Notes to Wittgenstein’s Aesthetics
1. For a discussion of the use of the phrase “language game” and its significance for aesthetics, see Hagberg 1994: 9–44.
2. For a discussion of gestures and their relations to pictures, see Lüdeking 1990.
3. See in this connection the discussion of the sign and its life in Wittgenstein 1958: 4–10.
4. Wittgenstein does not discuss here the connection to aspect-perception or “seeing-as”, but this is to emerge as a central theme in his subsequent thinking about perception (figuring centrally in Section xi of Philosophical Investigations, Part II), and it has been much discussed in the secondary writings on Wittgenstein’s aesthetics. The list is long, but for a start, see the papers collected in Seeing Wittgenstein Anew (Day & Krebs 2010).
5. For a very helpful recent discussion of Wittgenstein’s conception of such pictures, see Fischer 2006. The most sustained work to date in excavating and dismantling such pictures is still found in Frank B. Ebersole’s three volumes; see his Things We Know (1967), Language and Perception (1979a), and Meaning and Saying (1979b). See also, in connection with questions of aesthetic perception, Hagberg 1991.
6. This is not to suggest that Wittgenstein was anything like an uncritical follower of Kohler or of Gestalt psychology generally; whole sections of his multifarious writings on the philosophy of psychology can be read as sustained critical meditations on the philosophical wrong-turns taken by that movement (e.g., reifying the interpretation-laden perception into a mental object).
7. For a full examination of Wittgenstein’s comments on Freud and their significance for the philosophy of psychology more broadly, see Jacques Bouveresse, Wittgenstein Reads Freud (1991b [1995]).
8. For discussions of Wittgenstein’s work as it weaves through and finds resonances within the broader context and culture of Modernism, see Michael LeMahieu and Karen Zumhagen-Yekplé, editors, Wittgenstein and Modernism (2017).
9. This discussion emphasizes that Wittgenstein sees both language and the arts as culturally situated, that is, we fathom more of both the reach and depth of a word or a work by seeing it in the discursive or cultural context from which it drew its “life”, or in which it exhibits its greatest resonance within an expansive discursive or cultural web or network. But it is of interest to note that Wittgenstein’s own work can become the cultural background against which other work can be seen; see for example Zumhagen-Yekplé 2020.