1. For information concerning Wolff’s life, the reader can consult, among other sources, Wolff’s own autobiography (published in Wuttke 1841) and the recent biography by Kertscher (2018).

2. A German professor of philosophy typically lectured on several sub-disciplines, such as logic, metaphysics, ethics, as well as physics, politics, economics, grammar and rhetoric. For a general discussion, see Paulsen 1902 [1906].

3. For a brief account of the philosophy of Tschirnhaus, see Beck 1969: 189–195. For details concerning Wolff’s relationship with Tschirnhaus, see Dyck forthcoming[b].

4. Other commentators who mention the interactive quality of Wolff’s atomic elements include: Beck (1969: 271); Johann Erdmann, (1866 [1890: 224–226]); and Burns (1966: 99).

5. Here, and throughout this section, passages from Wolff’s Cosmologia generalis are taken from Burns 1966.