World Government

“World government” refers to the idea of all humankind united under one common political authority. Proposals for a unified global political authority have existed since ancient times—in the ambition of kings, popes and emperors, and the dreams of poets and philosophers. Recently, some have argued that a world government is already here, or nascent in contemporary conditions of capitalist globalization. There is much debate about whether global institutional developments towards a world state are inevitable or contingent, stable or subject to reversal, and whether unifying economic and political developments are to be desired or feared, justified or illegitimate, actively promoted or resisted.

Proponents of world government offer distinct reasons for why it is an ideal or necessary form of political organization. Some are motivated negatively and see world government as functionally the definitive solution to old and new human problems such as war and the development of weapons of mass destruction, global poverty and inequality, global financial instability, infectious disease and pandemics, and environmental degradation and climate change. More positively, some have advocated world government as a proper reflection of the unity of the cosmos, under reason or God, or as the teleological end-state of struggles for recognition or moral freedom or the perfection of humanity. Proponents have also differed historically in their views of the form of government that a world state should take. While medieval thinkers advocated world government under a single monarch or emperor who would possess supreme authority over all other lesser rulers, modern proponents of world government generally have not advocated a wholesale dismantling of the sovereign states system but incremental innovations in global institutional design to move humanity toward pacific world federalism or cosmopolitan democracy.

Critics of world government come from a wide political spectrum, from radical and postcolonial to liberal to far right political adherents. Critics have offered three main kinds of objections—to do with the feasibility, desirability and necessity of establishing a common global political authority.

This entry will, first, outline the historical development of ideas of world government, as well as objections to it, through a selective discussion of the idea’s history in Western political thought. The entry will focus on Dante’s medieval treatise on the necessity of a world monarch or emperor, and then consider mainly arguments by Hobbes, Rousseau and Kant that reveal more skepticism about world government as a solution to the problem of war and peace among sovereign states. The historical background section will continue with the revival of ideas of world government in the nineteenth and twentieth centuries, prompted by imperial and colonial activity, technological developments, economic globalization, and the experience of two devastating world wars. While debates about world government during the Cold War were pervaded by the ideological division of the world, the section concludes with a discussion of the acceleration of neoliberal globalization, following the end of the Cold War, as well as resistance to it, on the prospects, promise, and perils of world state formation.

Second, the entry will explore debates in contemporary theory. One set of debates is located within international relations theory, between realist and neorealist, “international society”, liberal internationalist, republican, and constructivist schools, over the possibility and desirability of global structural transformation from anarchy to hierarchy. A second set of discussions about world government is located within contemporary liberal theory, between John Rawls and his cosmopolitan liberal critics, over the institutional implications of liberal commitments to both normative individualism and the value of freedom as collective self-determination. A third set of debates among contemporary republican and democratic theorists revolves around the question of whether a world state would fulfill or destroy the conditions necessary to support republican nondomination and democratic justice. A related, fourth set of debates involve critical and postcolonial theoretical critiques of the nascent global state emerging from the ascendancy of neoliberalism and persistence of patriarchal and racial capitalism.

There is lively debate between scholars within and between these sets of discussions about the feasibility, desirability, and necessity of uniting humanity under a world government. In current conditions, it is apparent that persistent and pervasive structural inequalities at the global level make health, security, prosperity, human rights, global justice, and environmental protection unevenly accessible, and seriously inaccessible, to a significant portion of the Earth’s inhabitants. In the context of the first two decades of the twenty-first century, it is uncertain whether world government is a political institutional project that, even if effectively pursued, would fulfill humanity’s collective aspirations for a sustainable peace of justice and freedom, or whether it will disappoint or haunt those who reach out for it.

• 1. Historical Background
• 2. Debates in Contemporary Political Theory
  • 2.1 International Relations Theory
  • 2.2 The Liberal Rejection of World Government
  • 2.3 Republican Nondomination and Global Democracy
  • 2.4 Critics of Capitalism and a Neoliberal World State
• 3. Conclusion
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

1. Historical Background

—Alfred, Lord Tennyson, “Locksley Hall” (1837)

United States President Harry Truman, who oversaw the founding of the United Nations after the Second World War, kept these lines from Tennyson’s poem in his wallet (Kennedy 2006: xi). After this brutal global war that claimed over fifty million lives, just like after the previous world war in which almost ten million perished, ordinary people and statespersons alike sought to establish a post-war international order that would be able to prevent another war of global devastation from occurring. In fact, since the problem of war, or large-scale socially organized violence, has been with us throughout human history, the ideal of a universal community of humankind living in perpetual peace was not at all new.

Derek Heater’s history of ideas of world government and citizenship begins by noting their presence in ancient Chinese and Indian as well as Graeco-Roman thought (1996: ix–x). According to Heater, the concept of human unity produced an ideal that such unity ought to be expressed in political form. The exact nature of that form, however, has changed radically over time. While Stoic ideas about the oneness of the universe were politically inchoate, they inspired medieval Christian proposals for a global political authority; at the same time, the historical model of imperial Rome (or its myths) inspired medieval quests for world empire.

The Italian poet, philosopher, and statesperson, Dante (1265–1321), perhaps best articulated the Christian ideal of human unity and its expression through a world governed by a universal monarch. In The Banquet [Convivio], Dante argued that wars and all their causes would be eliminated if

the whole earth and all that humans can possess be a monarchy, that is, one government under one ruler. Because he possesses everything, the ruler would not desire to possess anything further, and thus, he would hold kings contentedly within the borders of their kingdoms, and keep peace among them. (Convivio, bk 4, ch 4 [2000: 169])

In De Monarchia (1309–13: 8]), a full political treatise affirming universal monarchy, Dante draws on Aristotle to argue that human unity stems from a shared end, purpose or function, to develop and realize fully and constantly humanity’s distinct intellectual potential. In Book I, Dante argues that peace is a vital condition for realizing this end, and peace cannot be maintained if humanity is divided. Just as “[e]very kingdom divided against itself shall be laid waste” (Monarchia bk 1, ch. V, quoting Luke 11:17 [1995: 10]), since humankind shares one goal,

there must therefore be one person who directs and rules mankind, and he is properly called “Monarch” or “Emperor”. And thus it is apparent that the well-being of the world requires that there be a monarchy or empire. (Monarchia bk 1, ch. V [1995: 10])

Most importantly, when conflicts inevitably arise between two rulers who are equals, “there must be a third party of wider jurisdiction who rules over both of them by right”; a universal monarch is necessary as

a first and supreme judge, whose judgment resolves all disputes either directly or indirectly. (Monarchia bk 1, ch. X [1995: 14])

In the absence of a universal monarch, humanity is “transformed into a many-headed beast”, striving after “conflicting things” (Monarchia bk 1, ch. XVI [1995: 28]); humankind ordered under a universal monarch, however,

will most closely resemble God, by mirroring the principle of oneness or unity of which he is the supreme example. (Monarchia bk 1, ch. VIII [1995: 19])

Dante completes his treatise by extolling the Roman Empire as a part of God’s providence (Monarchia bks 2 and 3 [1995: 30–94). And while Dante argued for a universal emperor whose temporal power was distinct from the pope’s religious power, and not derivative from the latter, he envisioned that God’s will must require pope and emperor to forge a cooperative and conciliatory, rather than competitive and antagonistic, relationship.

The idea of uniting humanity under one empire or monarch, however, became an ambivalent appeal by the seventeenth century with the entrenchment in Europe of the system of sovereign states after the Peace of Westphalia (1648). At the same time, European encounters with non-European worlds precipitated European ambitions based on the principle of promoting civilization as an organizing framework for legitimizing European imperial and colonial expansion into other parts of the world (Keene 2002).

In Leviathan (1651), Hobbes (1588–1679) gave the quintessential formulation of sovereignty as supreme legal coercive authority over a particular population and territory. Hobbes argued that although mutual vulnerabilities and interests lead individuals to give up their liberties in the state of nature, in exchange for protection—thereby instituting sovereign states—the miseries that accompany a plurality of sovereign states are not as onerous to individuals, hence there is less rational basis for political organization to move towards a global leviathan:

because states uphold the Industry of their Subjects; there does not follow from the international state of nature, that misery, which accompanies the Liberty of particular men. (1651: ch. 13 [1986: 188])

Contrary to realist interpretations of Hobbes in international relations thought, Hobbes did not consider international law or cooperation between sovereign states to be impossible or impractical. Anticipating the development of international law, collective security organizations, the League of Nations and the United Nations, he affirmed the possibility and efficacy of leagues of commonwealths founded on the interests of states in peace and justice:

Leagues between Common-wealths, over whom there is no humane Power established, to keep them all in awe, are not onely lawfull [because they are allowed by the commonwealth], but also profitable for the time they last. (1651: ch. 22 [1986: 286])

In Hobbes, we find the first articulation of the argument that a world state is unnecessary, although he envisaged that the development of a lawful interstate order is possible, and potentially desirable.

In the eighteenth century, Charles Castel, Abbé de Saint-Pierre (1658–1743), in his Project for Making Peace Perpetual in Europe (1713), extended Hobbes’s argument that a rational interest in self-preservation necessitated the creation a domestic leviathan to the international realm, asserting that reason should lead the princes of Europe to form a federation of states by social contract. The contracting sovereigns would form a perpetual and irrevocable alliance, establishing a permanent Diet or Congress that would adjudicate all conflicts between the contracting parties. The federation would also proscribe as “a public enemy” (Rousseau 1756 [1917: 63]) any member who breaks the Treaty or disregards the decisions of the congress; in such a situation, all members would “arm and take the offensive, conjointly and at the common expense, against any State put to the ban of Europe” in order to enforce the decisions of the federation (1756 [1917: 61–4]). In other words, perpetual peace can be achieved if the princes of Europe would agree to relinquish their sovereign rights to make war or peace to a superior, federal body that guaranteed protection of their basic interests.

In his comments on this proposal, Rousseau (1712–78) acknowledged its perfect rationality:

Realize this Commonwealth of Europe for a single day, and you may be sure it will last forever; so fully would experience convince men that their own gain is to be found in the good of all. (1756 [1917: 93])

To Rousseau, however, existing societies had so thoroughly corrupted humans’ natural innocence that they were largely incapable of discovering their true or real interests. Thus, the Abbé’s proposals were not utopian, but they were not likely to be realized “because men are crazy, and to be sane in a world of madmen is itself a kind of madness” (1756 [1917: 91]). At the same time, Rousseau noted that the sovereigns of Europe were not likely to agree voluntarily to form such a federation:

No Federation could ever be established except by a revolution. That being so, which of us would dare say whether the League of Europe is a thing more to be desired or feared? It would perhaps do more harm in the moment than it would guard against for ages. (1756 [1917: 112])

This consequentialist objection to the idea of world government speculates that even if it were desirable, the process of creating a world government may produce more harm than good; the necessary evils committed on the road to establishing a world government would outweigh whatever benefits might result from its achievement.

Rousseau viewed war as a product of defectively ordered social institutions; it is states as public entities that make war, and individuals participate in wars only as members or citizens of states. Far from viewing the achievement of a domestic leviathan as moral progress, Rousseau noted that the condition of a world of entangled sovereign states puts human beings in more peril than if no such institutions existed at all. Isn’t it the case, he argued, that

each one of us being in the civil state as regards our fellow citizens, but in the state of nature as regards the rest of the world, we have taken all kinds of precautions against private wars only to kindle national wars a thousand times more terrible? And that, in joining a particular group of men, we have really declared ourselves the enemies of the whole race? (1756 [1917: 56])

In Rousseau’s view, the solution to war is to establish well-governed societies, along the lines he established in The Social Contract (1762); only in such contexts will human beings realize their full rational and moral potential. To establish perpetual peace, then, we should not pursue world government, but the moral perfection of states. A world of ideal societies would have no cause for war, and no need for world government.

Kant tried, in his Idea for a Universal History with a Cosmopolitan Purpose (1784), to refute the claim that the development of the domestic state constituted a moral step backwards for humankind, by placing it and its trials

in the history of the entire species, as a steadily advancing but slow development of man’s original [rational] capacities. (1784 [1991: 41])

Nature employs the “unsociableness of men” to motivate moral progress; thus war is a means by which nature moves states

to take the step which reason could have suggested to them even without so many sad experiences—that of abandoning a lawless state of savagery and entering a federation of peoples in which every state, even the smallest, could expect to derive its security and rights not from its own power or its own legal judgment, but solely from this great federation (Foedus Amphictyonum), from a united power and the law-governed decisions of a united will. (1784 [1991: 47])

This is the “inevitable outcome” (1784 [1991: 48]) of human history, a point Kant reiterated in Perpetual Peace [1795], when he argued that rationality dictated the formation of

an international state (civitas gentium), which would necessarily continue to grow until it embraced all the peoples of the earth. (1784 [1991: 105])

In present conditions, however, Kant noted that “the positive idea of a world republic cannot be realized”, thus his treatise on perpetual peace begins with the social fact of a world of distinct but interacting states. What would be required, given such a world, to achieve perpetual peace? Kant makes three arguments. First, every state must have a republican constitution that guarantees the freedom and equality of citizens through the rule of law and representative political institutions. The internally well-ordered republican state is less likely to engage in wars without good reason;

under a constitution where the subject is not a citizen, and which is therefore not republican, it is the simplest thing in the world to go to war. (1784 [1991: 100])

Second, such internally well-ordered states would need to enter into a “federation of peoples”, which is distinct from an “international state” (1784 [1991: 102]). A

pacific federation (foedus pacificum) … does not aim to acquire any power like that of a state, but merely to preserve and secure the freedom of each state in itself, along with that of the other confederated states. (1784 [1991: 104])

In this context, a federal union of free and independent states, he argued,

is still to be preferred to an amalgamation of the separate nations under a single power which has overruled the rest and created a universal monarchy.

His reasons against a universal monarchy combine fears of an all-powerful and powerless world government:

For the laws progressively lose their impact as the government increases its range, and a soulless despotism, after crushing the germs of goodness, will finally lapse into anarchy. (1784 [1991: 113])

Most forcefully articulating the tyranny objection, Kant argued that a “universal despotism” would end “in the graveyard of freedom” (1784 [1991: 114]). The third condition for perpetual peace in a world of distinct but interacting states is the observance of cosmopolitan right, which Kant limits to universal hospitality. Although the human race shares in common a right to the earth’s surface, Kant argued that strangers do not have entitlements to settle on foreign territory without the inhabitants’ agreement. Thus, cosmopolitan right justifies visiting a foreign land, but not conquering it, which Kant criticized the commercial states of his day to have done in “America, the negro countries, the Spice Islands, the Cape” and East India (1784 [1991: 106]).

Kant’s views on the desirability of world government were clearly complex (Kokaz 2005: 87–92; Pogge 2009). On the one hand, Kant provides two of the most trenchant objections to world government. The tyranny argument posits that world government would descend into a global tyranny, hindering rather than enhancing the ideal of human autonomy (Kant 1795 [1991]). Instead of delivering impartial global justice and peace, a world government may form an inescapable tyranny that would have the power to make humanity serve its own interests, and opposition against which might engender incessant and intractable civil wars (Waltz 1979; DuFord 2017). In another argument against its desirability, the inevitable remoteness of a global political authority would dilute the laws, making them ineffectual and meaningless. The posited weakness of world government leads to objections based on its potential inefficiency and soullessness (Kant 1795 [1991]).

On the other hand, Kant also provides a republican vision of world government based on universal reason. His endorsement of the ideal of human unity prompted him to see a world republic, under which free and equal individuals, united by one global sovereign, would achieve a “fully juridical condition” (Pogge 2009: 198), as the ideal end of the progress of human history. At the same time, Kant’s faith in human unity through reason coexisted with his subscription to a theory of racial hierarchy in human development, and he came to be critical of the dominant modes of European expansionist policies in world politics in the late eighteenth century—through colonial wars, exploitation, and conquests—as undermining the moral progress of Europeans (Valdez 2019). More generally, Kant condemned any move towards a universal monarchy, because a monarchy, in contrast to a republic, does not guarantee, but undermines, the freedom and equality of individuals. Although a world republic is Kant’s ultimate political ideal, a universal despotic monarch that exercises power arbitrarily is equivalent to a global anarchic state of nature, which is his ultimate dystopia. In between lies his “realistic utopia” (Rawls 1999: 11–6) consisting of a federation of free (republican) states short of a world state. As Habermas has put it,

This weak conception of a voluntary association of states that are willing to coexist peacefully while nevertheless retaining their sovereignty seemed to recommend itself as a transitional stage en route to a world republic. (2010: 268)

Kant’s work shows that even in the eighteenth century, debates about world government were alive and well, including arguments by radical political cosmopolitans such as Anacharsis Cloots (Jean-Baptiste du Val-de-Grace, baron de Cloots, 1755–1794), who used social contract theory to advocate the abolition of the sovereign states system in favor of a universal republic encompassing all humanity (Kleingeld & Brown 2002). At the same time, philosophical projects for perpetual peace in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries were Eurocentric in adopting Europe as the centre of world order, in failing to recognize non-European peoples in equal standing, and in obscuring the global inequalities and injustices being established by European commercial enterprises and states (Pitts 2018: 6–7).

The nineteenth and twentieth centuries witnessed revivals of proposals for world government that were fueled by racialized theories of progress that buttressed European-led colonial and imperial expansion over much of the world, technological developments in travel and communications, the rapid ascent of a global capitalist system, as well as the devastating impact of wars fought with modern technology. Theories of “scientific racism” continued to pervade European thought on world order:

White supremacist visions of global governance circulated widely in the Anglo-American world. (Bell 2018: 871)

One of the most prominent proponents of world order, H.G. Wells (1866–1946), envisaged in 1901 a “New Republic” of Anglo-American dominance, and while he repudiated racial theories, his vision of a universal world state included a civilizing mission (Wells 1902; Bell 2018: 870). The construction of racial and civilizational hierarchies, backed by military domination, meant that the inclusion of non-Europeans and non-whites, whether in imperial projects, colonial civilizing missions, or later, in a system of formally independent states embedded in a capitalist global economy, would be marked by deep asymmetries and inequalities in standing, status, rights, burdens, and powers (Anghie 2005; Bell 2019; Getachew 2019).

In the Second World War, after the atomic bombings of Hiroshima and Nagasaki, atomic scientists lobbied for the international control of atomic energy as a main function of world federalist government. Albert Einstein wrote in 1946 that technological developments had shrunk the planet, through increased economic interdependence and mutual vulnerability through weapons of mass destruction. Although his adherence to the idea of a world government to guarantee interstate peace preceded the development of nuclear weapons, Einstein’s advocacy gained momentum with the risk of nuclear annihilation:

A world government must be created which is able to solve conflicts between nations by judicial decision. This government must be based on a clear-cut constitution which is approved by the governments and nations and which gives it the sole disposition of offensive weapons. (1946 [1950: 132]; Nathan & Norden 1960)

Organizations such as the United World Federalists (UWF), established in 1947, called for the transformation of the United Nations into a universal federation of states with powers to control armaments. World peace required that states should give up their traditional unrestricted sovereign rights to amass weapons and wage war, and that they should submit their disputes to authoritative international institutions of adjudication and enforcement; world peace would only be achieved through the establishment of world law (Clark & Sohn 1958/1960 [1962]).

Calls for world government in the post-World War Two era implied a deep suspicion about the sovereign state’s potential as a vehicle for moral progress in world politics. Emery Reves’ influential The Anatomy of Peace, is a condemnation of the nation-state as a political institution: “The modern Bastille is the nation-state, no matter whether the jailers are conservative, liberal or socialist” (1945: 270). Echoing Rousseau, Reves argued that nation-states threaten human peace, justice and freedom, by diverting funds from important needs, prolonging a global climate of mistrust and fear, and creating a war machine that ultimately precipitates actual war. The experience of the world wars thus made it especially difficult to view states as agents of moral progress. David Mitrany, perhaps motivated by such suspicions, bracketed the idea of a world federation or world state, and focused on the role that “a spreading web of international activities and agencies” could play in the pursuit of world integration and peace (1966: 38; Trachtman 2013).

Some did not reject the nation-state per se, but only authoritarian nondemocratic states as unfit partners for building a peaceful world order. The Atlantic Union Committee (AUC), formed in 1949 by Clarence Streit, for example, called for a federal union of democratic states that would be the genesis of a

free world government, as nations are encouraged by example to practice the principles which would make them eligible for membership, namely the principles of representative government and protection of individual liberty by law. (1950, quoted in Baratta 2004: 470; for a critique see Rosenboim 2017)

In the context of the Cold War (1945–89), however, the division of the world into two ideologically opposed camps—led by the United States (US) and the Union of Soviet Socialist Republics (USSR)—produced mutual distrust that pervaded the reception of all proposals for world government. Soviet opposition to all Western proposals as attempts to impose “American monopolistic capitalism” on the world (Goodman 1953: 234) made the world federalist movement’s goal of establishing a universal federation infeasible. The Soviet leadership also condemned the AUC’s proposal for an exclusive union of democracies as part of the Cold War rivalry—an attempt to strengthen the anti-communist (anti-Soviet) bloc.

In a distorted fashion, the Soviet Union became the historical manifestation of socialist or communist thought. Socialist ideas can be traced back to the French Revolution, but developed more fully as a response to negative aspects of the rapid growth of industry in the nineteenth century. At the same time that technological advancements promised great material progress, the changes they wrought in social and economic relations were not all positive. While the many workers, or “proletarians”, in new industrial factories worked under terrible conditions for meager wages, the few factory owners, “the bourgeoisie” or “capitalists”, amassed great wealth and power. According to Karl Marx (1818–1883), human history is a history of struggles not between nations or states, but between classes, created and destroyed by changing modes of production. The state as a centralized, coercive authority emerges under social modes of production at a certain stage of development, and is only necessary in a class society as the coercive instrument of the ruling class. The capitalist economic system, however, contains within it the seeds of its own destruction: capitalism necessitates the creation of an ever-growing proletarian class, and a global revolution by the proletariat will sweep away “the conditions for the existence of class antagonisms and of classes generally” (Marx & Engels 1848 [1988: 75]). The state will fall along with the fall of classes:

The society that will organize production on the basis of a free and equal association of the producers will put the whole machinery of state where it will then belong: into the Museum of Antiquities, by the side of the spinning wheel and the bronze axe. (Engels 1884 [1978: 755])

In a communist vision, capitalism is a necessary but transitional and ephemeral order of things; the revolutionary overthrow of capitalism by forces it unleashed itself is necessary to attain a new world order, “in which the free development of each is the condition for the free development of all” (Marx & Engels 1848 [1988: 75]). World peace and freedom as nondomination for all (Roberts 2017), including freedom from the “alienated” or “estranged” labor (Marx 1844 [1978: 71–81]) produced under capitalism, will be achieved through the transformation of a capitalist to a communist social order:

In proportion as the antagonism between classes within the nation vanishes, the hostility of one nation to another will come to an end. (Marx & Engels 1848 [1988: 73])

The Russian revolutionary, V.I. Lenin (1870–1924), drew on Marx to argue that the proletarian class needed to seize the coercive apparatus of the state to oppress the resisters and exploiters, the bourgeoisie, however, Lenin was committed to world revolution, and to the view that the state is “the organ of class rule”, and that even the

proletarian state will begin to wither away immediately after its victory because the state is unnecessary and cannot exist in a society in which there are no class antagonisms. (Lenin 1918: 65)

In the context of the post-World War I world that witnessed the collapse of empires as well as the fortification of others, buttressed by the League of Nations, Lenin’s vision of a new communist world order entailed an appeal to the colonized to mount anti-imperialist revolutions. This contrasted with U.S. President Woodrow Wilson’s less radical interpretation of self-determination as good self-government, a formulation that was consistent with the civilizing narrative based on racial hierarchies, and the continuation and extension of a colonial international order (Pedersen 2015).

Later Soviet leaders and elites who rejected Western proposals for world federation somewhat inconsistently envisaged the transcendence of nation-states and world capitalism, and the establishment of a world socialist economy governed by a “Bolshevik World State” (Goodman 1953: 231). In communist ideology, ultimately, balance-of-power politics between states enjoying unrestricted sovereignty did not cause war; the real cause of war was capitalism. In practice, the Soviet Union’s internally and externally repressive policies made a mockery of socialist ideals of a classless society, or a world of peaceful socialist republics, and the disintegration of the Soviet Union itself spelled the practical end of one alternative to a capitalist world order.

The end of Cold War ideological divisions led some to have great expectations in the 1990s of enhanced global cooperation to rid humanity of the threat of global nuclear annihilation and to increase global commerce and spread prosperity, the material bases for building a truly global moral and political community of humankind. The end of the twentieth century was marked by an unbridled faith and optimism in the inexorable twin triumph of capitalism and liberal democracy as the end of history (Fukuyama 1992). With the collapse of Soviet-style state socialism, the world witnessed neoliberal transformations on a global scale, driven by the “ideology of free markets, trade liberalization, deregulation, and the small state” (Lüthi 2020: 596). Quinn Slobodian has described the paradoxical ascendancy of “globalist” neoliberalism, entailing the development of a world state and regulatory laws that privileged the “encasement” of markets from domestic democratic regulation and accountability, leading to an institutional project to redesign “states, laws, and other institutions to protect the market” (2018: 4 and 6). As neoliberalism spread on a global scale, so did the deterioration of conditions for robust democratic politics, precipitating serious backsliding of democratization.

The optimism of the 1990s and early 2000s was thus short-lived as a variety of persistent and deepening structural injustices of the modern international system produced conditions ripe for violent conflict and mass atrocities, the global war on terror after 2001, the global financial crisis of 2007–9, growing numbers of displaced people, rising socioeconomic inequality, and the hollowing out of social welfare protections, not to mention the disruptive consequences wrought by climate change, and the Covid-19 global pandemic. The persistence of racial subordination and gender inequalities, as well as the ascendancy of a neoliberal world order, have provoked much critical debate about how these and other dominating hierarchies, backed by powerful international institutions, law, states, and corporations, can be tamed or overthrown, or how the crises they generate may accelerate structural transformations at the global level in a more emancipatory direction.

2. Debates in Contemporary Political Theory

2.1 International Relations Theory

Contemporary international relations theory developed out of the urgent need to explain and predict the causes of war and peace in world politics. International relations theory has also developed in response to globalization, which has wrought “fundamental changes in the spatial and temporal contours of social existence” (Scheuerman 2002 [2018]), characterized by the uneven increase and intensification of social interconnectedness, economic integration, and the “shrinkage of geographic distance on a world scale” (Keohane 2001). While much of international relations theory’s approach to world government has remained focused on the problem of overcoming interstate anarchy for the sake of human security in the face of common global threats, a “global politics paradigm” (Zürn 2018) has emerged which understands world government as only one possible institutional development among others in a system of global governance characterized by the co-constitution of transnational, international and domestic realms of politics and political contestation.

Contemporary international “realists” or “neorealists” claim not to evaluate the contemporary states system in normative terms. They liken the international order to a Hobbesian state of nature, where notions of justice and injustice have no place, and in which each unit is rationally motivated to pursue every means within its power to assure its own survival, even at the expense of others’ basic interests. Some realists have thus held that ideas of world government constitute exercises in utopian thinking, and are utterly impractical as a goal for human political organization. Assuming that world government would lead to desirable outcomes such as perpetual peace, realists are skeptical that world government will ever materialize as an institutional reality, given the problems of egoistic or corrupted human nature, or the logic of international anarchy that characterizes a world of states, all jealously guarding their own sovereignty or claims to supreme authority. World government is thus infeasible as a solution to global problems because of the unsurpassable difficulties of establishing “authoritative hierarchies” at the global or international level (Krasner 1999: 42). Furthermore, Kenneth Waltz, in his seminal account of neorealism, Theory of International Politics, clearly favors a system of sovereign states over a world government (1979: 111–2). World government, according to Waltz, would not deliver universal, disinterested, impartial justice, order or security, but like domestic governments, it would be driven by its own particular or exclusive organizational interests, which it would pursue at the expense of the interests and freedom of states. This realist view thus provides a sobering antidote to liberal and other progressive narratives that foretell peace through interdependence.

William Scheuerman has argued (2011: 67–97), however, that so-called “classical” realists of the mid-twentieth century were more sympathetic to ideas of global institutional reform than contemporary realists. “Classical” and “progressive” realists such as Reinhold Niebuhr, E.H. Carr, and Hans Morgenthau, as well as John Herz and Frederick Schuman, supported a global reformist agenda, prompted by the advent of economic globalization, technological change, modern total warfare, and the nuclear revolution. Although a desirable end-goal, the feasibility of global political change towards a world government in the form of a global federal system, according to Reinhold Niebuhr, would depend on deeper global social integration and cohesion than was evident in the mid-twentieth century (Scheuerman 2011: 73). In addition, Niebuhr was concerned that absent the required social and cultural basis for global political unity, the achievement of world government would be undesirable, since in such conditions, a world government would require authoritarian devices to rule, raising the specter of a global tyrannical power (72–6). Others, such as James Burnham, posited that a world state could only arise through imperial conquest (Deudney 2019). Despite these caveats, realist prudence-based as well as functional arguments for a Weberian world state have gained traction again (Cabrera 2010; Ulaş 2016; Araujo 2018; Craig 2019).

“International society” theorists, or the “English school”, argue that although there is no central overriding authority above sovereign states, their relations are not wholly lawless or devoid of authoritative and enforceable norms and rules for conduct. The anarchy between states does not preclude the concept of a norm-governed society of states (Bull 1977). Since “international society” theorists do not see the absence of a central global authority as necessitating a state-eat-state world, they regard the idea of world government as unnecessary, and potentially dangerous, since it may serve as a cloak in the struggle for imperial domination between states. Martin Wight has noted that the moral ideals of cosmopolitanism typically translate in practice into political tyranny and imperialism (1991). As an alternative to world government, and echoing both Rousseau and Kant, Chris Brown forwards

the ideal of a plurality of morally autonomous, just communities related to one another in a framework of peace and law. (1995: 106)

Establishing an international society, ideally conceived, would make a supreme world government unnecessary. Andrew Hurrell, however, argues that

it is important to recognize the extent to which social, environmental and, above all, technological change is likely to affect the scale of governance challenges, the sources of control and governance, and the subjects of control. (2007: 293)

For these reasons, Hurrell does not consider a retreat to a traditional state-based pluralism to be feasible, but argues that the development of a “stable, effective and legitimate international society” requires redressing global inequality through the significant redistribution of political power to buttress the collective political agency of the weak and marginalized (2007: 318).Liberal internationalist accounts of world order are motivated by more than just the traditional preoccupation with problems of war and peace. This school of international relations thought, more than the preceding two, is explicitly critical of traditional accounts of state sovereignty. Richard Falk has depicted the contemporary world order as one of “inhumane governance”, identifying the following ills: global severe poverty affecting more than one billion human beings, denial of human rights to socially and culturally vulnerable groups, the persistent use and threat of war as an instrument of politics, environmental degradation, and the lack of transnational democratic accountability (1995: 1–2). A liberal internationalist agenda is advanced when progress is made on alleviating or correcting these ills. However, Falk is explicit that

humane governance can be achieved without world government, and that this is both the more likely and more desirable course of action. (1995: 8)

By world government, Falk means a form of global political organization that has, at minimum, the following features:

compulsory peaceful settlement of all disputes by third-party decision in accordance with law; general and complete disarmament at the state and regional levels; a global legislative capacity backed up by enforcement capabilities; and some form of centralized leadership. (1995: 7)

Instead of world government, Falk calls for “transnational democratic initiatives” from global civil society as well as United Nations reform, both of which would challenge and complement the statist and market forces that currently produce our contemporary global ills (1995: 207). Most liberal international theorists thus envision the need for authoritative international and global institutions that modify significantly the powers and prerogatives traditionally attributed to the sovereign state.

Anne-Marie Slaughter has also rejected the idea of cosmopolitan democracy and a global parliament as infeasible and unwieldy (2004: 8 and 238). Slaughter is an advocate of “global governance”, in the sense of “a much looser and less threatening concept of collective organization and regulation without coercion”, to solve common global problems such as transnational crime, terrorism, and environmental destruction (2004: 9). According to Slaughter, states are not unitary, but “disaggregated” and increasingly “networked” through information, enforcement, and harmonization networks (2004: 167)—producing

a world of governments, with all the different institutions that perform the basic functions of governments—legislation, adjudication, implementation—interacting both with each other domestically and also with their foreign and supranational counterparts. (2004: 5)

A networked world order, she argues,

would be a more effective and potentially more just world order than either what we have today or a world government in which a set of global institutions perched above nation-states enforced global rules. (2004: 6–7)

Although Slaughter is keen to highlight the promise of “global governance through government networks” as “good public policy for the world and good national foreign policy” (2004: 261), she acknowledges that in contemporary world conditions of radical social, economic and political inequality between states and peoples, effective and fair global governance will require the networks comprising global governance to abide by the norms of “global deliberative equality”, toleration of reasonable and legitimate difference, and “positive comity” in the form of consultation and active assistance between organizations; in addition, global governance networks would need to be made more accountable through a system of checks and balances, and more responsive through the principle of subsidiarity (2004: 244–60). Without movement towards a more equitable world of mutual respect, however, it is difficult to see actually existing global governance networks operating in an impartial and generous spirit to help

all nations and their peoples to achieve greater peace, prosperity, stewardship of the earth, and minimum standards of human dignity. (2004: 166)

In this vein, Thomas Weiss has lamented the intellectual and political shifts in perspective from world government to global governance, arguing that current voluntary associations, organizations and networks at the global level are “so obviously inadequate” to meeting global challenges that we

are obliged to ask ourselves whether we can approach anything that resembles effective governance for the world without institutions with some supranational characteristics at the global level. (2009: 264)

While many contemporary international relations theorists seem to reject the feasibility, desirability, or necessity of world government, constructivist theorist Alexander Wendt has argued that the “logic of anarchy” contains within it the seeds of transformation towards a “global monopoly on the legitimate use of organized violence—a world state” (2003: 491). Using Aristotelian and Hegelian insights, Wendt offers a teleological account of the development of world order from an anarchic states system to a world state, arguing that

the struggle for recognition between states will have the same outcome as that between individuals, collective identity formation and eventually a state. (2003: 493)

Technological changes, especially those that increase the “costs of war” as well as “the scale on which it is possible to organize a state”, affect the struggle for recognition among states, undermining their self-sufficiency and making a world state “inevitable” (2003: 493–4). Wendt draws on the work of Daniel Deudney (1995 and 1999), who argued that the evolution of destructive technology makes states as vulnerable as individuals in a Hobbesian state of nature:

Hence nuclear one-worldism—just as the risks of the state of nature made it functional for individuals to submit to a common power, changes in the forces of destruction increasingly make it functional for states to do so as well. (Wendt 2003: 508)

Deudney, however, has recently argued that the world state solution, involving a top-down hierarchical mode of government, is impractical and conceptually dead; his proposed alternative is a “negarchic”, republican-federalist conception of world order that solves the problems of anarchy through the development of regimes of mutual restraint and obligation, but without the risk of despotism or totalitarianism accompanying hierarchical world government (2019 and 2020).

According to Wendt, however, the path of world state formation is inevitable, and would be characterized by the emergence of “a universal security community”, in which members expect to resolve conflicts peacefully rather than through force; a “universal collective security” system that ensures the protection of each member should “crimes” occur; and a “universal supranational authority” that can make binding authoritative decisions about the collective use of force (2003: 505). Driving this transformation is the struggle for recognition, and the

political development of the system will not end until the subjectivity of all individuals and groups is recognized and protected by a global Weberian state. (2003: 506; for a critique of teleological arguments about institutional forms, see Levy 2020)

Wendt recognizes that powerful states enjoying the benefits of asymmetrical recognition may be most resistant to world state formation. He argues, however, that with the diffusion of greater violence potential to smaller powers (such as al-Qaeda and North Korea),

the ability of Great Powers to insulate themselves from global demands for recognition will erode, making it more and more difficult to sustain a system in which their power and privileges are not tied to an enforceable rule of law. (2003: 524)

Based on the assumption that systems tend to develop toward stable end-states, a world state in which individuals and

states alike will have lost the negative freedom to engage in unilateral violence, but gained the positive freedom of fully recognized subjectivity. (2003: 525)

is the inevitable end-state of the human struggle for recognition. At the same time that Wendt sees world state formation as an inevitable trajectory of the struggle for recognition between individuals and groups, he argues that a world state could take various forms: while collectivizing organized violence, it need not collectivize on a global scale culture, economy or local politics; while requiring a structure that “can command and enforce a collective response to threats”, it need not abolish national armies, or require a single UN army; and while it requires a procedure for making binding choices,

it would not even require a world “government”, if by this we mean a unitary body with one leader whose decisions are final. (2003: 506)

2.2 The Liberal Rejection of World Government

We now turn to debates about world government among contemporary liberal theorists. Since the publication of John Rawls’s landmark A Theory of Justice in 1971, liberal theorists such as Charles Beitz and Thomas Pogge have sought to formulate a cosmopolitan version of liberalism by extending Rawlsian principles of domestic justice to the international realm. According to Beitz, a cosmopolitan liberal conception of international morality is

concerned with the moral relations of members of a universal community in which state boundaries have a merely derivative significance. (1979 [1999a: 181–2])

Cosmopolitan liberalism evaluates the morality of domestic and international institutions based on “an impartial consideration of the claims of each person who would be affected” (1999b: 287). A cosmopolitan liberal theory of global justice thus begins with a conception of humanity as a common moral community of free and equal persons. There is debate among contemporary theorists about the relationship and distinction between moral cosmopolitanism and political or institutional cosmopolitanism in the form of a world state or government (Beitz 1994; Dufek 2013; Ypi 2013; Cabrera 2018 and 2019).

Contemporary liberal theorists have traditionally argued that world government, in the form of a global leviathan with supreme legislative, executive, adjudicative and enforcement powers, is largely unnecessary to solve problems such as war, global poverty, and environmental catastrophe. World government so conceived is neither necessary nor sufficient to achieve the aims of a liberal agenda (Yack 2012). Even cosmopolitan liberals have not argued that moral cosmopolitanism necessarily entails political cosmopolitanism in the form of a world government.

Although Rawls himself rejects cosmopolitan liberalism, disagreeing with his liberal critics on several critical issues related to global distributive justice, they are united in their agreement that a world state is not part of a liberal ideal for world order. In his treatise on global order, The Law of Peoples, Rawls forwards the concept of a society of peoples, governed by principles that will accommodate “cooperative associations and federations among peoples, but will not affirm a world-state” (1999: 36). He explicitly states his reason for rejecting the idea of a world state or government:

Here I follow Kant’s lead in Perpetual Peace (1795) in thinking that a world government—by which I mean a unified political regime with the legal powers normally exercised by central governments—would either be a global despotism or else would rule over a fragile empire torn by frequent civil strife as various regions and peoples tried to gain their political freedom and autonomy. (1999: 36)

Other liberal thinkers have similarly rejected the desirability of world government in the form of a domestic state writ large to cover the entire globe (Beitz 1999b: 182; Jones 1999: 229; Tan 2000 and 2004; Pogge 1988: 285; Satz 1999: 77–8; Risse 2012).

In a related objection, “communitarian” liberals, such as Michael Walzer, argue against a centralized world government as a threat to social pluralism. Walzer thus endorses “sovereign statehood” as “a way of protecting distinct historical cultures, sometimes national, sometimes ethnic/religious in character”, and rejects a centralized global order because he does not

see how it could accommodate anything like the range of cultural and religious difference that we see around us today. … For some cultures and most orthodox religions can only survive if they are permitted degrees of separation that are incompatible with globalism. And so the survival of these groups would be at risk; under the rules of the global state, they would not be able to sustain and pass on their way of life. (2004: 172 and 176)

At the same time that distinct communities may constitute intrinsic human goods, Walzer also endorses social and political pluralism as an instrumental good: given the diversity of human values, he argues that they

are best pursued politically in circumstances where there are many avenues of pursuit, many agents in pursuit. The dream of a single agent—the enlightened despot, the civilizing imperium, the communist vanguard, the global state—is a delusion. (2004: 188)

A world of distinct, autonomous communities may be important to curbing the appetite of a hegemonic or global state to re-make the world in its own image. Liberal nationalists and communitarians thus object to world government due to the homogeneity argument—world government may be so strong and pervasive as to create a homogenizing effect, obliterating distinct cultures and communities that are intrinsically valuable. Liberal political pluralists (Muñiz-Fraticelli 2014) are concerned that any state, including a world government, could destroy associative groups that constitute legitimate sources of political authority; and by destroying the rich social pluralism that animates human life (Walzer 2004), produce a loss of value (Miller 2007; Valentini 2012).

The liberal rejection of world government, however, does not amount to an endorsement of the conventional system of sovereign states or the contemporary international order, “with its extreme injustices, crippling poverty, and inequalities” (Rawls 1999: 117). Rawls’s rejection of a world government does not negate the legitimacy and desirability of establishing international or transnational institutions to regulate cooperation between peoples and even to discharge certain common inter-societal duties. Thus, after his rejection of a world state, Rawls goes on to say that in a well-ordered society of peoples, organizations

(such as the United Nations ideally conceived) may have the authority to express for the society of well-ordered peoples their condemnation of unjust domestic institutions in other countries and clear cases of the violation of human rights. In grave cases they may try to correct them by economic sanctions, or even by military intervention. The scope of these powers covers all peoples and reaches their domestic affairs. (1999: 36)

Rawls’s vision of global order clearly rejects a world of atomistic sovereign states with the traditional powers of absolute sovereignty. Instead, his global vision includes “new institutions and practices” to “constrain outlaw states when they appear” (1999: 48), to promote human rights, and to discharge the duty of assistance owed to burdened societies.

Thomas Pogge argues that realizing

a peaceful and ecologically sound future will … require supranational institutions and organizations that limit the sovereignty rights of states more severely than is the current practice. (2000: 213)

He sees this development to be possible only when a majority of states are stable democracies (2000: 213–4). Pogge thus appears to agree with Rawls that the path to perpetual peace (and environmental safety) lies in promoting the development of well-ordered states, characterized by democratically representative, responsive and responsible domestic governments.

As these lines of argument by Rawls and Pogge suggest, liberals have been quick to reject framing the choice of world orders as one between either a world of traditional sovereign states or a world with a global central government. Pogge has asserted that liberals should

dispense with the traditional concept of sovereignty and leave behind all-or-nothing debates about world government.

Instead, he argues for an

intermediate solution that provides for some central organs of world government without, however, investing them with [exclusive] “ultimate sovereign power and authority”. (1988: 285)

In this “multi-layered scheme in which ultimate political authority is vertically dispersed”, states that retain ultimate political authority in some areas would be juxtaposed with a world government with “central coercive mechanisms of law enforcement” that has ultimate political authority in other areas (Pogge 2009: 205–6). Debra Satz has also argued that framing the choice as one between the current states system and “an all-powerful world-state” poses a false dilemma:

the contrast between a system of sovereign states and a centralized world-state is too crude. There are many other possibilities, including a state system restrained by international and intergovernmental institutions, a non-state-based economic system, a global separation-of-powers scheme, international federalism, and regional political-economic structures, such as those currently being developed in western Europe and the Americas (via NAFTA). (Satz 1999: 77–8)

Simon Caney has also endorsed a system of international institutions designed to

provide a reliable and effective means of protecting people’s basis interests (and instrumental consideration) and also to provide a fair forum for determining which rules should govern the global economy (a procedural component). (2006: 734)

As the many liberal proposals for moral improvement of the world order indicate, liberal objections to world government—whether they take the form of tyranny/homogeneity arguments and/or the inefficiency/soullessness objections—are not motivated by a complacent attitude towards the contemporary world order and its resulting conditions (Pogge 2000). As Charles Jones has put it, these valid and plausible objections to world government do not show that “the status quo is preferable to some alternative arrangement” (1999: 229). While liberal theorists acknowledge the tyrannical potential of a world government, they also acknowledge that “sovereign states are themselves often the cause of the rights-violations of their citizens” (1999: 229). Kok-Chor Tan characterizes liberal proposals for world order to involve, therefore, neither world government nor absolute state sovereignty. Instead, liberals have argued consistently for restrictions on the traditional powers of sovereignty, as well as for the vertical dispersion of sovereignty, “upwards towards supranational bodies, and also downwards toward particular communities within states” (2000: 101). In such a world order, states become “another level of appeal, and not the sole and final one” (2000: 101).

David Held argues that this dispersion of sovereignty is inevitable given that the nation-state does not exist in an insular world, but a highly interdependent and complex system: the contemporary reality consists of a globalized economy, international organizations, regional and global institutions, international law, and military alliances, all of which operate to shape and constrain individual states. Although national sovereignty still has a place in the contemporary world order,

interconnected authority structures … displace notions of sovereignty as an illimitable, indivisible and exclusive form of public power. (1995: 137)

In Held’s account of cosmopolitan democracy, the universal realization of the liberal ideal of autonomy, derived from Kant, ultimately requires long-term institutional developments such as the creation of a global parliament, an international criminal court, the demilitarization of states, and global distributive justice in the form of a guaranteed annual income for each individual (1995: 279–80). Although cosmopolitan theorists tend to reject the dichotomy posed between a political system of sovereign states and one with a centralized world government, and have tended to eschew the terminology of the world state in their accounts of global democratic institutional reform, William Scheuerman has argued that some of their proposals of supranational institutions mimic core attributes of traditional statehood, thus inadvertently bringing the world state back into liberal cosmopolitan visions of world order (2014). It is thus an open question whether “statist cosmopolitanism” (Ypi 2011), which considers states as viable agents of cosmopolitan justice, is feasible, or whether cosmopolitanism requires transcending the state system (Ulaş 2017).

2.3 Republican Nondomination and Global Democracy

Democratic, republican and critical theorists have become concerned with the global context of order and justice due to its importance for establishing protective external conditions for the moral and political achievements of centuries of domestic democratic political struggle. Traditionally, the main global threat was interstate war, thus the projects for perpetual peace. Today, democratic theorists worry that contemporary processes of globalization are undermining the achievements of democratic societies in the areas of civil and social rights such as access to education and healthcare, and the economic securities provided by the welfare state. From this perspective, economic globalization and the growing power of international and transnational institutions pose a potential threat to democratic ideals of civic equality and self-determination. The task of the democratic theorist is to think about how democracies can respond to these global developments in ways that best help preserve the fragile achievements of domestic democratic justice (Habermas 2004 [2006]; see also Scheuerman 2008). Increasingly, theorists of global democratic reform envisage the need to develop new institutions and practices of representation and accountability rather than merely to extend traditional constitutional models and electoral mechanisms of domestic democratic governance (Archibugi 2008; Macdonald 2008; Marchetti 2008; Tinnevelt 2012; Tanyi 2019; Erman 2019).

Key to discussions in democratic, republican and critical theory about global order and justice is the political ideal of nondomination. Neo-republican theorist Philip Pettit understands commitment to this ideal to entail reducing people’s vulnerability to alien control or the arbitrary power of others to interfere with their choices and their lives. In the international context, Pettit has outlined a “republican law of peoples” that has the twin goals of ensuring that every people is represented by a non-dominating government in a non-dominating international order (2010). Starting with a world of states, Pettit argues that a state which is “effective and representative of its people” fulfills the republican ideal of nondomination, and “it would be objectionably intrusive of other agents in the international order” to bypass such states and assume responsibility for its members (2010: 71–2). A legitimate international order is one

in which effective, representative states avoid domination—whether by another state, or by a non-state body—and seek to enable other states to be effective and representative too. (2010: 73)

In an international context, the sources of domination include other states; “non-domestic, private bodies” such as “corporations, churches, terrorist movements, even powerful individuals”; and “non-domestic, public bodies” such as the World Bank, the International Monetary Fund, and the North Atlantic Treaty Organization (2010: 77). While representative states realize nondomination internally for their members, individuals’ enjoyment of freedom as nondomination is not secured unless their states are protected in their external relations from dominating strategies, including “intentional obstruction, coercion, deception, and manipulation” as well as “invigilation”, and “intimidation” (2010: 74).

Pettit’s account presupposes the legitimacy of domestic democracies that ensure nondomination as a starting point for thinking about a legitimate international order, and he explicitly rejects the idea of a world state, modeled on a domestic republican regime, as an infeasible remedy for the challenges posed by domination in an international context (2010: 81; but see Koenig-Archibugi 2011). There is no easy solution, but Pettit considers feasible improvements to the current international order can be made by further developing multilateral

international agencies and forums by means of which states can work out their problems and relations in a space of more or less common reasons

as well as fostering greater solidarity among subgroups of weaker states so that they can form rival blocs that can resist domination by more powerful agents (2010: 84). While Pettit is mostly concerned with the dominating potential of powerful states, and considers international agencies to be less threatening (2010: 86), Cécile Laborde adds to Pettit’s account not only a concern for agent-relative domination, but also, and more centrally, systemic domination, which entails a greater awareness of the dominating potential of international organizations such as the International Monetary Fund, World Trade Organization and the World Bank (2010). One of the ways that powerful states dominate weak states is by “entrenching and institutionalizing” their dominant position through unfair international social structures in areas such as trade (2010: 57).

Indeed, Nancy Kokaz, in a republican interpretation of Rawls’s Law of Peoples, argues that “a global republic cannot be dismissed by a civic [republican] theory of global justice” (2005: 94). The civic pluralist ideal that is threatened by the advent of global capitalism and ensuing deracination requires “a global state powerful enough to protect local communities” from the homogenizing tendencies and “excesses of global capitalism” (2005: 93). In a further development of republican ideas about global order and justice, James Bohman has argued that a republican ideal of freedom as nondomination in the new global “circumstances of politics” requires political struggle in the direction of transnational democracy (2004 and 2007). According to Bohman,

under conditions of globalization, freedom from tyranny and domination cannot be achieved without extending our political ideals of democracy, community and membership. (2004: 352)

Not only are currently bounded democratic communities ineffective in resisting new global sources and forms of domination, they are also “potentially self-defeating”, constituting

a thousand tiny fortresses in which the oldest form of domination is practiced at many different levels: the domination of noncitizens by citizens, or nonmembers by members, using their ability to command noninterference much like those who live within gated communities. (2007: 175 and 180)

Daniele Archibugi has termed this

democratic schizophrenia: to engage in a certain [democratic] behavior on the inside and indulge in the opposite [undemocratic] behavior on the outside. (2008: 6)

Such vicious circles of “democratic domination” can only be overcome by making borders, membership and jurisdiction the subjects of democratic deliberation across dêmoi (Bohman 2007: 179). Whether or not democracy serves global justice depends on the possibility of transnational democratization, and Bohman sees two primary agents of such transformation, in democratic states pursuing “broadly federalist and regional projects of political integration”, such as the European Union, and in the less institutionalized activities of “participants in transnational public spheres and associations” (2007: 189). While some think that the formal development of regional or global institutions must be democratized in order to realize republican nondomination or democratic agency (Valentini 2012), others argue that global democracy may be justified mainly for its instrumental role in protecting and promoting

the fundamental interests of all the world’s citizens, rather than by that of maximizing citizens’ democratic agency

at the global level (Weinstock 2006: 10).

Critical theorist Iris Marion Young similarly calls for a global politics of nondomination, that would support “a vision of local and cultural autonomy in the context of global regulatory regimes” (2002: 237). Her model of global governance—“a post-sovereign alternative to the existing states system” (2000: 238)—entails a “decentred diverse democratic federalism” (2000: 253). While everyday governance would be primarily local, it would take place in the context of global regulatory regimes, built upon existing international institutions, that would be functionally defined to deal with

(1) peace and security, (2) environment, (3) trade and finance, (4) direct investment and capital utilization, (5) communications and transportation, (6) human rights, including labor standards and welfare rights, (7) citizenship and migration. (2002: 267)

Young envisages these global regulatory regimes to apply not only to states, but also to non-state organizations, such as corporations, and individuals. In terms of feasibility, Young points to the development of a robust “global public sphere” (Habermas 1998) as crucial to bringing about “stronger global regulatory institutions tied to principles of global and local democracy” (Young 2002: 272).

Increasingly, then, republican and democratic theorists view transnational and supranational institutions not as intrinsic threats to democratic freedom and justice, but as potentially instrumental institutional developments that are necessary to fortify the capacities of contemporary states to deliver on democratic and republican values. In this sense, supporting the development of transnational democratic institutions is consistent with upholding the values of national identity and belonging, and the proper functioning of states, by providing a robust framework to coordinate and discipline states into solving problems of human rights and global justice in areas such as labor, health, migration, and taxation, in a more fair, equitable, and non-dominating manner (Abizadeh 2008; Ronzoni 2012; Valentini 2012; Dietsch 2015; Fine & Ypi 2016; Cabrera 2018). Paradoxically, it may be that in conditions of globalization, only a world state can provide the essential supporting conditions for all states, including democratic ones, to enjoy effective and legitimate collective self-determination (Lu 2018). Thus, republican cosmopolitanism in the form of a world state may be less of an oxymoron than Pettit suggests.

2.4 Critics of Capitalism and a Neoliberal World State

An abiding controversy about the contemporary world economy is its potential to enhance or destroy societal goals of securing justice, freedom, and welfare provision, including the protection of human rights and democratic politics (Stiglitz 2002; Kinley 2009). Craig Murphy has worried that globalization would

inevitably be accompanied by the anti-democratic government of “expertise” or by the non-government of marketization at ever more inclusive levels. (2000: 800)

Economists have warned that the relationship between global economic integration, national self-determination, and democratic politics can be fraught (Rodrik 2011), and that capitalism has a tendency to reproduce and intensify inequality (Piketty 2013 [2014]). In the twentieth century, Immanuel Wallerstein (2011) developed the world-systems approach to analyzing the contradictions inherent in a capitalist world-system. Although imperial military competition gave way to a world of sovereign states in the era of decolonization, he noted that a capitalist world order perpetuates systems of domination to maintain capitalist interests, at the expense of the developing world. World-systems theory thus explains how capitalism forms a stable set of exploitative relations between core and peripheral states, resulting in an international division of labor that benefits the core at the expense of the periphery.

While world-systems theory posits that “economic exploitation of the periphery does not necessarily require direct political or military domination” (Kohn & Reddy 2006 [2017]), contemporary postcolonial theorists argue that the rise of neoliberal globalization can be marked by the establishment of international economic institutions that have dislocated the power of sovereign states to make economic decisions, and relocated them in international economic institutions—the WTO, IMF and World Bank—with effective enforcement powers.

Whereas realist, liberal and republican theorists typically posit that a world state is a possible futuristic institutional development to evolve from anarchy, postcolonial theorists have argued that anarchy does not accurately describe the global historical institutional reality. Some also argue that world government is already here, albeit in a nascent form (Albert et al. 2012; Goodin 2013). Critical and postcolonial theorists argue that the course of capitalist modernity has produced a nascent world state of neoliberal domination (Chimni 2004; Slobodian 2018). In such conditions of structural domination, a world state may be undesirable as a political project due to established and entrenched global hierarchies based on racist, patriarchal, and capitalist domination and exploitation (Robinson 1983; Pateman and Mills 2007). As B.S. Chimni has put it,

A network of economic, social and political [International Institutions] has been established or repositioned, at the initiative of the first world, and together they constitute a nascent global state whose function is to realize the interests of transnational capital and powerful states in the international system to the disadvantage of third world states and peoples. The evolving global state formation may therefore be described as having an imperial character. (2004: 1–2)

Although fragmented in structure, the future global state, according to Chimni, is in the process of congealing to actualize and legitimize a world-view that ultimately serves the transnational capitalist class comprising the owners of transnational capital. This class allies with the networks of international law and institutions to undermine the decision-making powers of states, especially those with weak institutional capacities, and to make decisions without transparency or effective participation of those affected.

While increasingly intrusive, the decisions of international economic and financial institutions remain largely unaccountable. According to Slobodian, neoliberal globalists actively sought to construct the institutions of the global economy to evade accountability, “to contain potential disruptions from the democratically empowered masses”, so that the global economy could be “protected from the demands of redistributive equality and social justice” (2018: 264). While the Washington Consensus seemed to be based on sound economic principles—that free markets “and competition enable the efficient allocation of scarce resources”—and forecast economic growth based on liberalizing trade, investment, and capital flows, its failure to produce growth or inclusive development in many countries has revealed the importance of empirical analysis to check ideological distortions of economic policy (Rodrik 2015). China’s economic transformation illuminates global challenges arising from the decline of “managerial capitalism”, or Fordism, which generated the regulatory state-model of governance, and the rise of “neoliberal capitalism”, or post-Fordism, defined by the “hollowing out” of the state, reduction of central regulatory capacity, coupled with flexible production processes disaggregated into production chains and networks, and increasing vulnerability of the peripheral workforce (Dowdle 2016: 207–229).

In response to these predicaments of contemporary capitalism, critical and postcolonial theorists emphasize that there is no option to return to a mythical world of autarkic or autonomous and insulated states with traditional sovereign prerogatives (Winter & Chambers-Letson 2015). Instead, globalized domination can only be transformed through globalizing transnational labor and social movements that struggle for greater democratization of the decision-making processes of both domestic and international institutions (Chimni 2004). In calling for a revision of the principles that regulate the relationship between the global economy and sovereign states, in order to buttress state power, especially of Third World states, against international economic and financial institutions, critical theorists join contemporary liberal (Isiksel 2020) and republican theorists who view the state as continuing to play an important role in securing equal human freedom. According to Adom Getachew, “postcolonial cosmopolitanism” acknowledges the persistent unequal integration and hierarchy produced by the world politics of empire, and views the reinforcement of the sovereign state, as well as the dispersion of sovereignty in regional federations and a redistributive international economic order, as key to anti-colonial struggles to resist domination and remake the world (2019: 34).

Given that the Eurocentric narrative of civilizational progress forwarded the nation-state as a marker of civilization, and fated Indigenous peoples to extinction with the advent of modernity, however, Indigenous political theorists have reason to be ambivalent about a Weberian state at any level of political organization. Some Indigenous political theorists have mounted radical challenges to the settler colonial state as well as the statist international order. Glen Coulthard’s critique of the liberal politics of multicultural recognition reveals that the struggle for recognition may not emancipate, but entrench subjects in the settler colonial subjectivity offered by the settler colonial state (2014). Following anti-colonial thinker Frantz Fanon, Coulthard argues that dominated agents need to struggle to create new decolonized frameworks of recognition that they can call their own, and not only seek equal recognition based on structures of settler colonial power, otherwise

the colonized will have failed to reestablish themselves as truly self-determining: as creators of the terms, values, and conditions by which they are to be recognized. (2014: 139)

Coulthard also understands the political project of Indigenous “resurgence” to be inextricably linked to the struggle to construct alternative social and economic systems to capitalism; thus for Indigenous resurgence to be successful, “capitalism must die” (2014: 173). Such Indigenous politics of refusal (Simpson 2014) of both statism and capitalism underscore that the struggle for recognition of Indigenous humanity in conditions of racial capitalist modernity entails radical structural transformations of global order (Lu 2017 and 2019).

3. Conclusion

The aim of much normative theorizing about global institutions and global justice is to interrogate whether a world government is feasible, desirable, or necessary for realizing human aspirations for just, inclusive, peaceful, and prosperous relations between the diverse individuals and groups that comprise a common moral community of humankind. Some think that the idea of world government involves a paradox: however it is conceived institutionally, when the winning conditions exist for establishing a desirable form of world government—one that will guarantee human security with individual liberty, protect the environment, and advance global social justice—it will no longer be necessary (Nielsen 1988: 276). Once all governments, especially the most powerful ones, are willing to use their power to build government networks that promote global peace, justice and environmental protection, and to cede some traditional rights of sovereignty to supranational institutions in areas such as the use of military force, the management and protection of the environment and natural resources, and the distribution of wealth, the establishment of a global political authority might seem superfluous. As Alexander Wendt has pointed out, however, a stable end-state of world order development requires such ideal conditions, should they ever develop, to become institutionalized into a world state that enacts “a global monopoly on the legitimate use of organized violence” (1988: 491); enforcement mechanisms are not superfluous, since there is always the possibility of violations by outlaw states and groups. In a similar vein, the Swedish philosopher Torbjörn Tännsjö has argued that neither voluntary multilateral cooperation under conditions of anarchy, nor a hybrid arrangement of “shared sovereignty between the world government and nation-states”, will be effective in resolving contemporary challenges in the realms of human security, global justice and the environment (2008: 122–125). Since sovereignty is indivisible, Tännsjö posits that a world state must have ultimate decision-making authority over nation-states over jurisdictional issues:

Unless there are sanctions available to the central authority to back up a decision as to where a question is to be handled, the system of states will be thrown back into a state of nature. (2008: 125–6)

From critical and postcolonial perspectives, however, the state of nature reference point of much of international relations theory is a normatively obscuring myth that occludes the hierarchies of structural domination that have pervaded the development of world order (Jahn 2000; Lu 2017: 120). Postcolonial and critical theorists often share the ethical concerns and moral commitments of normative theorists (Kohn 2013)—justice, equality, freedom, nondomination—but their theorizing focuses on the diagnostic task of analyzing the causes and character of contemporary structural and institutional developments, as well as the global processes and conditions that make them possible. They view contemporary global order, marked by radical imbalances and disparities produced by historic and ongoing structural injustices based on class, race, and gender, as serving certain functions and interests, in terms of what they naturalize, enable, suppress, and obscure. In 2020 and 2021, as a world divided by deep political, social and economic structural inequalities faces pandemic conditions, economic recession, and environmentally deleterious developments, the questions of whose sense of world community and whose global needs will define the global political agenda and order are more salient than ever.

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