain mental states and responses in the way we explain the interactions of billiard balls. The model, Wittgenstein sees here, can be inviting for its simplicity and uniformity across cases—but it either oversimplifies or falsifies our actual experienced mental phenomenology.

But again, Wittgenstein’s fundamental concern here is to point out the great conceptual gulf that separates aesthetic perplexities from the methodology of empirical psychology. To run studies of quantified responses to controlled and isolated aesthetic stimuli, where emergent patterns of preference, response, and judgment are recorded within a given population’s sample, is to pass by the true character of the aesthetic issue: the actual puzzlement concerning an aesthetic response or reaction, if we feel such puzzlement, will be conceptual, not empirical. And so here again we see a direct link between his lectures on aesthetics and his far more extensive work in the philosophy of psychology: the penultimate passage of Part II of Philosophical Investigations (PI: II, §xiv), was

The existence of the experimental method makes us think we have the means of solving the problems which trouble us; though problem and method pass one another by. (PI: II, iv, 232)

He says, near the close of this part of his lectures on aesthetics,

Aesthetic questions have nothing to do with psychological experiments, but are answered in an entirely different way. (LA: 17)

A stimulus-response model adapted from scientific psychology—what we might in our present period call the naturalizing of aesthetics—falsifies the genuine complexities of aesthetic psychology through a methodologically enforced reduction to one narrow and unitary conception of aesthetic engagement. For Wittgenstein, it is a nuanced grasp of relevant particularity and complexity, and not reduction to a presumed unitary essence, that paves the way to genuine conceptual clarification. Reduction to a simplified model, by contrast, yields only the illusion of clarification in the form of conceptual incarceration (“a picture held us captive”).^[5]

2.2 The “Click” of Coherence

Aesthetic satisfaction, for Wittgenstein, is an experience that is only possible within a culture and where the reaction that constitutes aesthetic satisfaction or justification is both more immediate, and vastly larger and more expansive, than any simple mechanistic account could accommodate. It is more immediate in that it is not usually possible to specify in advance the exact conditions required to produce the satisfaction, or, as he discusses it, the “click” when everything falls into place. Such exacting pre-specifications for satisfaction are possible in narrowly restricted empirical cases where, for example, we wait for two pointers in a vision examination to come into a position directly opposite each other. And this, Wittgenstein says, is the kind of simile we repeatedly use, but misleadingly, for in truth “really there is nothing that clicks or that fits anything” (LA: 19). The satisfaction is more immediate, then, than the causal-mechanistic model would imply. And it is much broader than the causal-mechanistic model implies or could accommodate as well: there is no direct aesthetic analogue to the matched pointers in the case of a larger and deeper form of aesthetic gratification. Wittgenstein does, of course, allow that there are very narrow, isolated circumstances within a work where we do indeed have such empirical pre-specifiable conditions for satisfaction (e.g., where in a piece of music we see that we wanted to hear a minor ninth, and not a minor seventh, chord). But, contrary to the empirical-causal account, these will not add up, exhaustively or without significant remainder, to the experience of aesthetic satisfaction. The problem, to which Wittgenstein repeatedly returns in these lectures, is with the kind of answer we want to aesthetic puzzlement as expressed in a question like “Why do these bars give me such a peculiar impression?” (LA: 20) In such cases, statistical results regarding percentages of subjects who report this peculiar impression rather than another one in precisely these harmonic, rhythmic, and melodic circumstances are not so much impossible as just beside the point; the kind of question we have here is not met by such methods.

The sort of explanation one is looking for when one is puzzled by an aesthetic impression is not a causal explanation, not one corroborated by experience or by statistics as to how people react…. This is not what one means or what one is driving at by an investigation into aesthetics. (LA: 21)

It is all too easy to falsify, under the influence of explanatory models misappropriated from what is itself an oversimplified conception of science, the many and varied kinds of things that happen when, aesthetically speaking, everything seems to click or fall into place. Although this may seem at first glance a fairly circumscribed point, i.e., that an oversimplifying model of cause-and-effect relations misappropriated from experimental empirical psychology is misleading, it is actually a quite large point, for it reorients our expectations concerning how questions of aesthetic experience and aesthetic responses should be both asked and answered.

2.3 The Charm of Reduction

In the next passages of Wittgenstein’s lectures, he turns to a fairly detailed examination of the distinct charm, for some, of psycho-analytic explanation, and he interweaves this with the distinction between scientific-causal explanation of an action versus motive-based (or personally-generated) explanations of that action. It is easy, but mistaken, to read these passages as simply subject-switching anticipations of his lectures on Freud to follow. But his fundamental interest here lies with the powerful charm, a kind of conceptual magnetism, of reductive explanations that promise a brief, compact, and propositionally-encapsulated account of what some much larger field of thought or action “really” is. (He cites the example of boiling Redpath, one of his auditors, down to ashes, and then saying “This is all Redpath really is”, adding the remark “Saying this might have a certain charm, but would be misleading to say the least” (LA: 24). “To say the least” indeed: the example is striking precisely because one can feel the attraction of an encapsulating and simplifying reduction of the bewildering and monumental complexity of a human being, while at the same time feeling, as a human being, that any such reduction to a few physical elements would hardly capture the essence of a person. Rather, it misses everything that is part and parcel of humanity itself. This, he observes, is an explanation of the “This is only really this” form. Reductive causal explanations function in precisely the same way in aesthetics, and this links directly to the problems in philosophical methodology that he adumbrated in the Blue and Brown Books (BB: 17–19), particularly where he discusses what he calls “the craving for generality” and the attendant “contemptuous attitude toward the particular case”. If the paradigm of the sciences (which themselves, as he observes in passing, carry an imprimatur of epistemic prestige and the image of incontrovertibility) is Newtonian mechanics, and we then implant that model under our subsequent thinking about psychology, we will almost immediately arrive at an idea of a science of the mind, where that science would progress through the gradual accumulation of psychological laws. (This would constitute, as he memorably puts it, a “mechanics of the soul” [LA: 29]). With this background, we then dream of a psychological science of aesthetics, where—although “we’d not thereby have solved what we feel to be aesthetic puzzlement” (LA: 29)—we may find ourselves able to predict (borrowing the criterion of predictive power from science) what effect a given line of poetry, or a given musical phrase, may have on a certain person whose reaction patterns we have studied. This would be a science of art’s power and of aesthetic responses. But aesthetic puzzlement, again, is of a different kind, and here he takes a major step forward, from the critical to the constructive phase of his lectures. He writes, “What we really want, to solve aesthetic puzzlements, is certain comparisons—grouping together of certain cases” (LA: 29). Such a method, such an approach, would never so much as occur to us were we to remain both dazzled by the misappropriated model of mechanics and contemptuous of the particular case. This too is of fundamental importance in understanding aesthetic experience, because the very concept of comparison shifts our attention from one particular artifact or work to the relations between them; that is, rather than assuming that everything that is to be seen in a work is internally contained within that work, we look up and around—we look at the work in a comparative-relational context. Properties and qualities of works of art and music do not invariably display themselves in an internally-bounded way. Often it is only by comparative or cross-work consideration that some of those properties or qualities emerge to a visible or audible degree. To focus our attention exclusively on a single work unto itself in a bounded way is often, against strictly formalistic intuitions or presuppositions, not to see that work for what it is or all that it is.

3. The Comparative Approach

Comparison, and the intricate process of grouping together certain cases—where such comparative juxtaposition usually casts significant features of the work or works in question in higher relief, where it leads to the emergence of an organizational gestalt,^[6] where it shows the evolution of a style, or where it shows what is strikingly original about a work, among many other things—also focuses our attention on the particular case in another way. In leading our scrutiny to critically and interpretatively relevant particularities, it leads us away from the aesthetically blinding presumption that it is the effect, brought about by the “cause” of that particular work, that matters (so that any minuet that gives a certain feeling or awakens certain images would do as well as any other). Wittgenstein’s point here speaks both of his work in aesthetics and his approach to philosophical problems more generally as we see it throughout Philosophical Investigations: by giving sufficient attention to particulars, the larger question that motivated our selection of the particular case at hand in the first place begins to evaporate, due to what gradually reveals itself to be a disorienting over-generality. It is not so much that the particular case illustrates or answers the general question, but rather that the focus on the contextually-specific relevant details of the particular case seriously challenge the intelligibility of that over-general question.

3.1 Critical Reasoning

These foregoing matters taken together lead to what is central to Wittgenstein’s thoughts on aesthetics. In observing that on one hearing of a minuet we may get a lot out of it and on the next hearing nothing, he is showing how easy it can be to take conceptual missteps in our aesthetic thought from which it can prove difficult to recover. From such a difference, against how we can all too easily model the matter, it does not follow that what we get out of the minuet is independent of the minuet. That would constitute an imposition of a Cartesian dualism between the two ontologies of mind and matter, but in its aesthetic guise. And that would lead in turn to theories of aesthetic content of a mental kind, where the materials of the art form (materials we would then call “external” materials) only serve to carry the real, internal or non-physical content. Criticism would thus be a process of arguing inferentially from outward evidence back to inward content; creation would be a process of finding outward correlates or carriers for that prior inward content; and artistic intention would be articulated as a full mental pre-conception of the contingently finished (or “externalized”, as we would then call it) work. It is no accident that Wittgenstein immediately moves to the analogy to language and our all-too-easy misconception of linguistic meaning, where we make “the mistake of thinking that the meaning or thought is just an accompaniment of the word, and the word doesn’t matter” (LA: 25). This indeed would prove sufficient to motivate contempt for the particular case in aesthetic considerations, by misleadingly modeling a dualistic vision of art upon an equally misleading dualistic model of language (Hagberg 1995). “The sense of a proposition”, he says, “is very similar to the business of an appreciation of art” (LA: 29). This might also be called a subtractive model, and Wittgenstein captures this perfectly with a question:

A man may sing a song with expression and without expression. Then why not leave out the song—could you have the expression then? (LA: 32 editorial note and footnote.)

Such a model corresponds, again, to mind-matter Cartesian dualism, which is a conceptual template that also, as we have just seen above, manifests itself in the philosophy of language where we would picture the thought as an inner event and the external word or sign to which it is arbitrarily attached as that inner event’s outward corresponding physicalization. It is no surprise that, in this lecture, he turns directly to false and imprisoning pictures of this dualism in linguistic meaning, and then back to the aesthetic case. When we contemplate the expression of a drawn face, it is deeply misleading—or deeply misled, if the dualistic picture of language stands behind this template-conforming thought—to ask for the expression to be given without the face. “The expression”—now linking this discussion back to the previous causal considerations — “is not an effect of the face”. The template of cause-and-effect, and of a dualism of material and expressive content (on the subtractive model), and the construal of the material work of art as a means to the production of a separately-identifiable intangible, experiential end, are all out of place here. On such a model, the materials of art are mere delivery vehicles, with the valuable content—of a differing ontological order—the abstract target of our aesthetic attention. All of the examples Wittgenstein gives throughout these lectures combat these false pictures, each in their own way. And so, this too connects Wittgenstein’s thinking in aesthetics to his much larger philosophical project: examples are not illustrations of pre-identified philosophical content. Rather, they reveal what we might have missed on a more abstract level; they possess the power to direct the inquiry and not merely illustrate it; and they make visible the practices, the contexts, that give our words meaning and point. In his lectures here, we see that this is true of our aesthetic words, our vocabulary of appreciation and interpretation. In his more expansive philosophical inquiries, we see that this is true of words concerning the mind, concerning language, concerning action-description, and concerning philosophical methodology itself. Each example—in music, in visual art, in architecture, in music, and in literature and poetry, serves this purpose, just as do examples in his writings on language, mind, rule-following, intention, mathematics, certainty, and so forth.

But then Wittgenstein’s examples in the arts also work in concert: they together argue against a form of aesthetic reductionism that would pretend that our reactions to aesthetic objects are isolable, that they can be isolated as variables within a controlled experiment, that they can be hermetically sealed as the experienced effects of isolatable causes. He discusses our aesthetic reactions to subtle differences between differently drawn faces, and our equally subtle reactions to the height or design of a door (he is known to have had the ceiling in an entire room of the house in Vienna he designed for his sister moved only a few inches when the builders failed to realize his plan with sufficient exactitude). The enormous subtlety, and the enormous complexity, of these reactions, are a part of—and are as complicated as—our natural history. He gives as an example the error, or the crudeness, of someone responding to a complaint concerning the depiction of a human smile (specifically, that the smile did not seem genuine), with the reply that, after all, the lips are only parted one one-thousandths of an inch too much: such differences, however small in measure, in truth matter enormously. His architecture for his sister shows this; his intricate and intimate responsiveness to the arts and especially to music show this; and his entire philosophy of language shows this.

3.2 Seeing Connections

Beneath Wittgenstein’s examples, as developed throughout these lectures, lies another interest (which presses its way to the surface and becomes explicit on occasion): he is eager to show the significance of making connections in our perception and understanding of art works—connections between the style of a poet and that of a composer (e.g., Keller and Brahms), between one musical theme and another, between one expressive facial depiction and another, between one period of an artist’s work and another. Such connections—we might, reviving a term from first-generation Wittgensteinians, refer to the kind of work undertaken to identify and articulate such connections as “connective analysis”—are, for Wittgenstein, at the heart of aesthetic experience and aesthetic contemplation. And they again are of the kind that reductive causal explanation would systematically miss. In attempting to describe someone’s feelings, could we do better than to imitate the way the person actually said the phrase we found emotionally revelatory, Wittgenstein pointedly asks? The disorientation we would feel in trying to describe the person’s feeling with subtlety and precision without any possibility of imitating his precise expressive utterance — “the way he said it”—shows how very far the dualistic or subtractive conceptual template is from our human experience, our natural history, our mode and patterns of attention.

Connections, of the kind alluded to here—a web of variously-activated relations between the particular aspect of the work to which we are presently attending and other aspects, other parts of the work, or other works, groups of works, or other artists, genres, styles, or other human experiences in all their particularity—may include what we call associations awakened by the work, but connections are not reducible to them only (and certainly not to undisciplined, random, highly subjective, or free associations).^[7] The impossibility of the simplifying subtractive template emerges here as well:

Suppose [someone says]: “Associations are what matter—change it slightly and it no longer has the same associations”. But can you separate the associations from the picture, and have the same thing?

The answer is clearly, again like the case of singing with and then without expression above, negative:

You can’t say: “That’s just as good as the other: it gives me the same associations”. (LA: 34)

Here again, Wittgenstein shows the great gulf that separates what we actually do with, what we actually say about, works of art, and how we would speak of them if the conceptual pictures and templates with which he has been doing battle were correct. To extend one of Wittgenstein’s examples, we would very much doubt the aesthetic discernment, and indeed the sympathetic imagination and the human connectedness, of a person who said of two poems (each of which reminded him of death) that either will do as well as the other to a bereaved friend, that they would do the same thing (where this is uttered in a manner dismissive of nuance, or as though it is being said of two detergents). Poetry, Wittgenstein is showing, does not play that kind of role in our lives, as the nature and character of our critical verbal interactions about it indicate. And he ascends, momentarily, to a remark that characterizes his underlying philosophical methodology (or one dimension of it) in the philosophy of language that is being put to use here within the context of his lectures on aesthetics:

If someone talks bosh, imagine the case in which it is not bosh. The moment you imagine it, you see at once it is not like that in our case. (LA: 34)

The gulf that separates what we should say if the generalizing templates were accurate from what we in actual particularized cases do say could further call into question not only the applicability or accuracy, but indeed the very intelligibility or coherence, of the language used to express those templates, those explanatory pictures. Wittgenstein leaves that more aggressive, and ultimately more clarifying and conceptually liberating, critique for his work on language and mind in Philosophical Investigations and other writings, but one can see from these lectures alone how such an aggressive critique might be undertaken.

Also, the seeing of connections is often a matter of aspect-seeing, or seeing-as (as Wittgenstein discusses in in Philosophical Investigations, Part II, sec. xi). This is a discussion that he begins with a contrast between two senses of the verb “to see”, where in the first sense we see, for example, that a drawing on the blackboard is of a smiling face. The second sense is where we see a resemblance between two drawings of smiling faces on the blackboard. One can point to what one sees in the first case in a way that one cannot in the second; that is, while the recognition of the face does not call for connective or relational perception, the discernment of similarity between the two does. This part of Wittgenstein’s work has been discussed at some length (Kemp & Mras [eds] 2016), and these issues are often rightly taken to be central to his larger conception of aesthetic perception and understanding.

3.3 The Attitude Toward the Work of Art

Near the end of his lectures Wittgenstein turns to the question of the attitude we take toward the work of art. He employs the case of seeing the very slight change (of the kind mentioned above) in the depiction of a smile within a picture of a monk looking at a vision of the Virgin Mary. Where the slight and subtle change of line yields a transformation of the smile of the monk from a kindly to an ironic one, our attitude in viewing might similarly change from one in which for some we are almost in prayer to one that would for some be blasphemous, where we are almost leering. He then gives voice to his imagined reductive interlocutor, who says, “Well there you are. It is all in the attitude” (LA: 35), where we would then focus, to the exclusion of all of the rest of the intricate, layered, and complex human dimensions of our reactions to works, solely on an analysis of the attitude of the spectator and the isolable causal elements in the work that determine it. But that, again, is only to give voice to a reductive impulse, and in the brief ensuing discussion he shows, once again, that in some cases, an attitude of this kind may emerge as particularly salient. But in other cases, not. And he shows, here intertwining a number of his themes from these lectures, that the very idea of “a description of an attitude” is itself no simple thing. Full-blooded human beings, and not stimulus-response-governed automata, have aesthetic experience, and that experience is as complex a part of our natural history as any other serious mode of human engagement.

The complexity of the perceiving mind in aesthetic experience has been discussed with increasing frequency in recent years (Gibson & Huemer [eds] 2004; Bru, Huemer, & Steuer [eds] 2013); the emphasis placed on this by Wittgenstein, across a broad range of individual comments in his writings, has broken up the simplifying picture of a monolithic or standardized perceptual experience that we all have in common in, say, looking at a painting or listening to a piece of music or reading a poem or novel. For Wittgenstein, the sensibility of the viewer, listener, or reader is one essential part of what is required to fully understand the depth and complexity of aesthetic experience and its role in human life. Just as Wittgenstein said above that what we might initially think of as an isolated case of aesthetic perception or experience can only be truly seen within the larger frame of a culture, so here we see him emphasizing that we can only describe a moment of aesthetic interpretation by seeing it within the larger frame of a sensibility.

Wittgenstein ends the lectures discussing a simple heading: “the craving for simplicity” (LA: 36). To such a mind, he says, if an explanation is complicated, it is disagreeable for that very reason. A certain kind of mind will insist on seeking out the single, unitary essence of the matter, where—much like Russell’s atomistic search for the essence of the logic of language beneath what he regarded as its misleadingly and distractingly variegated surface—the reductive impulse would be given free reign. A traditional reading of Wittgenstein’s early work in the Tractatus (1921/1922) claims that in that early work he followed in that reductive/analytic vein (although there has emerged more recently an alternative interpretation of that early work that brings out the connections between that and his later work from The Blue Book forward). In any case, in these lectures, delivered in 1938, we see a profound philosophical mind that has worked itself free from oversimplifying templates, from reductive conceptual pictures. Here, as in all of his work from this point forward, examples themselves do a good deal of philosophical work, and their significance is that they give, rather than merely illustrate, the philosophical point at hand. He said, earlier in these lectures, that he is trying to teach a new way of thinking about aesthetics—and indeed about philosophy itself.

The subject of aesthetics, as he said in his opening line, is to his way of seeing both very big and entirely misunderstood. It is very big in its scope—in the reach of the aesthetic dimension throughout human life. But we can now, at the end of his lectures on aesthetics, see that it is a big subject in other senses too: aesthetics is conceptually expansive in its important linkages to the philosophy of language, to the philosophy of mind, to ethics, and to other areas of philosophy, and it resists encapsulation into a single, unifying problem. It is a multi-faceted, multi-aspected human cultural phenomenon where connections, of diverging kinds, are more in play than causal relations. The form of explanation we find truly satisfying will thus strikingly diverge from the form of explanation in science—the models of explanation in Naturwissenschaften are misapplied in Geisteswissenschaften, and the viewing of the latter through the lens of the former will yield reduction, exclusion, and ultimately distortion. The humanities are thus, for Wittgenstein, in this sense autonomous.

4. The Aesthetic Significance of the Later Writings

Again, the aesthetic dimension of life was, for Wittgenstein, nothing less than fundamental to what it means to live the life of a human being, and throughout his writings that extend far beyond his lectures explicitly on aesthetics, we see continuous reflections on and connections to the arts, music, and aesthetic experience. And these remarks move varyingly in two directions: some move from a philosophical point or observation concerning linguistic usage, mind, or meaning, to an example in the arts that shows that point or observation in aesthetic form; one would naturally expect this. But as often, or perhaps more often, Wittgenstein perhaps less expectedly moves in the other direction, employing a case from the arts and our experience of them to the parallel or related philosophical point; that is, he learns from an example in the arts first and then applies that to, or assesses the implications of, that example or case for the conceptual clarification of philosophical issues concerning language, mind, and meaning. Then in addition, his later writings often hold quite deep significance for aesthetics, if not directly stated.

4.1 The Blue Book, Meaning, and the Arts

This compact book opens with the question, “What is the meaning of a word?” (BB: 1), and in it Wittgenstein quickly shows that he is combatting a reductive impulse that would oversimplify the conception of meaning and reduce it to a conceptually neat model (one version of suggests that meaning is reducible to ostensive definition, to the direct relation between a word as a name the thing to which that name refers) that would see context-invariance as a virtue (where Wittgenstein sees it to be a blinding simplification that misses far more than it captures). What we see here is that it would prove impossible for Wittgenstein (or for that matter anyone) to both command the rich, subtle, and perception-shaping vocabulary that we bring to our engagement with and in the arts and subscribe to any such reductive model. Wittgenstein repeatedly reminds us of the way words actually work in contexts of human interaction, and he insists that the road to conceptual clarity is to accept, and ever further explore, the true complexity of that rather than proceeding on the assumption that there must be a hidden essence of word-meaning lying beneath all the variability on when we then will think of as its surface. One can see in these pages an excavation and removal of the presuppositions of positivism, the view that would reduce ethical and aesthetic language to either meaningless verbiage or mere emotive expressions that are neither true nor false. Here, indeed, Wittgenstein is moving from the observable intricacies of our verbal practices—our life in language—to philosophy, and part of that lesson for the broader philosophy of language of course applies with equal force to our aesthetic language. What he shows as he progresses here is that the plausibility of any reductive conception of meaning diminishes as our grasp of the particularities of actual usage increases.

One conception that is both implicitly and explicitly critiqued in this book is that of atomism—basically the idea that a sentence is composed of independently-meaningful word-units, and so that the meaning of a sentence is an additive combination of those “atoms” (BB: 2–7). Here he interweaves his discussion with the analogous musical case: a coherent melody is quite evidently not a mere concatenation of notes, no more than a coherent sentence is a “word salad” or a mere concatenation of isolated words. Indeed, the very idea of “adding up” notes to see what melody those atom-notes create strains coherence—this model is so foreign to our experience of musical comprehension and melodic sense-making that the concept of adding-up as applied to thematic sense in music seems like a category mistake. Simply put, we see here that neither linguistic nor melodic understanding work like that; the same point could be made concerning individual brushstrokes and a painting.

Another aspect of Wittgenstein’s work in this book holding immediate relevance for our understanding of the arts and aesthetic experience is his discussion of the question of what he here calls the sign and its life, in effect the word and its meaning. He shows how powerfully misleading a dualistic schema can become when we structure questions of meaning upon it, that is, how easily we can misconstrue what we take to be incontrovertible facts of the case by assuming from the outset that the “life-giving” content of a sign, a word, will be prior mental or intentional content on the part of a speaker or writer (BB: 4–7). On that classic mind/matter dichotomy, the ultimate determinant of meaning would invariably be pre-verbal cognition, and our model of correct interpretation would then follow accordingly. That is, ultimately correct or perfect interpretation would then be an exact recovery of private mental content, and any movement along a continuum of interpretation ranging from right to wrong would be determined by that interpretation’s degree of intentional retrieval. Throughout the Blue Book Wittgenstein carefully dismantles this dualistic model, showing both the power of its initial intuitive plausibility and its instructive failure to correspond to the phenomenological experience of working with and living within language. In that real language words interact in something analogous to chemical ways, they prove to be inflected and are in some cases transformed by context, they seem to dissolve into each other in a way that makes the atomistic model seem strangely scientistic, they creatively extend what we might have thought of as the bounds of sense, and they carry ranges of implication that are not contained within explicit intentional content and yet that are after the fact acknowledged by a speaker or writer as part of what they meant. The parallel for the arts is evident: if we construe the work of an artist in dualistic terms with mind preceding matter, then we picture the artistic intention as a full prefiguration of the resultant artwork—which is then seen as a contingent materialization of the prior cognitive content. Here again, any question of meaning will be referred to that content, and any question of interpretation will be judged by the extent to which it retrieves work-preceding intentional content (BB: 7–17). All of this is deeply misled: as non-dualistic aestheticians have suggested following the influence of Wittgenstein’s work, a great deal of creative thinking takes place in and with the materials of art, and intentional content is thus not, or not exclusively, a matter of pre-materiality cognition. And non-dualistically, two other facts of our practices emerge as well: (1) artists can suddenly see connections that seem implicit within the materials that are in a sense “waiting” to be discovered by them and integrate those connections into the work (e.g., the original Mozart scores show this, where we see his quill return to, for example, measure 14 and cross out and change that measure at the time he is writing measure 76 because of his sudden discernment of an internal thematic relation between 14 and 76), and (2) the materials themselves can seem, as we say in our evolved aesthetic language, to “speak” to themselves, to indicate to the artist where they “want to go”. Conversation, writing, and thinking in words, are all like this—and the arts are too. All of this comports with, and is in a sense within the implication range, of what Wittgenstein is uncovering in the Blue Book. For him, any theory of bifurcated mental acts and cognitive content prior to physical-material embodiment is to be in the grip of a radically oversimplifying picture. What we do with words, and what we do with the materials of art, are very different from what any such dualistic model would predict (Hagberg 2016b, 2016c).

Wittgenstein considers the example of a water-diviner saying “with this rod I feel in my hands that the water is five feet below the ground” (BB: 9–11). In terms of internally-contained sentential elements, we understand every word and the statement composed of them. And yet, the implications set in motion by these words are strangely disorienting: at that more broadly encompassing level, we do not understand. Aesthetic understanding—for instance the understanding of the significance and implications of a musical theme—functions at that higher, broader level. A musical theme, a series of brushstrokes, a poetic phrase, an architectural detail, a scene in film or theater, a sculptural curvilinear gesture in steel, a frozen moment in photography, can all exhibit artistic analogues of linguistic implicature; what we understand is not contained within nor reducible to those isolated elements. One way to express what Wittgenstein frequently states throughout this book is that we are to a greater extent speakers in language rather than speakers of language; that is, it is the complexly webbed relations of our words that make them what they are, and we can see much the same when considering both works of art, our reactions to them, and our lives with them.

Throughout the Blue Book, Wittgenstein identifies, and unearths the presuppositions in support of, what he calls the “contemptuous attitude toward the particular case.” Mistakenly believing that attitude to be methodologically appropriate for a philosophical analysis aiming, for example, at a trans-historical and universalized account of linguistic meaning, we find ourselves blinded to the specificities of particular linguistic contexts—from the level of a culture all the way down to an individual, that determine how meaning functions in that time, in that place, with those persons. An over-general account of meaning throughout the arts would make the parallel mistake. By contrast, an enriched comprehension of the nuanced particular, as it displays meaning-generating internal and external relations, will capture meaning in situ—for Wittgenstein, the only place that meaning exists (BB: 27–44).

4.2 Philosophical Investigations, the Mind, and the Arts

For Wittgenstein, philosophy is an activity, and he shows this perhaps most fully in Philosophical Investigations than anywhere else in his writings. This activity is carried out for him in a self-interrogative manner, sustaining a heightened vigilance concerning the misleading powers of hidden presuppositions, conceptual “pictures” or simplifying templates, the intellectual impulses that would lead us into polarized theories, false dichotomies, and, as we’ve seen in the Blue Book, overgeneralizations and the “contemptuous attitude.” These all manifest themselves in our answers to philosophical questions (as one sees throughout his writings), but it is in Philosophical Investigations that we see him most acutely assessing how these misleading habits of the philosophical mind can manifest themselves within the formulations of the questions themselves. Referring to “the multiplicity of language games” (PI: sec. 24) that we must keep in view (in this case concerning the practice of questioning), Wittgenstein suggests that without the multiplicity of our practices in view, we can be quickly motivated to ask questions such as “What is a question?”, where the answer on that level would apply to all particular cases. And without the parallel mindfulness concerning the multiplicity of our artistic practices, we can be quickly motivated to ask questions such as “What is a work of art?”, where that answer is then expected to apply with full explanatory power to narrower questions such as, “What is a work of music?” or “What is a work of literature?”. His point, itself made in a multiplicity of ways that actually resist reduction to a singular philosophical methodology, is that from this altitude we cannot see the kinds of meaning-determining relations of the kind mentioned just above in the Blue Book, and so like understanding each word of the water-diviner but not understanding the water-diviner, we can hear the words of these trans-contextual questions, but whether we richly understand them is another issue. Wittgenstein said that only aesthetic questions really gripped him; whether this was true, given his work on language, the mind, mathematics, certainty, and philosophical methodology, his point concerned highly particularized aesthetic questions with a granny particularity. To invent one such example, we might ask,

Why does that shaping of this four-measure melody, with the ascent emphasized with a crescendo, have a slightly emerging quality of smiling-through-tears that the same melody, emphasizing its descent, does not?

And for him, like questions of meaning in language, it is on this level of specificity that we will experience aesthetic understanding of a kind that is, indeed, gripping.

Also, throughout this book we see a sustained engagement with the intellectual impulses that would lead us into a mind/matter dualism that, in the case of language, would lead us to see language as the embodiment of cognitively prior and ontologically separable mental content that is only contingently externalized. Actual language, by contrast, is as much a part of our natural history as “walking, eating, drinking, playing” (PI: sec. 25). One way to express this point might be to say that many philosophers have treated language as though we are in the first instance disembodied, and so our language too comes from an immaterial, ghostly place that stands prior to, and again separable from, any living breathing person or groups of persons. The aesthetic parallel is evident: we would think of artistic creativity in dualistic terms where pre-creative ratiocination is the content, that is then only contingently made manifest—and so the sole criterion for accurate interpretation would be an attempt to get inside the head of the artist. But of the mind-in-action, he shows that we can only understand cases of meaning something, of willing, of intending, by situating those events into actual contexts of their manifestations—and in such contexts we do not “read” the manifestations as evidence for those hidden mental acts (PI: secs. 1, 9, 10, 20, 30, 35, 40, 41, 43, 120, 138, 139, 247, 532). Our perception and understanding of them do not comport with a dualistic model (Hagberg 1986). And artistic acts of creativity, of performance, of interpretation, do not conform to that model either. Like being in language rather than being in a sense behind it or using it as an externalizing tool from an inward distance, so artists are in the materials of art, in a dialogical creative interaction with those materials. And like words interacting, opening lines of implication that may have been preconceived and may not have been, so the materials of art have a life in the same way. Unearthing dualistic models of the mind and of language, as Wittgenstein does throughout Philosophical Investigations, holds immediate significance for our understanding of what we might call, emphasizing these parallels, the language of art.

However, calling it that should not desensitize us to the fact that one can see many places in Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Investigations (and other writings) where the arts, and for him particularly music, cast light onto our understanding of language (PI: secs. 295, 401, 518, 520, 523, 527; Pt II, 35, 38, 45–49, 51, 168, 195, 209–210, 260, 267, 367). The street travels both ways. Wittgenstein sees that what we might, from a higher perceptual altitude, say that we have the same melody used by different composers. That is, the same intervallic structure may be used, in the same rhythmic figure. But he sees that there is not really a bounded musical entity that is trans-contextually transplanted, because that musical “sentence”, although internally structurally identical, will have a different function, it will imply different harmony, it will suggest different variations beyond it, and it will thus convey a different sense. This is what he sees in music as casting light on language: what we might call “the same sentence” isn’t really that. Rather, the same sequence of words may recur, but those words in differing contexts perform different functions and deliver different services. The meaning of the melody will invariably and inseparably be context-bound; the same is true of (what we might call) the same sentence. The roles that they play is the question; atomistic word-meaning or phrase-meaning is instructively tone-deaf in both cases. Like a phrase in music, a phrase in language can do many different things, and Wittgenstein’s sustained attentiveness to the inflection-power of context brings this out in high relief in both art and language. Melodies can assert, proclaim, question, answer, reinforce, look back, promise, represent, motivate, show a way, develop an idea, establish a mood, inflect a mood, change a mood, redirect attention, summarize, expand upon, quietly close, and countless other things. All of the arts develop variations on these, and taken in toto they hold a great lesson for our understanding of what language is and how it functions. In possession of a culturally refined sensibility and the way that works of art “speak to each other”, Wittgenstein sees this everywhere.

In concert with the foregoing considerations, Wittgenstein in Philosophical Investigations looks into the notion, the concept, the idea, of thinking itself (PI: secs. 92–97, 110, 327–332, 339, 361, 383, 361, 574, 598, 686–690; Pt. II, 246, 248, 280, 281, 316–322). There is much to reflect upon in connection with aesthetics in these remarks, but in brief on can say that, consistent with his family-resemblance metaphor for general classes (e.g., knowledge, truth, meaning, and we can add here art, interpretation, and creativity), thinking does not have a single essence that all cases of thinking share. And, again in concert with the foregoing, just as speakers may think of what they are going to say but they do so in language and not, as we have seen, before it, so artists think in the materials of their artform and not before it. Thinking is thus, in a doubled sense, embodied from the outset: it is the thinking of a person in a context of inquiry, and it is a thinker thinking in the materials of thought, that is, language. And so again, the direct parallel in art presents itself: the thinking creator of art, the thinking performer, the thinking poet, the thinking conductor, etc., thinks in the materials that will manifest that thought. So as language comes first, so the materials of art come first in tandem. Wittgenstein speaks of the strength of Brahms’s melodic thought: this is a remark about the profundity of the thinking Brahms undertook in both imagined sound and in actual sound at the piano—that is, as imagined musical materials. And that is evident in his work—and nowhere else. This connects directly to Wittgenstein’s critique of the idea of a metaphysically private language, a language created wholly in a solipsistic interior, again prior to and separate from any (what we then call) external expression (PI: secs. 243–315). Language, he said, is the vehicle of thought; the same is true in the arts. The privacy of mind, viewed as sealed metaphysical interior, is for Wittgenstein (and after his work on the mind and on the private language considerations, many others) a philosophical myth. The artistic mind is no different. And so, what we might call the “soul” of a work of art is never discoverable in isolation.

4.3 The Philosophy of Culture

Wittgenstein sees a new word in a discussion, a conversation, and exchange, or a “conversation” with oneself, as a fresh seed sown on the ground of that discussion. That is, it quickly becomes a new “plant” with root, stalk, and branches growing out through ever-expanding webs of association (Hagberg, 2015). He saw creativity in music and the arts in parallel terms, and this image of the new seed provides the clue to the way he saw both the “soil” in which new work in the arts grows, and the way a work’s “roots” reach into, and draw nourishment from, a culture. Thus, for Wittgenstein the way to understand the significance of a work of art is to historically imagine our way into the culture in which it grew and in which it has its original meaning-determining relations and comparisons.^[8] And he speaks of the way in which a work of art can then live beyond its original context and reach out into new webs of relations, comparisons, and associations—but where some of the “spirit” of that original culture will nevertheless come with it (Wittgenstein 1980a, passim). This makes the work like a word that is a new seed and yet that carries, however submerged or invisible to a superficial glance, its etymological origin and evolution with it. And Wittgenstein sees that the multiple perspectives, multiple standpoints, from which we can “view” a word is itself an aesthetic phenomenon—that is, that we can see both word and work in varying frames of reference, varying contexts, and ultimately differing cultures (see Szabados 2014). It is for this reason that Wittgenstein takes similes in the philosophy of language so seriously; to articulate a likeness is to specify and demarcate meaning. And articulating a simile, be it linguistic or aesthetic, is a way of specifying how it is that we see both words and works in the contexts of their discourses. One might inquire, in the spirit of ordinary-language philosophy, into the occasion or particular instance of the employment of a word or phrase in order to specify or more deeply comprehend its meaning-content; works of art, for Wittgenstein, have occasions of their “utterance” as well. He sees that parallels of linguistic life are woven through our aesthetic practices; sense-making in one is very like sense-making in the other (Hagberg 2019a). To understand words at greater depth is to see them within the culture in which those words have their life; works of art are the same.

Wittgenstein’s extensive work of aspect-perception or seeing-as (PI: Pt. II, sec. xi) must also take an important place in considering his broader philosophy of culture: to see one thing in light of another is not the same as seeing that one thing (Hagberg 2010 and 2016a). For example, to hear a melody as a variation of another is very different from hearing simply that melody. One could insist that the sonic experience is identical—and in a reductive way it is. But the point is that these two hearings are dramatically different phenomenologically if not sonically: the variation is situated into what one might call an imagination-supported “double-hearing”. We hear what it is, and we “hear” its origin-melody behind it. Blown up to the grander scale of a culture-wide mode of perception, this is how Wittgenstein sees aesthetic understanding: it is imagination-assisted perception informed by cultural awareness. This case of hearing the melody as a variation is like an auditory simile; the visual arts and literature work in the same way.^[9] And so: to strip any work of art down to its internally-contained, non-relational, non-contextual qualities would be the aesthetic parallel of the atomistic, invariant, and transcontextual conception of word-meaning discussed above. Of course, to view or experience any work of art in a manner wholly focused on its internal properties and the internal relations between its parts is possible—but that exclusionary focus, once completed, will itself then reach out beyond its internal boundaries into the culture within which that internal-property analysis is contained (for example, the formalistic musical aesthetics of Eduard Hanslick, arguing for internal analysis, itself becomes more comprehensible when seen in the light of the broader intellectual impulses of Viennese culture at that time). For Wittgenstein, like words in the context of a culture’s linguistic practices, the richer qualities of a work will emerge when we see that work in the light of the culture that served as its soil.

5. Conclusion

Everything covered here concerning the impoverishing and blinding superimposition of conceptual models, templates, and pictures onto the extraordinarily rich world of aesthetic engagement gives further content to what Wittgenstein meant at the beginning of his lectures on aesthetics with the words “entirely misunderstood”. Throughout Wittgenstein’s development, culminating in the complexity-exploring project of Philosophical Investigations and other work on certainty and on the philosophy of psychology, Wittgenstein is unearthing the philosophical presuppositions of simplification-seeking philosophical undertakings. And throughout this work it is, as we have seen, examples themselves that have priority as indispensable instruments in the struggle to free ourselves of misconception in the aesthetic realm in particular and more broadly in philosophy taken as a whole. Such examples, given due and detailed attention, will exhibit a context-sensitive particularity that makes generalized pronouncements hovering high above the ground of that detail look otiose, inattentive, or, more bluntly, merely a theoretically-motivated falsification of cultural experience. What remains after such investigation is not, then—and this is an idea Wittgenstein’s auditors must themselves have struggled with in those rooms in Cambridge, as many still do today—another theory built upon now stronger foundations, but rather a clear view of our multiform aesthetic practices. Wittgenstein, in his distinctive work and his original approach to philosophy and its problems, did not generate a theory of language, of mind, or of mathematics. He generated, rather, a vast body of work perhaps united only in its therapeutic and intricately labored search for conceptual clarification. One sees the same philosophical aspiration driving his forays, distributed across the full range of his writings, into aesthetics.

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