A. Related Views

There are a number of philosophers and traditions that share the two key features of Anomalous Monism: its rejection of any reductive relationship between mental and physical events and properties, and its assertion of monism. In this section, we look briefly at one classic precursor to Anomalous Monism as well as several more recently developed positions that share these features. The comparisons help to shed further light on Anomalous Monism.

At the most general level, one distinctive component of Anomalous Monism is its a priori status. It is deduced logically from what are plausibly claimed to be a relatively bland set of assumptions themselves not clearly empirical in nature, and each, individually, acceptable to dualist ontological positions. (Certainly the anomalism principle is not empirical. While the cause-law principle has been claimed to be an empirical, and false, assumption (Cartwright 1983 – see §3.3), we have seen (§3.2) that Davidson himself views it as a priori. The interaction principle does not appear to be based upon empirical assumptions.) This a priori status sets Anomalous Monism apart from other forms of nonreductive monism that have been developed since Anomalous Monism was formulated. However, Anomalous Monism’s clearest philosophical ancestor, Spinoza (1985 [1677]), shared this a priori perspective, and Davidson explicitly acknowledges Spinoza’s anticipation of Anomalous Monism (Davidson 1999c). We begin with him.

A.1 Spinoza’s Parallelism

Spinoza held that the world was composed of only one kind of substance or stuff (monism) which exhibits distinct realms of physical and mental properties. On the standard reading of Spinoza’s metaphysics, these two realms are causally insulated from each other – while mental events can cause and result from other mental events, and physical events can cause and result from other physical events, there are no causal relations between mental and physical events. There are thus no strict psychophysical laws. But there are both strict physical and strict psychological laws. The causal insulation of the two realms, and the existence of strict psychological laws, appear to distinguish Spinoza’s position from that of Anomalous Monism.

Davidson, however, disputes this traditional reading of Spinoza’s metaphysics , emphasizing two key points. First, while Spinoza does indeed deny that there can be explanatory relations between the mental and the physical, his notion of explanation is quite demanding. ‘Explanation’ means ‘adequate explanation’, which in turn requires a demonstration of logical entailment between explanans and explanandum. Davidson happily concedes that no such relation exists between mental and physical properties and events. But he denies that one need impose such a strong requirement on causation and causal explanation. In any case, it is consistent with Spinoza’s position that mental events cause and are caused by physical events so long as one does not equate ‘cause’ with ‘logically entails’.

Second, and related to this, Davidson insists that while explanation is, intuitively, an intensional notion – one sensitive to how events are described – causation is extensional, obtaining between pairs of events independently of how they are described. As we have seen (§1, §§6–6.2), this distinction between causation and explanation is central to Anomalous Monism. Some interpreters of Spinoza, explicitly considering the question of his relation to Anomalous Monism, have denied that Spinoza would or should accept such an extensional account of causation (see Della Rocca 1991 and Jarrett 1991). Davidson replies that one needs to distinguish an opaque and a transparent concept of ‘cause’ (where the former involves sentences which do not allow the substitution salva veritate of co-referring expressions, and the latter does allow such substitutions). Davidson accepts that Spinoza himself probably had in mind the opaque concept, in keeping with historical tradition, but that nothing stands in the way of his accepting a needed transparent concept as well. Davidson sees this as the only way to get Spinoza out of being saddled with the logical absurdity that would result from holding that, for instance, the physical event of a bell ringing cannot cause a mental awareness of the ringing even though that mental awareness is identical (as Spinoza’s monism requires) with a physical event in the brain caused by the ringing.

According to Davidson, what Spinoza is really committed to is denying the possibility of a fully adequate (complete) explanation of the occurrence of the awareness by appeal to the laws of nature and the cause described in physical terms. This does not preclude holding that the ringing of the bell may cause us to be aware of the ringing. Davidson goes on to reject Spinoza’s infamous doctrine of parallelism, the view that the temporal order of physical events corresponds to the order and connection of ideas. Since the physical domain is governed by strict laws, this would entail the possibility (indeed, necessity) of strict, purely psychological laws. Just as events described physically would have a fully adequate explanation in terms of strict physical laws and initial conditions, so too would events described mentally need to have a fully adequate explanation in terms of strict mental laws and initial (mental) conditions. Davidson rejects this picture (as indeed Anomalous Monism must) because too many causes and effects of mental events are not themselves events with mental descriptions – the mental domain is thus ‘open’ in a way that the physical domain is not (§2.3). Every physical event has a fully adequate (strict) physical explanation, but no mental event can have a fully adequate (strict) mental explanation.

In these ways, then, Davidson finds points of significant contact between Anomalous Monism and Spinoza’s position, and attempts to soften or correct those points of apparent divergence. Davidson’s view appears to be that if Spinoza had had available to him the intensional-extensional distinction as well as a concept of causation that was not identical to logical entailment, his position would essentially be that of Anomalous Monism. However, related to Spinoza’s commitment to strict psychological laws is his infamous insistence on determinism and subsequent lack of free will and free action. Davidson claims, to the contrary, that Anomalous Monism, with its denial of strict psychophysical and psychological laws, is a key necessary condition of freedom (see supplement B.3).

A.2 Functionalism

Functionalist accounts of mental phenomena (for a good overview, see Block 1980) were the most prominent of the nonreductionist monist positions developed at around the same time as Anomalous Monism. According to functionalism, an adequate analysis of the meaning and individuation of propositional attitudes such as belief, desire, intention and other psychological states is in terms of the explanatory/causal role that they play in the etiology of behavior. Beliefs differ from desires, for instance, in the role that each plays in mediating the relations between perceptual inputs, behavioral outputs and other intervening psychological states. To believe something is just to be in a state that exhibits such a distinctive causal pattern. It is not relevant what realizes such a functional state, however, just so long as it is the sort of realizing media that can support such a pattern.

Associated with functionalism was the doctrine of multiple realizability: mental properties can, in practice as well as principle, be realized by a variety of media which do not share anything in common physically other than a capacity to support the distinctive pattern (Fodor 1974). Other species, with different internal wiring, can realize mental properties, and in principle so could extraterrestrial beings. Mental properties therefore cannot be reduced to physical properties because of this heterogeneous nature of the realizing physical media. However (at least according to most proponents of functionalism – see Lewis 1966), some physical media must play the realizing role – hence, monism.

Functionalism therefore differs from Anomalous Monism in appealing to multiple realizability rather than rationality as the ground for irreducibility. There are other important differences as well. For one thing, it is unclear what exactly grounds the monism of functionalism – in Anomalous Monism, the monism is derived in an a priori fashion from Davidson’s three principles, but it often seems to be simply an assumption within the functionalist framework (Fodor 1974, but again, see Lewis 1966). Indeed, some functionalists explicitly observe that their account is consistent with dualism (see Block 1980). Another key difference is that traditional functionalism has built into it a kind of reductionism, though not of the type-type variety. This comes out in the fact that the inputs and outputs between which the functional states are supposed to play their mediating role are typically required to be characterized in non-intentional terms. For instance, intending to stay dry would be (partially) defined not in terms of perceiving that it is raining and subsequently opening an umbrella, but instead in terms of something like sensory stimulations and mere bodily movements. Indeed, many functionalists claim to provide an analysis of mental properties in other, non-mental terms. Brian Loar (1981, 20–25) sees his functionalist account as a direct refutation of Anomalous Monism, purporting to account for the rational nature of mental states and events within a reductionist framework (see §4.1.3). But whether or not all functionalists view their accounts in these terms, it nonetheless appears that the nonreductionism of functionalism is of a vertical but not horizontal nature, so to speak. Mental properties cannot be reduced to their realizing physical properties (because of multiple realizability), but there will be strict lawlike generalizations (the distinctive patterns) that purport to define mental properties in non-mental terms – causal relations to non-mentally characterized inputs, outputs and other functional states.

Another point on which functionalism diverges from Anomalous Monism is in its attempt to account not only for the propositional attitudes – belief, desire, intention, etc. – but also for sentient states and events like pains and tickles – conscious phenomena that there is something it is like to experience (Nagel 1974). These wider aspirations have, however, proven to be especially problematic for functionalism. A standard objection has been that while the propositional attitudes may be given a plausible analysis in terms of causal patterns, the felt quality of sentient states and events cannot be analyzed in purely causal terms without losing touch with what is distinctive about such phenomena (Nagel 1974; Chalmers 1996; see §2.1).

Many of the same questions that arose in our examination of Anomalous Monism – in particular, concerning supervenience and mental causation – arise also in discussions of functionalism. Indeed, these questions arise for any property dualist monism – any theory on which mental and physical properties are thought of as distinct and irreducible but instantiated by the same set of states, events or substances. For instance, Kim 1992 argues that multiple realization actually entails a form of type-reduction, given the key physicalist assumption – the causal inheritance principle – that the causal powers/explanatory relevance of higher order properties is identical to and exhausted by those of all of their lower-order realizing properties. On this view, mental properties have no causal powers/explanatory value over and above those of their realizing physical properties. Kim’s formulation of the principle, however, is completely insensitive to the points about effect-types and interest-relativity of explanation discussed in §6.2 and supplement E.1). A more nuanced formulation of the principle also amenable to physicalists would respect those points by selecting, from the full set of realizing causal powers, those that actually play an explanatory role relative to particular effect-types. Such a formulation of the principle would not clearly lead to the reductionist conclusion pressed by Kim, yet would retain a physicalist ontology and also respect the insights of the dual explananda approach.

A.2.1 A Comparison of Davidson’s and Lewis’s Arguments for Monism

It is interesting to compare the argumentative strategy that Davidson employs for establishing monism with an earlier argument developed by David Lewis (Lewis 1966) that uses functionalism as a premise. Davidson cites Lewis’s article (Davidson 1970, fn. 7 – see below), but doesn’t discuss or even mention Lewis’s argument. Given that Lewis’s article was published before Davidson’s and is cited by him, and that the two arguments are strikingly similar in structure, it appears that Davidson was heavily influenced by Lewis’s argument in constructing his own, without explicitly acknowledging it. The following discussion in a sense logically reconstructs how Davidson might have gotten to his own argument for monism by considering Lewis’s. One caveat: Lewis’s argument for monism is formulated throughout in terms of “experiences”, which encompass both conscious, non-intentional mental phenomena as well as intentional propositional attitudes. Since Davidson focuses only the latter (see §2.1), the following discussion assumes this narrower focus. This doesn’t affect anything said about Lewis’s argument.

Consider the following very simple argument schema for establishing monism: (1) some mental events cause physical effects; (2) every physical effect has a physical cause; (3) therefore those mental events must be identical to the physical causes of their physical effects. This conclusion contradicts the classic Cartesian dualist picture, on which mental states and physical states are entirely different sorts of things. Davidson and Lewis share different versions of the first and second premises as well as the conclusion of this argument schema. In what follows we sort out these different versions and associated rationales and details.

Lewis actually (and apparently unknowingly) offers two quite different arguments for the identity of mental and physical states. Both appeal to functionalist (“causal”) conceptions of mental states, with the official one (Lewis 1966, 19–25) additionally invoking an assumption of the explanatory adequacy of physics (see below). Lewis’s second, unofficial argument (Lewis 1966, 17, purporting to gloss the official argument), instead appeals to an isomorphism (see also Lewis 1966, 21) between the causal patterns defining mental and physical states. This isomorphism forms the basis for the conclusion of identity between these states. The explanatory adequacy of physics plays no role in this second, unofficial argument. And the isomorphism claim is something that could only be uncovered by empirical investigation. As we will see, this makes the second, unofficial argument philosophically quite different than the official argument.

Lewis’s official argument assumes, first, the functionalist claim that distinctive causal patterns are definitive of different mental states, and that these patterns include causal relations to physical effects such as behavioral manifestations (Lewis 1966, 24 goes so far as to claim that all mental states have behavioral manifestations as their typical causal effects and so as part of their causal definitions). As an example, the belief that raising one’s hand will enable one to ask a question is causally defined partly in terms of typical physical effects such as one’s hand going up under appropriate conditions if one desires to ask a question. Lewis then assumes, second, the explanatory adequacy of physics: all physical effects that have explanations must have physical explanations (allowing for the possibility of an indeterministic universe in which some physical events have no explanation). From these two assumptions, Lewis draws the materialist conclusion that mental events must be identical to physical (neural) events. This is because the physical effects of mental states that partially define them must, according to the explanatory adequacy of physics, have physical explanations. These mental states must, therefore, be identical to those physical states that have to exist to explain those physical effects.

Since functionalism offers definitions of mental states, and since definitions are entirely general, it is mental types that are at issue, not mere tokens. Functionalism defines mental-types in terms of distinctive causal pattern-types, which include explanatory relations to physical-types (explanatory because causal relations can only obtain between tokens, not types – this point may be part of what informs Davidson’s (1970, fn. 7) one remark about Lewis’s article). Lewis’s argument should therefore be understood to proceed as follows: since functionalism posits that all mental event-types explain some physical effect-type or other, and the explanatory adequacy of physics holds that all physical effect-types must be explained by physical cause-types, all mental event-types must therefore be identical to the physical cause-types that explain those physical-effect types. It is therefore functionalism that, in focusing on types rather than tokens, explains the force of Lewis’s particular brand of monism: the identity of mental-types and physical-types.

With this point in mind, let’s return to the very simple argument schema for monism sketched above. Because of his focus on functionalist theory and thus mental types, Lewis must express the first premise of that schema (some mental events cause physical events) as “all mental event-types explain some physical some effect-type or other”, and the second premise (every physical effect has a physical cause) as “every physical effect-type has a physical cause-type explanation”. This enables the conclusion that Lewis is after: all mental-types are identical to the physical-types that explain their physical effect-types. And questions will now arise as to whether the intuitive premises of the very simple argument schema should be understood in Lewis’s type-versions in an argument for monism and hence against dualism. Here is where Davidson’s argument for monism deviates sharply from Lewis’s.

The strongest form of argument for monism should meet two general constraints: it should not depend on empirical investigation, and each of its premises ought to be, independently, neutral concerning dualism. The independence from empirical investigation is what makes it a conventionally philosophical argument, with necessarily true premises and conclusion known purely a priori, and so not hostage to contingent and potentially falsifiable empirically-based claims. The neutrality is needed in order to prevent the argument for monism from being circular, by appealing to premises that themselves assume monism or rule out dualism. Lewis’s argument is problematic in both of these respects.

Consider the functionalist theory in the first premise. Lewis notes that it definitionally rules out forms of dualism such as parallelism and epiphenomenalism (Lewis 1966, 20), because it includes causal relations between mental and physical events – something denied by parallelism and epiphenomenalism. This is perhaps unproblematic since contemporary philosophers as a rule don’t take parallelism seriously and desperately try to avoid epiphenomenalism (see §6). But Lewis fails to notice, far more importantly, that functionalism by definition rules out the paradigmatic form of dualism developed by Descartes as well. This is a problem, because it makes Lewis’s argument circular against the one form of dualism that is still taken seriously in contemporary debates and has come to exemplify dualism. It’s hard to see how Descartes could accept a theory that defines mental states as having physical effects. He certainly recognizes that mental states often have physical effects (and so he accepts the first premise of the very simple argument schema), but accepting that those effects define those mental states would be tantamount to giving up his dualism. Further, it is rather murky in Lewis’s version of functionalism whether it is empirically based or not (later functionalists are clearer in their own versions on this question). One wouldn’t generally think that the definitions of mental states offered by Lewis are empirically based, by virtue of being “analytical” and necessary (see Lewis 1966, 20–21). But Lewis sometimes talks in ways suggesting this and it is hard to see how statements concerning causal relations could not be empirically based. This issue is muddied by the fact that the causal statements relevant here are part of purported definitions that are supposed to be analytically necessary of mental states. This makes it hard to determine the empirical status of these purported definitions. Lewis’s first premise in his official argument is thus problematic regarding one constraint on arguments for monism and outright incompatible with the other.

With respect to Lewis’s second premise – the explanatory adequacy of physics – Lewis emphasizes that it is non-empirically based (Lewis 1966, 23), and claims that it is compatible with dualism (Lewis 1966, 23–24). He is arguably right about the first claim (see related discussion in §3.2 and §3.3) but wrong about the second. Lewis does correctly note that the explanatory adequacy of physics is compatible with dualist positions such as parallelism and epiphenomenalism, precisely because they deny causal interaction between mental and physical. (It is odd that Lewis emphasizes this compatibility, while acknowledging, as just discussed, the incompatibility between these dualist positions and functionalism. Why emphasize the compatibility of this premise with dualism unless one thinks this is a desideratum for any premise in an acceptable argument for monism?) But as noted above, these forms of dualism are at best marginal in contemporary debates. Lewis, again, oddly fails to even consider Cartesian dualism. Descartes certainly cannot accept that every physical event, whether token or type, must have a physical explanation. According to Descartes’s dualism, bodily movements caused by mental events have mental but not physical explanations. This is essential to his position. Lewis thus fails to register that Cartesian dualism, which still has proponents today, is ruled out by each of the premises he uses to establish monism taken individually. Lewis’s official argument for type-identity is therefore weaker than is ideal in possibly depending on empirical support, and in being clearly circular with respect to the Cartesian position that epitomizes dualism. His unofficial argument, distinguished earlier, faces similar problems.

So far we’ve seen that Lewis’s versions of the premises of the very simple argument schema for monism violate plausible constraints on the strongest form of argument for monism. What is particularly striking about Davidson’s argument for monism is that its premises are designed to meet those constraints. All are non-empirically based (see §2.2, §3.2 and §4). And all are neutral concerning dualism: Descartes explicitly accepts Davidson’s interaction principle; while not all mental events must have physical effects (this avoids Descartes’s problem with functionalism), some certainly do. Descartes clearly would also accept the anomalism principle. While he would obviously reject the conclusion of Lewis’s argument, which yields strict psychophysical laws – type-identities between mental and physical types – that are clearly inconsistent with Descartes’s dualism, more importantly he would reject the appearance of such laws in a premise of Lewis’s argument. Lewis’s functionalist definitions of mental states just are psychophysical laws, and are not only inconsistent with Descartes’s dualism but also with the form of freedom of the will that he espouses, as they would enable exceptionless predictions of human action (for discussion of the relation between anomalous monism and human freedom, focusing in part on whether Descartes and Davidson are right to see the anomalism principle as either necessary or sufficient for freedom, see supplement B.3). Descartes can also accept the cause-law principle: his dualism doesn’t require ruling out any strict laws covering causal relations, even those between mental and physical event-tokens. What it must rule out is the existence of strict psychophysical laws, which as just noted Descartes would see as contradicting dualism as well as threatening freedom of the will (for more on the relation between the explanatory adequacy of physics and the cause-law principle, see supplement C.1). Therefore, each premise in Davidson’s argument is non-empirically based as well as neutral concerning Cartesian dualism. And yet, taken together, they yield a monist conclusion (those mental event-tokens that do cause physical event-tokens must be token identical to physical-event tokens) inconsistent with Descartes’s dualism.

In light of the above comparison, it is a reasonable conjecture that Davidson’s own argument for monism came about at least in part as a result of grappling with Lewis’s official argument in light of the anomalism principle that Davidson came to independently, in something like the way reconstructed above. As we’ve seen, Davidson’s and Lewis’s arguments share the basic structure of the very simple argument schema for monism, in holding different versions of each of its premises and conclusion. But they differ dramatically in the compatibility of their versions of each premise with reasonable general constraints on arguments for monism.

A.3 Bare Materialism

Another version of nonreductive monism, put forward in different ways by Hornsby (1981, 1985, 1993), Leder (1985) and McDowell (1985), rejects the token-identity of Anomalous Monism and replaces it with a blander, bare materialist doctrine of substance monism. As we have already seen (§5.2), this is motivated, in the first instance, by the concern that it is simply too demanding to require that every mental event bear a uniquely identifying description in the language of physics – the fine-grained spatiotemporal specificity of the language of physics appears ill-suited to mental events. Davidson’s early view, recall, was that there must be such a fine-grained physical description for every causally interacting mental event, though he made no attempt to provide examples. McDowell (1985) sees this requirement as an overreaction to the threat of Cartesian dualism. He puts the point as follows:

…since it is not events but substances that are composed of stuff, one can refuse to accept that all the events there are can be described in ‘physical’ terms, without thereby committing oneself to a non-‘physical’ stuff or compromising the thesis that persons are composed of nothing but matter. (McDowell 1985, 397)

This view is essentially shared by Hornsby and Leder, each of whom questions both the intelligibility of attaching precise spatiotemporal parameters to mental events, and the purported necessity of doing so, in order to maintain a materialist position. McDowell and Hornsby subsequently come to question the cause-law principle, which, when appended to the interaction and anomalism principles (both of which are accepted by McDowell and Hornsby) leads to the token-identity thesis they question. Each sees the cause-law principle as unmotivated and, as we have seen, McDowell claims it to be inconsistent with another of Davidson’s basic commitments – his rejection of scheme-content dualism (see §3.3 and supplement B.1).

We have already seen that Davidson later came to weaken his early claim regarding uniquely identifying strict law descriptions for mental events. So the rationale for bare materialism, as an alternative to Anomalous Monism, seems less compelling. With respect to bare materialism taken on its own, it is also unclear what its rationale is for asserting materialism, even one of this minimalist variety, which focuses on substances (the person or perhaps the body) rather than events undergone by substances. One virtue of Anomalous Monism is that it provides a justification for its form of materialism. It is also not clear how mental events, when thought of as not describable in the language of physics, can be held to interact with events describable in physical language. Here concerns with a lineage going back to the earliest critics of Descartes, such as Pierre Gassendi and Princess Elisabeth of Bohemia, again rear their heads: if physical but not mental events (which supposedly interact) have precise spatiotemporal locations, how can events of such different kinds causally interact, and where is the locus of interaction? These questions are just as pressing for proponents of minimal materialism who reject token-identities of mental and physical events.

As discussed in §5.2, the spatiotemporal objection to Anomalous Monism is difficult to evaluate, depending as it does on our own current intuitions about the intelligibility of recognizing precise spatiotemporal dimensions for mental events and states. There is also Davidson’s later rejection of the requirement that such descriptions be uniquely identifying to take into account. Davidson’s point, early and late, however, is that based upon a priori argument we know that there must be some such description, even if we may never actually be in a position to make the relevant identifications.

A.3.1 Token-Identity and Minimal Materialism

As we have seen, Davidson’s central claim concerning monism is that what makes a mental event identical to a physical event is that the mental event has a physical description (§5). It has been objected that this is an extremely weak condition, making token-identity too trivial a thesis to merit the label of even the most minimal materialism (Antony 2003; Latham 2003). In particular, it is argued that an event could receive a physical description even though it might, for all we know, include, as a part, the thinking of an immaterial mind. Antony (2003) claims that such a ‘hybrid’ event must count as ‘physical’, according to Davidson, because of the physical description, but it would seem to be counterintuitive to accept this label given the presence and behavior of the immaterial mind. Now, an initial and seemingly plausible response to this is that if all physical events have physical explanations, as Davidson clearly believes, then the thinking/existence of this immaterial mind could have no causal consequences. We couldn’t, then, ever know of it, or have any reason to think it obtained, and it is not clear that its sheer conceivability (if it is conceivable – see below) should count against Davidson’s monism.

Antony acknowledges the inclination not to take this kind of dualism seriously, but argues that such inclinations don’t constitute arguments, and that if Davidson’s monism doesn’t rule it out it is an unacceptably weak conception of materialism. However, the impossibility of any evidence for such a position appears to constitute a rather strong argument against it. Antony also acknowledges the inclination not to consider such hybrid events as genuine events, but rather as clearly gerrymandered constructions like one incorporating this morning’s rainfall with some distant supernova. However, Antony rejects this too, claiming that unlike such gerrymandered events, his imagined hybrid events are “perfectly unified”. This, however, seems clearly wrong. Consider what is intuitively offputting about the obviously gerrymandered constructions – they incorporate events that are spatially unconnected. Can Antony claim something different about his hybrids? Since their phenomenal components are supposed to be mental, it seems that they can’t have spatial descriptions. But if so, they are indeed spatially unconnected to their supposed physical companion events. It’s hard to see how this warrants counting hybrids as genuine events as opposed to gerrymandered ones. (Note that this is especially (though not only) the case given Davidson’s later endorsement of the spatiotemporal criterion for event-individuation.) A connected worry relates precisely to what makes Davidson’s restriction of his argument for monism to causally interacting mental events reasonable. If an event or subevent has no causal consequences, what grounds do we or could we have for believing in its existence? Without such grounds, it sounds less unmotivated than Antony suggests to not take such proposals seriously. Antony seems to anticipate this concern (2003, 11), claiming that his hybrid events do causally interact with physical events by virtue of their physical companions. But by Antony’s own definition, the phenomenal component of the event is an event that does not causally interact with physical events (2003, 9). Hybrids enter into causal relations by virtue of the physical subevents only. This provides further grounds for doubting that they are genuine events that we could have evidence for. And this suggests that it is entirely reasonable not to take their possibility seriously as an objection to the strength of Davidson’s materialism.

A.4 Other Positions

Various other nonreductive monist positions have been developed that are motivated by concerns very different than those of Anomalous Monism. These positions raise issues that go beyond what can be addressed here, but some are worth noting. As observed above, one motivation derives from concerns with sentient phenomena – whether, given distinctive properties attaching to conscious states and events, they can be explained in terms of underlying physical states and events. Proponents of these views deny that such an explanation is possible, and subsequently assert various forms of property dualism together with a substance monism (see Chalmers 1996). And another nonreductive monist position has been motivated by appeal to a semantic thesis concerning how mental contents of propositional attitudes are determined. Some externalist views like Davidson’s hold that mental contents are determined in part by physical environmental factors. Others emphasize social factors, such as the role that experts play in constituting norms of usage for concepts to which laypeople defer. Some proponents of this view conclude that the attitudes in which these contents figure cannot be held to be token-identical to underlying physical states of those agents, even though all states and events may indeed be physical in some other sense (Burge 1979, 1993). Davidson (1987a) has forcefully argued, against this view, that the token-identity theory of mind is consistent with semantic externalism. (For related discussion, see supplement B.2.)