Common Ground in Pragmatics

Compare and contrast the following scenarios. In the first, Betty sends Fred an email saying that she will be in town tomorrow, and then sends the same message to Barney. In the second scenario, Betty addresses the two men jointly with one message. In both scenarios, Barney and Fred are apprised of the fact that Betty will be in town tomorrow, but otherwise their information states are palpably different: whereas in the first scenario they unwittingly share the same information, in the second scenario, it is common ground between the two men that Betty will be in town tomorrow.

Common ground is a central notion in pragmatics, and a fixture in discussions of reference, presupposition, speech acts, implicature, language conventions, fiction, and many other topics related to language use. Stalnaker (2014: 2) introduces common ground as

a body of information that is presumed to be shared by the parties to a discourse,

and descriptions like this abound in the literature. However, it is generally understood that common ground

is a sine qua non for everything we do with others—from the broadest joint activities to the smallest joint actions that comprise them. (Clark 1996: 92)

If the context of a discourse is the indefinitely large surroundings of the exchange, common ground is that part of the context that is shared, in some special sense that remains to be elucidated, between interlocutors. The pink marble in my pocket is part of the contexts in which I interact with others, but it isn’t common ground until I reveal it to them, verbally, manually, or otherwise. The nature of that special kind of sharing is controversial, and it is our main topic.

The bulk of this entry is devoted to the three main views on common ground: the container view, which treats common ground as a set of possible worlds or propositions; the mentalist view, which takes it to be a structure of mental states; and the normative view, according to which common ground is a structure of normative states. Each of these views is associated with a distinctive take on pragmatics and specifically on how speech acts change the common ground.

• 1. Introduction
• 2. The container view
• 3. The mentalist view
  • 3.1 Mentalist pragmatics and common ground
  • 3.2 The building blocks of common ground
  • 3.3 Unbounded common ground?
    • 3.3.1 Case-based arguments
    • 3.3.2 The logic of common ground
    • 3.3.3 The case against unbounded common ground
  • 3.4 Conclusion
• 4. Normative views
  • 4.1 Reasons to believe
  • 4.2 Normative pragmatics and common ground
  • 4.3 Conclusion
• 5. An inclusive view
• 6. Outside face-to-face settings
  • 6.1 Bigger audiences
  • 6.2 Anonymity
  • 6.3 Asynchrony
  • 6.4 Reduced interactivity
  • 6.5 Limits of common ground
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Introduction

While the notion of common ground goes back at least as far as C.S. Peirce (Pietarinen 2004, 2006), the term “common ground” was introduced in pragmatics by Paul Grice, who used it in his William James lectures of 1967 (Grice 1989). It gained some traction during the 1970s (Stalnaker 1978; Karttunen & Peters 1979), and then became firmly established, though it always had to compete with synonyms and near-synonyms. In the early 1990s, Clark (1992: 21) listed nine alternative terms that, at the time, were being used in roughly the same way: “shared knowledge”, “conversational context”, “common set of presumptions”, “shared sets”, “contextual domain”, “tacit assumptions”, “pragmatic presuppositions”, “normal beliefs”, and “mutual beliefs”. Many of these were short-lived, but there is a family of labels that remains current. They are collocations formed by prefixing an adjective like “mutual”, “common”, or “joint”, to a noun like “knowledge”, “belief”, “information”, or “acceptance”; hence “common knowledge”, “mutual acceptance”, “joint belief”, and so on.

In practice, this terminological free-for-all hasn’t done much harm, but it is liable to cause misunderstandings when a variety of views on common ground are under discussion, as is the case here. In order to contain the confusion somewhat, readers are advised, as a rule of thumb, to construe quoted expressions like “common knowledge” and “mutual belief” as synonymous with “common ground”. In my own usage, “mutual” will be firmly associated with common ground and “shared” will be its superordinate until §4.2, where the two adjectives become synonyms.

Communication and common ground are mutually dependent and affect one another. On the one hand, our utterances depend on the common ground in numerous ways. Pronouns are a familiar example: an utterance of “She did it” will not make much sense unless it is settled what “she” and “it” refer to, and these expressions take their referents from the common ground. And this is by no means an isolated example; common ground is a stock ingredient in theories of definite descriptions (Clark & Marshall 1981; Ludlow 2004 [2022]), fiction and pretence (Eckardt 2014; Semeijn 2021), conversational implicature (Geurts 2010; Green 2017), language conventions (Lewis 1969; Gilbert 2014; Geurts 2018), lying and deception (Stokke 2018; Marsili 2023), presupposition (Stalnaker 1970, 1974; Beaver, Geurts, & Denlinger 2021), quantification (Roberts 1995), and many other aspects of pragmatic interpretation.

On the other hand, our linguistic interactions change the common ground. Again the instances are legion, and include several of the cases listed in the last paragraph, but speech acts stand out. Assertions, questions, commands, greetings, etc. change the common ground on several levels. For example, if Barney tells Betty, “I’ll feed the cat”, it becomes common ground between them not only that Barney uttered the sentence “I’ll feed the cat”, but also, and more importantly, it is now common ground that Barney has expressed his intention and undertaken the commitment to feed the cat.

Hence, there are three main questions concerning the general topic of this entry:

1. What is common ground and what distinguishes it from merely shared information?
2. How do our linguistic interactions change the common ground?
3. How do our linguistic interactions rely on and exploit the common ground?

Our chief question is the first, and since the answers to it differ widely between theoretical frameworks, sundry approaches to pragmatics will be considered, too. The relevant differences between these approaches manifest themselves most clearly in how they treat the effects of speech acts on the common ground, so the second question will be addressed at least partially. The third question has comparatively little bearing on our main topic, and is therefore left aside.

2. The Container View

The simplest way of conceptualising common ground is as a glass container filled with information. Glass is best, because the information must be equally available to all interlocutors. More formally, the common ground is a set of propositions or possible worlds that represent what the actual world might be like. Here we will go with Stalnaker’s (1970; 1974) possible-worlds account of common ground, because it is the simplest.^[1] Suppose Betty and Barney agree that it will not rain today, but they haven’t agreed yet whether it will be warm enough for swimming. Then Betty and Barney’s common ground is a set of worlds in which it will be dry today, while it is true in some and false in others that it will be warm enough for swimming.

Now Betty checks out the weather forecast and learns that it will be 24°C (∼75°F) in the afternoon, and she rushes to tell Barney that it will be warm enough for swimming. Then all worlds in which it is not warm enough for swimming are expunged from Betty and Barney’s common ground. Thus, in this framework, assertion is defined as a speech act that serves to restrict the common ground (Stalnaker 1978). More generally, the programme associated with the container view is to define speech-act types in terms of their effects on the common ground.

This view on common ground is highly abstract and as a consequence its explanatory power is limited (García-Carpintero 2015; Harris 2020; Marsili 2023). Consider, for example, how we might analyse promises along the same lines as assertions. How does a promise change the common ground, if the common ground is just a set of worlds? Suppose Barney promises Betty to mow the lawn. It may well be that the state of affairs Barney undertakes to bring about is adequately captured by removing from the common ground all worlds in which Barney fails to mow the lawn. But then we will be treating promises as assertions, and the two categories become indistinguishable. Similar issues arise with other speech acts, and while in some cases they have been addressed, proposed solutions always involve new structures for speech acts to change. Thus Portner (2007) introduces a “to-do list” and proposes that the defining purpose of a command is to add an item to that list. In the same vein, Roberts (2012) introduces a stack of “questions under discussion” for questions to manipulate. The details of these proposals don’t matter here. What matters is that they are ad hoc in the sense that they don’t make essential use of the framework.

Another telling illustration of the limited explanatory power of the container view is that it fails to capture the key distinction between common ground and information that is merely shared. Consider again the set of worlds introduced earlier as Betty and Barney’s common ground; call it \(W\). So, by hypothesis, in all worlds in \(W\) it will be dry today. Now consider an alternative scenario, in which Betty and Barney merely happen to share the information that it will be dry today, which is represented by a set of worlds in which it will be dry today. Call this set \(W'\) and note with alarm that \(W\) and \(W'\) may well be the same set. That is to say, there is nothing in the content or structure of a set of worlds to suggest, let alone imply, that it is anyone’s common ground. If we adopt the container view, the distinction between common ground and merely shared information is left unaccounted for.

Conclusion: although the container view may have some heuristic value, it is too abstract to do much theoretical work under its own steam.

3. The Mentalist View

3.1 Mentalist pragmatics and common ground

Communication is usually described as the transmission or exchange of information, knowledge, or ideas. In accordance with this folk-pragmatic picture, mentalist theories of pragmatics concentrate their attention on the psychological states of speakers and hearers. On a mentalist account it may be held, for example, that by telling you that the cat is on the mat, I express my belief in the proposition that the cat is on the mat, I intend to instil the same belief in you, and my communicative bid is successful if and only if you come to believe that the cat is on the mat. This style of analysis has been developed in many different ways, most of which take their lead from Grice (1957) by giving pride of place to communicative intentions (Bach & Harnish 1979; Sperber & Wilson 1995; Stalnaker 2014). There is considerable variation within this family of accounts, but that need not concern us here.

Mentalist pragmatics is naturally twinned with a mentalist conception of common ground, in which common ground is a structure of mental states, notably knowledge or belief. For example, Bach and Harnish (1979: 5) define common ground as mutual belief, which they define as follows:

Which is equivalent to:

On this type of account, the mutuality of common ground is captured in terms of higher-order belief sharing. If I tell you that the cat is on the mat, and thereby make you believe that the cat is on the mat, then you and I share the belief that the cat is on the mat, but not only that: we also share the belief that we share that belief, and we share the belief that we share the belief that we share that belief.

That’s a lot of belief sharing already, and since there will be more, it will be useful to have a compact notation to represent arbitrary orders of belief sharing within a group:

Using this notation, Bach and Harnish’s definition of mutual belief may be rendered thus:

According to this definition, mutual belief is a bounded notion: the recursion stops at level 3. Proponents of this type of account typically hold that mutual belief spans a handful of levels, at most, and that the number of orders is not rigidly fixed:

Higher-level beliefs are in principle possible, and indeed among spies or deceptive intimates there could be divergence at level four or higher without divergence at the first three levels, but we think such higher-level beliefs are not possible for a whole community or large group. (Bach & Harnish 1979: 309)

An industrial-strength conception of mutual belief is obtained by letting the recursion run free:

On this definition, if you and I mutually believe that \(p\), then both of us believe \(p\), both of us believe that both of us believe \(p\), and so on forever. Thus construed, common ground requires that all parties have an infinitely large number of beliefs. This view on common ground is the best known as well as the most controversial; we will discuss it in §3.3.

How do speech acts change the common ground? Take assertion, which, especially amongst philosophers, remains the archetypical speech act (Pagin & Marsili 2021). Suppose that Wilma says to Betty, “Fred snores”, and as a consequence it becomes common ground between Wilma and Betty that Fred snores. How can that be? In outline, a mentalist explanation might go as follows. By saying that Fred snores, Wilma expresses the belief that Fred snores and that she intends Betty to adopt that belief, too. Betty trusts Wilma to be truthful and therefore comes to believe that Fred snores. All this is common ground between Wilma and Betty, and therefore the effect of Wilma’s utterance is that it becomes common ground between them that Fred snores.

Let’s flesh out this outline on the assumption that common ground is mutual belief of some order \(n\). So we have:

(1)

Betty and Wilma believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) that Wilma believes that Fred snores.

(2)

Betty and Wilma believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) that Betty believes that Fred snores.

If common ground is mutual belief, these propositions capture the two main assumptions of the last paragraph: that it is common ground between Betty and Wilma (1) that Wilma’s assertion is sincere and (2) that Betty trusts Wilma’s assertion to be truthful. Presumably, both assumptions would hold in a normal run of events, but both are contingent: Betty may have reason to suspect that Wilma is mistaken or lying, in which case (1) or (2) or both will fail to be true, and it will not become common ground that Fred snores. But suppose that (1) and (2) both hold; then it readily follows that:

(3)

Betty and Wilma believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) that Betty and Wilma believe\(_{\langle 1\rangle}\) that Fred snores.

In other words, it is common ground between Betty and Wilma that they share the belief that Fred snores. This is not quite the same as saying that it is common ground between Betty and Wilma that Fred snores, but we’re getting there. We just need the following axiom:

If we accept this, as seems reasonable, it is easy to prove that (3) entails:

(4)

Betty and Wilma believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) that Fred snores.

Which is to say that it is common ground between Betty and Wilma that Fred snores. Since \(n\) was arbitrary, this argument goes through regardless whether mutual belief is bounded or unbounded.

Although this small case study merely gives a flavour of how, in a mentalist framework, speech acts may affect the common ground, it already brings out two important points in which mentalist accounts differ from the container view. First, speech acts aren’t defined in terms of their effects on the common ground, but rather in terms of the interlocutors’ mental states; common ground is less central to mentalist pragmatics than it is on the container view. Secondly, any changes in the common ground that a speech act may trigger are indirect and substantially dependent on the common ground: it takes quite some common ground for our utterances to change the common ground.

3.2 The building blocks of common ground

Thus far we have considered how common ground may be defined in terms of beliefs. Other variations on the same mentalist theme use different mental states as the building blocks of common ground, for example, knowledge (Clark & Marshall 1981), acceptance (Stalnaker 2014), or manifestness (Sperber & Wilson 1995); here we will briefly look at the first and a bit longer at the second. Formally, all these variations are quite similar to the ones discussed before, for they all define common ground as mutual \(S\), for some type of mental state \(S\). For example, mutual knowledge is defined thus:

Outside pragmatics, formal theories of mutual knowledge have been developed by economists, computer scientists, and logicians (Fagin, Halpern, Moses, & Vardi 1995; Vanderschraaf & Sillari 2023), but it seems to be generally agreed that knowledge is too strong a concept for defining common ground. For, if common ground is defined as mutual knowledge, then \(p\) cannot be common ground unless it is true that \(p\), and surely we want to allow it to be common ground between Fred and Barney that Napoleon was Greek, even if they are wrong.

What we need, it seems, is a non-factive mental-state concept. Belief is the most obvious candidate, but there are others. Following Fraassen (1980), Stalnaker (1984) makes a distinction between acceptance and belief, where the former is more general than the latter:

Acceptance, as I shall use this term, is a broader concept than belief; it is a generic propositional attitude concept with such notions as presupposing, presuming, postulating, positing, assuming and supposing as well as believing falling under it. (1984: 79)

I accept a proposition \(p\) if I treat it as true, which I may do without believing \(p\), and even if it is common ground that I reject \(p\) (cf. Bratman 1992; Cohen 1992). For example, I may accept \(p\) as a working hypothesis in scientific inquiry or with a view to proving that it is false. These are rather special cases, and indeed, according to Stalnaker, accepting a proposition without believing it to be true is a special thing to do.

Therefore, while Stalnaker (2014) defines common ground as mutual acceptance, he qualifies his definition by saying that

belief (and common belief) are the default settings for acceptance for the purpose of the conversation (and for common ground). (2014: 45)

That is to say, whereas acceptance is a more general notion than belief, it defaults to belief, ceteris paribus, and by the same token, common ground defaults to mutual belief, ceteris paribus. Hence, in the final analysis, what Stalnaker proposes is a pluralist account: for the most part, common ground consists of mutual beliefs, while some propositions are mutually accepted but not mutually believed. The idea that common ground is a heterogeneous structure is widely endorsed (Karttunen & Peters 1979; Clark 1996); its ramifications remain under-explored.

While holding that mutual belief entails mutual acceptance, Stalnaker also allows for the possibility

that something is mutually believed, but not part of the common ground, because one or another of the parties to the conversation is not prepared to acknowledge that it is mutually believed, and so not prepared to draw on this information in the conversation. (Stalnaker 2014: 45)

For example, a driver stopped for speeding might say, “I’m in a bit of a hurry, is there any way we can settle this right now?”, thereby suggesting a bribe without being upfront about it (Pinker, Nowak, & Lee 2008; Camp 2018). Following Stalnaker’s suggestion, in this case it would be mutual belief, but not common ground, that the speaker is offering a bribe. However, given that, on Stalnaker’s account, common ground is mutual acceptance and entailed by mutual belief, this analysis is self-contradictory. (For more critical discussion of Stalnaker’s notion of acceptance, see Kölbel 2011.)

3.3 Unbounded common ground?

Whereas bounded notions of common ground haven’t caused much controversy, opinions on unbounded common ground are sharply divided, with some authors taking it for granted that common ground must be an infinite structure of mental states, while others dismiss this idea as absurd on psychological grounds.^[2] In this section, we will first consider the arguments in favour of the hypothesis that common ground is infinite, and then assess the arguments against.

3.3.1 Case-based arguments

One way of arguing in favour of unbounded common ground is by way of example (e.g., Clark & Marshall 1981; Vanderschraaf & Sillari 2023). Informal arguments of this sort tend to be long-winded, and in the interest of brevity and clarity I will give a comparatively simple example of my own devising, whose key passage is closely modelled on a scenario by Vanderschraaf and Sillari (2023). The first stage of the argument resembles the argument in §3.1, which served to illustrate how speech acts can change the common ground, but whereas there common ground was presupposed, here we seek to prove that infinite common ground is entailed by such acts.

It isn’t hard to see that this argument is flawed. It offers a description of how Fred and Wilma may reason, but given that they believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) \(p\), no argument to the effect that they are entitled or even committed to believe\(_{\langle n+1\rangle}\) \(p\) will prove that they actually believe\(_{\langle n+1\rangle}\) \(p\). If common ground is defined as an infinite structure of beliefs (say), then no group can have common ground on anything unless each of its members has infinitely many beliefs, and no argument proving merely that they are entitled or committed to such-and-such beliefs will suffice to prove that they actually have them.

3.3.2 The logic of common ground

Another and perhaps weightier reason for supposing that common ground must involve unbounded recursion is that this is a standard feature of formal theories of mutual knowledge, mutual belief, and related notions (Vanderschraaf & Sillari 2023). Here we will focus on the possible-worlds analyses of belief and mutual belief, which Stalnaker’s (2002, 2014) account of common ground is based on (Fagin et al. 1995; Rendsvig, Symons, & Wang 2023).

Suppose that Betty believes, wrongly as it happens, that Wilma has a cold, but is undecided about whether Napoleon was French or not. Hence, as far Betty can tell, it may be the case that Napoleon was French or it may be the case that Napoleon was not French. We model Betty’s doxastic state as follows. Let \(p\) be the proposition that Wilma has a cold and \(q\) the proposition that Napoleon was French. Then in the actual world, call it \(w_0\), \(p\) is false and \(q\) is true. Since Betty’s belief that \(p\) disagrees with the facts, her doxastic world is different from \(w_{0}\). Or rather, her doxastic worldS (plural) are different from \(w_{0}\), because Betty allows for two possible states of affairs, \(q\) and \(\neg q\), that exclude one another. In order to represent Betty’s wavering on \(q\) versus \(\neg q\) we introduce two doxastic worlds, \(w_{1}\) and \(w_{2}\), and stipulate that \(q\) is true in one and false in the other; \(p\) is true in both worlds. Hence, Betty’s doxastic state may be summarised as follows:

\[ \begin{align*} & w_0: \neg p, q\\ & w_1: p, q\\ & w_2: p, \neg q\\ \end{align*} \]

While \(w_{0}\) is the actual world, with Betty in it, \(w_{1}\) and \(w_{2}\) are “accessible” to Betty from \(w_{0}\) in the sense that they represent what the actual world might be like, by Betty’s lights. The relations between these three worlds may be visualised thus:

In this graph, the arrows pointing from \(w_0\) to \(w_{1}\) and \(w_{2}\) represent the doxastic alternatives accessible to Betty from \(w_0\). That Betty believes \(p\) is represented by the fact that \(p\) is true in all of her doxastic alternatives; her wavering about \(q\) is represented by the fact that \(q\) is true in some but not all accessible worlds.

Different people have different beliefs, which require different accessibility structures. For example, suppose that Barney’s doxastic state agrees with Betty’s except that he considers it possible that Wilma doesn’t have a cold:

In this model \(p\) is true in some but not all accessible worlds, and therefore Barney doesn’t believe \(p\); he merely considers it possible that \(p\).

In the foregoing examples, all arrows leave from the same world, but the possible-worlds framework admits of richer structures, too:

Fred’s doxastic state is the same as Betty’s, except that \(w_{1}\) and \(w_{2}\) are accessible to each other. Thus, the model represents information not only about Fred’s beliefs, but also about his beliefs about his beliefs. To explain this, recall that, in the possible-worlds framework, an individual \(x\) believes \(p\) iff \(p\) is true in all worlds that are accessible from \(x\)’s world. Given that \(w_{2}\) is the only world that is accessible from \(w_{1}\) and vice versa, and that \(p\) is true in both worlds, we have:

(1)

a.

In \(w_{1}\), Fred believes that \(p\) (because \(p\) is true in \(w_{2}\)).

b.

In \(w_{2}\), Fred believes that \(p\) (because \(p\) is true in \(w_{1}\)).

(2)

a.

In \(w_{1}\), Fred believes that he believes that \(p\) (because (1b) holds).

b.

In \(w_{2}\), Fred believes that he believes that \(p\) (because (1a) holds).

And so on.

Since \(w_{1}\) and \(w_{2}\) are the only worlds accessible from \(w_{0}\), it follows that, in \(w_{0}\), Fred believes that \(p\), he believes that he believes that \(p\), and so on.

This case demonstrates the elegance and the power of the possible-worlds framework. Our model of Fred’s doxastic state is obviously finite, and not only that, it is quite small, to boot: three nodes interconnected by four arrows. And yet, this very simple finite structure supports infinitely many beliefs about beliefs. At the same time, our model of Fred’s doxastic state raises doubts about the framework. It is widely agreed, and with good reason, that it is psychologically challenging to have higher-order mental states, let alone mental states of any order (Armstrong forthcoming). This consensus seems to clash with the simplicity of the model. For at least at first blush it appears unlikely that an infinitely large configuration of mental states reduces to such a trivial structure. Something has got to give: either the accepted wisdom about the complexities of belief is mistaken or else something is amiss with the possible-worlds analysis.

I think it’s the latter, but first let us see how mutual belief is captured in the possible-worlds framework. This turns out to be surprisingly straightforward; it’s simply a matter of merging doxastic states (Fagin et al. 1995; Stalnaker 2014). Fred and Wilma’s individual doxastic states are both represented by structures consisting of a set of worlds and an accessibility relation. If these structures are merged, we obtain the same kind of structure, which may be seen as representing the doxastic state of the Flintstones as a couple, including the couple’s beliefs, which are Fred and Wilma’s mutual beliefs. Thus, the mutual beliefs of a group are derived from the beliefs of its individual members by merging accessibility structures (more precisely, by taking their transitive union).

This, then, is standard doxastic logic, which according to Stalnaker (2002, 2014), is the logic of belief as well as acceptance, and therefore the logic of common ground. If that were true, it would vindicate the view that common ground is an infinite structure of mental states. However, doxastic logic is widely agreed to be ill-cast as a theory of belief. This is conceded even by its advocates, who readily admit that the theory is “highly idealized” and may be applicable “only to idealized knowers—those with superhuman logical capacities” (Stalnaker 2006: 172). The problem is that some of the logic’s constitutive principles are way too strong. For example, one of its principal tenets is that you believe everything that logically follows from what you believe:

Closure under entailment

If \(p\) entails \(q\) and \(x\) believes \(p\), then \(x\) believes \(q\).

Given that, in a possible-worlds framework, belief is defined as universal quantification over worlds (\(x\) believes \(p\) iff \(p\) is true in all worlds accessible to \(x\)), it necessarily follows that beliefs are closed under entailment. It isn’t hard to see that this has unpalatable consequences. It implies, for example, that since mathematical truths hold in all worlds, everyone who believes anything at all inevitably believes that the Pythagorean theorem is true. But sadly, it is an all too familiar fact about the human condition that we don’t believe everything that is entailed by what we believe.

A less controversial principle, which is standardly accepted in doxastic logic, is the following:^[3]

Stacking

If \(x\) believes \(p\), then \(x\) believes that \(x\) believes \(p\).

On the face of it, this may seem plausible. But what plausibility it has begins to wither when we let the recursion run for more than three or four iterations. For example, if the Stacking principle holds, it is logically impossible for Betty to believe that Napoleon was Greek unless she also believes that she believes that she believes that she believes that she believes that she believes that she believes that she believes that she believes that she believes that Napoleon was Greek. This doesn’t feel right, at all.

Nothing in the above is to imply that doxastic logic is just a bad idea. It is merely to say that it is inadequate as a theory of mental states and therefore fails to support the view that common ground is an infinite structure of such states. In §4 it will be shown that, on some non-mentalist construals of common ground, it may plausibly be held that common ground is infinite and that doxastic logic is its logic.

3.3.3 The case against unbounded common ground

The upshot of the foregoing discussion is that, as things currently stand, there are no compelling arguments in favour of the view that mentalist common ground is unbounded. However, it is often said that the mentalist view must be wrong, because it creates fatal processing issues:

How exactly do the speaker and hearer distinguish between knowledge that they merely share, and knowledge that is genuinely mutual? To establish this distinction, they would have, in principle, to perform an infinite series of checks, which clearly cannot be done in the amount of time it takes to produce and understand an utterance. (Sperber & Wilson 1995: 18)

This line of argument is seriously flawed. It presupposes that the entire series of propositions that define common ground must be verified, one after the other, in order to establish that there is common ground. If that were true, the notion that common ground is unbounded would indeed be untenable. But we have seen how, in a mentalist framework, new common ground may be created in the wake of our communicative exchanges, regardless whether it is bounded or unbounded (§3.1), and more importantly, we have seen that there are various ways of representing unbounded common ground in a succinct manner; for example:

That’s 31 characters, spaces and punctuation included, and whether or not this particular definition is plausible from a psychological point of view, it proves by way of example that a simple and compact representation of unbounded common ground is possible.

The problem is not that unbounded common ground, mentalistically construed, would be impossible for finite creatures to represent, or that such creatures couldn’t decide whether they had it. Rather, the problem is an ontological one: if common ground is unbounded mutual belief (say), then there cannot be common ground unless all parties actually have infinitely many distinct beliefs. Is that possible?

Obviously, the answer to this question hinges on what beliefs are (Wilby 2010; Scarafone 2021), which is a controversial topic, to put it mildly. Beliefs have been variously held to be mental representations, physical states, functional states, behavioural dispositions, or a combination of several of the aforementioned, and then there is also the view that beliefs don’t exist in the first place (Schwitzgebel 2006 [2023]). While that debate is about the nature of beliefs (if there are any), here we are concerned with the role that beliefs are to play in pragmatic theory. This is a major foundational issue and it is compounded by the fact that beliefs may have more than one role to play. On the one hand, it may be supposed that pragmatics is concerned with, inter alia, the beliefs that language users have. On the other hand, pragmatics is often supposed to be concerned with the beliefs that language users attribute to others and themselves. Neither view entails the other; it is not inconsistent to deny the existence of beliefs and affirm that belief attribution exists. But if both views are endorsed together, as they often are, then the question of whether mutual belief can be unbounded presents itself twice, and the answer need not be the same in both cases. For example, if beliefs are physical states and attributed beliefs behavioural dispositions, then mutual belief might be argued to be more problematic in the first sense than in the second.

The upshot of the foregoing discussion is simply this. In order to decide whether, on a mentalist construal, the notion of unbounded common ground is coherent at all, a considerable amount of foundational groundwork needs to be done first. In the meantime, it’s probably best to postpone our verdict and treat this notion as alive but not kicking.^[4]

In one of the first contributions to the literature on mutual knowledge, Schiffer (1972) tried to defuse the problem under discussion by appealing to a distinction between explicit and implicit knowledge. The same distinction can and has been made for belief, so Schiffer’s argument applies to mutual belief, as well. He reasoned as follows. Most of our everyday knowledge is implicit in the sense that it involves propositions that we never considered or will consider. For example, an Oxford philosophy don who never considered whether his maternal grandmother was married to Benito Mussolini may still be said to know that that is not the case (Schiffer 1972: 36). Schiffer claimed that this is how we know most of the propositions that constitute mutual knowledge. Put otherwise, mutual knowledge is largely implicit, and since implicit knowledge is not represented explicitly, mutual knowledge is achievable with finite resources.

This argument is flawed. Whereas we are prepared to grant the Oxford don his knowledge because he can infer it immediately and effortlessly from what he knows explicitly, it is out of the question that, starting with the first three or four orders of shared knowledge, we can immediately and effortlessly infer any further order. Moreover, whereas Schiffer’s don would readily and unreflectingly avow that his maternal grandmother wasn’t married to Benito Mussolini, I’m sure that nobody (not even a congregation of Oxford dons) will readily and unreflectingly avow that they know\(_{\langle 76\rangle}\) \(p\), say. Hence, while the distinction between explicit and implicit knowledge may be plausible and may plausibly extend to mutual knowledge, it will not help to justify the claim that mutual knowledge is unbounded.

3.4 Conclusion

There is no doubt that people attribute mental states to each other and themselves, and that at least some of these mental states are higher-order beliefs or higher-order knowledge. After all, people say things like, “I believe that Barney believes that Betty is cheating on him” or, “Barney knows that Betty knows that he is cheating on her”. It is an open question how common this practice is, nor is it certain at all that we covertly engage in such attributions on a regular basis. But while these issues remain to be settled, the least we can say for now is that the mentalist view on common ground is coherent and receives some support from empirical facts. Provided, that is, that common ground is bounded. For, if it is a structure of mental states, the notion that common ground is unbounded, i.e., that this structure is infinitely large, is very much in dispute: the arguments in its favour are weak, at best, and although the arguments against it don’t settle the matter, this notion is widely mistrusted.

It bears emphasising that this issue only concerns mentalist theories of common ground. As we will see in the upcoming section, non-mentalist theories need not be affected by it, and may entail with impunity that common ground is unbounded.

4. Normative Views

And now for something completely different. We switch to a non-mentalist stance and proceed to discuss two views on common ground in which normativity plays a key role. These views differ greatly from one another, but share two signal features. First, while it is controversial whether mental states like belief have a logic at all, the normative accounts that we’ll be discussing arguably have logics of the kind discussed in the foregoing. Second, and relatedly, on either account it may be held that common ground is unbounded.

4.1 Reasons to believe

In his seminal monograph on convention, David Lewis (1969) outlined a theory of what he dubbed “common knowledge”. Unfortunately, that was a misnomer, as Lewis (1978: 44) came to realise, but the label stuck and it is still widely held that, in his book, Lewis proposed an account of common knowledge. He didn’t. In reality, what he proposed was a type of structure consisting of “reasons to believe”. In the parlance and notation of this entry, Lewis proposed that \(p\) is common ground between the members of a group iff everyone has-reason-to-believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) that \(p\), for all \(n\). Hence, Lewisian common ground (which he called “common knowledge”) is unbounded.

According to Lewis, \(p\) is common ground between the members of a group in situation \(S\) iff \(S\) meets the following conditions:

1. Everyone has reason to believe that they are in \(S\).
2. \(S\) indicates to everyone that everyone has reason to believe that they are in \(S\).
3. \(S\) indicates to everyone that \(p\).

The key primitives in this analysis are “reason to believe” and “indication”, and although Lewis hadn’t much to say about either, he made it clear that “\(S\) indicates to \(x\) that …” may be read as “\(S\) gives \(x\) reason to believe that …”; which leaves us with “reason to believe” as the key primitive in Lewis’s account.

Lewis claimed that these three conditions, “together with suitable ancillary premises regarding our rationality, inductive standards, and background information” (1969: 53), generate infinitely many orders of shared reasons to believe; the mutuality of common ground is captured in terms of higher-order sharing of reasons to believe, and Lewisian common ground is unbounded. Although Lewis’s “ancillary premises” may seem rather formidable, they play a relatively minor role in his argument. Even so, the informal proof with which Lewis supported his claim is insufficient, but in the meantime several fixes have been suggested, notably by Cubitt & Sugden (2003), Sillari (2008), and Vromen (2024). Between these proposals, Vromen’s stays the closest to Lewis’s proof, for he shows that common ground is entailed by Lewis’s premises supplemented with a minimal and independently motivated theory of reasons to believe.

While Lewis’s overriding concern was with the analysis of conventions, it isn’t hard to see how his account of common ground may be applied to speech acts. Suppose that the primary function of an assertion that \(p\) is to give the hearer reason to believe that \(p\) and requires that a cooperative speaker has reason to believe that \(p\) (Grice 1957; Kissine 2013). Consider again the incident of Wilma telling Betty that Fred snores (§3.1). It seems reasonable to suppose that, if Wilma says, “Fred snores”, then Wilma must have and Betty is given reason to believe that Fred snores, and that a situation \(S\) ensues which meets Lewis’s conditions:

• Both Betty and Wilma have reason to believe that they are in \(S\).
• \(S\) indicates to both that both have reason to believe that they are in \(S\).
• \(S\) indicates to both that Fred snores.

Then a suitably amended version of Lewis’s proof shows that, in this situation, Betty and Wilma have-reason-to-believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) that Fred snores, for all \(n\).

Reasons to believe aren’t beliefs any more than reasons to complain are complaints. Reasons to believe are normative attributes: if Barney has reason to believe that his boss is a fool, then he is entitled to believe that she is a fool, and under some conditions he ought to form that belief. But the two attributes are doubly dissociated: it is perfectly possible not to believe what one has reason to believe, and vice versa. Moreover, whereas doxastic logic is ill-suited as a theory of belief (§3.3), it is a lot more promising as a theory of reasons to believe. For example, it is at least prima facie plausible that the following principles hold:

Closure under entailment

If \(p\) entails \(q\) and \(x\) has reason to believe \(p\), then \(x\) has reason to believe \(q\).

Stacking

If \(x\) has reason to believe \(p\), then \(x\) has reason to believe that \(x\) has reason to believe \(p\).

By the same token, a Lewisian account of unbounded common ground is immune to the issues that beset its mentalist counterpart (§3.3).

One of the most remarkable (and least appreciated) features of Lewis’s theory is that it gives beliefs their due as well. For, on Lewis’s account, common ground may guide belief formation, along the following lines. Given that \(x\) and \(y\) have reason to believe that \(p\), they may come to actually believe that \(p\), provided they have the cognitive resources for making this inference; and given that \(x\) and \(y\) both have reason to believe that both believe that \(p\), both may come to believe that both believe that \(p\), provided they have the cognitive resources for making this inference. But as the cognitive resources needed to make these inferences increase from order to order, only the first few orders of belief will be formed, and thus \(x\) and \(y\) come to believe\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) that \(p\), for some small \(n\). In this way, mutual beliefs may track the lower region of Lewisian common ground, but only up to a point. As early as 1969, Lewis demonstrated, in effect, that a normative account of unbounded common ground may coexist and be integrated with a mentalist account of bounded common ground.

4.2 Normative pragmatics and common ground

Apart from the container view, the various perspectives on common ground considered so far are all individualist in the sense that common ground is taken to be constituted by individual attributes; for it is individuals who know, believe, accept, or have reason to believe that such-and-such is the case. We now consider a non-individualist perspective, in which common ground is viewed as consisting of social relations between individuals, which, like reasons to believe, are normative, though their normativity is of a rather different sort.

Human sociality is intensely normative. We habitually treat each other as having normative statuses: commitments, responsibilities, permissions, and so forth (Brandom 1994; Walton & Krabbe 1995; Kukla & Lance 2009). For example, when I get into a taxi, my normative status and the driver’s are thereby augmented with commitments that didn’t exist a moment ago: I am now supposed to inform the driver about my destination, he is supposed to take me there, I am supposed to pay him for that service, and so on.

While, on the one hand, our normative statuses govern our actions and interactions, on the other hand, they are shaped by them, too. The central tenet of normative pragmatics is that the latter is the chief purpose of language: our communicative exchanges serve to alter and sustain our normative statuses (Brandom 1994; Kibble 2006a, 2006b; Kukla & Lance 2009; Carassa & Colombetti 2009, 2011; García-Carpintero 2015; Krifka 2015; Geurts 2019; Scarafone 2021; Shardimgaliev 2022). Promising is the emblematic case. If I promise to call you tomorrow, I thereby become committed to you to act in certain ways and not in others (Searle 1969; Gilbert 2014; Habib 2008 [2022]). Hence, my commitment has a relational structure with three terms: you, me, and the proposition that I will call you tomorrow. More generally, commitments are of the form \(Cxy(p)\), where \(x\) and \(y\) are individuals and \(p\) is some content. This tripartite structure is often left implicit, but in many accounts it is explicit (Castelfranchi 1995; Royakkers & Dignum 2000; Singh 2000; Kibble 2006a, 2006b; Yamada 2012; Geurts 2019).

The constituent parts of normative statuses fall into two main classes. On the one hand, there are modes of necessity, like commitment, obligation, and responsibility; on the other hand, there are modes of possibility, like entitlement, permission, and consent. Here we are primarily concerned with commitments, which may be subdivided in various ways, two of which deserve special mention. One is the distinction between discursive and non-discursive commitments, which govern linguistic and non-linguistic acts, respectively. For example, if Fred promised Wilma to mow the lawn, he is non-discursively committed to mowing the lawn and he is discursively committed to refrain from saying or implying that he will not mow the lawn. Another distinction is that between propositional commitments and commitments to action, which have been taken to define assertions and promises, respectively. On some accounts, propositional commitments are a subclass of commitments to action. For example, Brandom (1994) holds that an assertion commits the speaker to justify her claim when challenged (cf. Walton & Krabbe 1995; Kibble 2006a, 2006b). Note that this commitment is propositional as well as discursive.

There is considerable variation within the extensive family of normative theories of pragmatics. There are differences in scope, with many theories focusing on a single speech act, usually assertion, while others aim to cover a broader range of utterance types. Moreover, and relatedly, there are diverging opinions on what types of commitment are crucial for pragmatics. For example, while Brandom (1994), for whom “asserting is the fundamental speech act” (1994: 173), confines his attention to discursive commitments, theories seeking to encompass promises or requests, for example, tend to employ non-discursive commitments, as well (Hamblin 1987; Walton & Krabbe 1995; Geurts 2019). In the following, we will cut through all this diversity, and use the root “commit” in a fairly non-committal way. However, unless indicated otherwise, we will only be concerned with propositional commitments, i.e., commitments to the truth of a given proposition. The only substantive premise that will be needed for tying together commitments with common ground is that commitments are relations which comply with a principle of “acceptance” (Gilbert 2014; Geurts 2019).

Suppose Fred tells Barney that he saw a squirrel on the roof. Then, normally speaking, Fred and Barney will come to share a commitment to the truth of the proposition that Fred saw a squirrel on the roof:

Note that, thus defined, commitment sharing has an element of mutuality that is lacking in shared belief or shared reasons to believe. Intuitively, whereas two individuals may share a belief by accident, commitment sharing is symmetrical and non-accidental.

Now suppose that Barney distrusts Fred’s visual acuity, and isn’t convinced that his neighbour really saw a squirrel. So he asks: “Are you sure? I’ve never seen any squirrels in our neighbourhood”. The implication of Barney’s response is that he is not prepared to share Fred’s commitment, though he is willing to accept that Fred is committed to the truth of the proposition that he saw a squirrel on the roof.

In everyday face-to-face communication, acceptance and sharing are often signalled (“Mhm”, “Okay”,…), but they may also be merely implied by the hearer’s response, and in the absence of overt clues acceptance and/or sharing are often taken for granted. Note that, as defined here, acceptance is something completely different from its Stalnakerian namesake (§3.2).

Given that commitment is a normative relation, it is not surprising that at least some of the logical principles that are plausible for reasons to believe (§4.1) are plausible for commitments, too:

Closure under entailment

If \(p\) entails \(q\) and \(Cxy(p)\), then \(Cxy(q)\).

Stacking

If \(Cxy(p)\) then \(Cxy(Cxy(p))\).

I’m claiming plausibility for these principles mainly to highlight the contrast between normative notions like commitment and reason to believe, on the one hand, and mentalist notions like knowledge, belief, and Stalnakerian acceptance, on the other. Only Stacking will play a role in the following, and a minor one at that.

Principles like the above establish logical connections between commitments of the form \(Cxy(\ldots)\), i.e., \(x\)’s commitments to \(y\). Are there any logical principles that plausibly connect \(x\)’s commitments to \(y\) with \(y\)’s commitments to \(x\)? I have argued that there is such a principle and that it is motivated by our practices of commitment making (Geurts 2019). The proposed principle is that \(x\) cannot have a commitment to \(y\) unless \(y\) accepts that \(x\) is so committed:

Acceptance

If \(Cxy(p)\) then \(Cyx(Cxy(p))\).

To motivate this principle, let’s begin with Gilbert’s (2014) remarks on promising and promises. According to Gilbert, if one person makes a promise to another, then

both are active in the process of constructing the promise. More precisely, the promisee must do something of an accepting rather than a rejecting. (2014: 318, emphasis in the original)

To return to an earlier example, suppose that, in an attempt at making a promise, Fred tells Wilma: “I’ll mow the lawn”. Then his attempt will fall flat, and no promise will have been made, if Wilma turns him down, for instance, by saying: “C’mon, you’re joking, you never mowed the lawn and you have no intention of doing so”. Now it may seem that Fred still made a promise in some sense, but even if he did, it didn’t result in a commitment that Wilma can hold him to. For that requires “something of an accepting”, as Gilbert puts it.

Gilbert’s discussion of acceptance is rather terse, but she does say that acceptance doesn’t require a verbal response and that mere acknowledgement is not enough: if Wilma responds with “I hear you”, then Fred still doesn’t have a commitment to her. However, Gilbert’s remarks accord with ample evidence showing that, quite generally, people are active contributors to the discourse even when it isn’t their turn to speak (Clark 1996; Bavelas, Coates, & Johnson 2000; Enfield 2017). Hearers’ real-time responses come in many forms, including various kinds of affirmative signals (“okay”, “yes”, “right”, “yeah”, “mhm”) and body language (nodding, shrugging, eye gaze, facial expressions). They may express a variety of states, ranging from understanding and interest to emotions like empathy, horror, or disgust. But their principal function is to express acceptance and agreement.

The Acceptance principle is in line with these facts. It generalises Gilbert’s observations about promissive commitments to commitments in general, by explicating acceptance in terms of commitment. It isn’t hard to see that this creates infinite cascades of commitments, and in fact we obtain the same recursive structures that define mutual belief and mutual reasons to believe. To show how, we define commitment\(_{\langle n\rangle}\) in the by now usual way:

Now, if mutual commitment is defined as \(C_{\langle n\rangle}xy(p)\), for all \(n\), the following theorems are derivable without much ado:

Theorem 1:

\(Cxy(p)\) and \(Cyx(p)\) iff \(x\) and \(y\) are mutually committed to \(p\).

Theorem 2:

\(Cxy(p)\) iff \(x\) and \(y\) are mutually committed to \(Cxy(p)\).

Theorem 1 follows from the Acceptance principle alone and it says that shared and mutual commitment coincide. Theorem 2 follows from Stacking and Acceptance; it says that \(x\) cannot have a commitment to \(y\) unless \(x\) and \(y\) are mutually committed to \(x\) having that commitment. In both cases, it is the Acceptance principle that drives the recursion. Like its Lewisian cousin, unbounded mutual commitment is immune to the issues that trouble its mentalist counterparts (§3.3).

If common ground is defined in terms of individual attributes like belief or reason to believe, then having such an attribute doesn’t entail that it is common ground that you have it, nor does sharing the belief or a reason to believe that \(p\) entail that \(p\) is common ground. The upshot of theorems 1 and 2 is that, when defined as mutual commitment, common ground takes on an entirely different aspect, owing to the fact that commitment is a relation between individuals rather than an attribute of individuals. Commitment sharing and common ground are the same thing; we just cannot have commitments to one another without it being common ground between us that we have them.^[5] Hence, in this framework, common ground and its constituents are much closer connected than on other views. Common ground consists of commitments and at the same time every commitment implies common ground.

4.3 Conclusion

In this section, we discussed two very different normative theories, both of which contrast with mentalist theories in two related ways. First, logical principles whose validity is questionable in a mentalist setting are prima facie plausible in normative settings, and second, normative theories allow common ground to be infinite, which is problematic in a mentalist setting. The second difference may not be such a big deal in itself, but both differences highlight the contrast between mentalist and normative conceptions of pragmatics and common ground.

That said, mentalist and normative views are not necessarily at odds with one another; in fact, as early as 1969, Lewis combined the two in an integrated account of reasons to believe and belief formation, thereby bringing together two modes of mutuality. In the upcoming section, we will follow up on Lewis’s pioneering work by exploring the interconnections between commitments and beliefs.

5. An Inclusive View

There are markedly different views on the nature of common ground. According to some theories, common ground consists of mental states, whereas others hold that its constitutive elements are normative states. In the spirit of Lewis, I argue that these various accounts are best viewed as being complementary rather than contrary. But to say that they are complementary is much easier than saying how they complement one another. Lewis proposed a partial answer to this question by showing how (bounded) mutual beliefs may track (unbounded) mutual reasons to believe (§4.1). The nexus between reasons to believe and beliefs is a matter of individual rationality: if I have reason to believe that \(p\) and it is relevant for me to decide whether or not to believe \(p\), then my rational choice is to believe that \(p\). The nexus between commitments and beliefs is more complex, because the normativity of commitments is fundamentally different from that of reasons to believe; most importantly, commitments are social relations rather than individual attributes. A further complication is that, in philosophy, the concept of belief has acquired a strong epistemological bias, which it doesn’t always have in everyday life. It is the everyday notion of belief that we need, so we’ll start with that.

Consider four statements that some people might be willing to endorse:

1. Mont Blanc is the tallest mountain of Western Europe.
2. Sally’s doll is in the basket.
3. Rembrandt was a great painter.
4. Dancing is a sin.

According to many philosophers, especially those with epistemological agendas, these statements fall into two disjoint categories: whereas (1) and (2) are made true or false by “the facts”, (3) and (4) merely express opinions. Those of us who cherish that distinction will be inclined to hold that real beliefs are about facts, and qualitatively different from opinions; reasons to believe will then be treated accordingly. However, everyday usage is less discriminative: all of (1-4) are commonly said to be true or false and are equally accepted as expressing the kind of things that people believe.

Hence, our everyday notion of belief is broader than its philosophical offshoot. In this respect, commitments agree with the former rather than the latter. If construed as social relations that are meant to be shared, commitments are not necessarily concerned with facts (though of course they may serve in our pursuits of truth to the facts). Therefore, all of (1-4) express the kind of things that people may believe and may be committed to. On this understanding of commitments and beliefs, let us now consider how the two are connected.

• Obviously, belief doesn’t imply commitment. All of us take many things to be true without being committed to their truth to anyone.
• Shared belief doesn’t imply shared commitment. Both of us may believe \(p\) without being committed to \(p\) to one another.
• Mutual belief doesn’t entail mutual commitment, but seems to imply it by default. The case of the suggested bribe (§3.2) is an exception. In this scenario the driver is patently suggesting a bribe, but without being upfront about it, and it seems plausible that this is an instance of mutual belief without mutual commitment. However, cases like this are truly exceptional, and therefore they are consistent with the idea that mutual belief implies mutual commitment by default.
• At first, it might seem that being committed to the truth of \(p\) doesn’t imply belief that \(p\), because people lie, and lying is a familiar case of commitment without belief. However, this too might be an exception that proves the rule. A more serious concern is the following. If my commitments are closed under such logical relations as entailment, stacking, and acceptance, then I have infinitely many commitments. Unless I can have infinitely many beliefs, which seems unlikely (§3.3.3), I can form matching beliefs for a fraction of my commitments, at best, and therefore it can’t be true that commitment implies belief by default. Note that the same objection could have been raised against reasons to believe (§4.1). There the issue was quietly pre-empted by supposing that we try to track with our beliefs only those reasons to believe that are of practical relevance to us. If a similar proviso holds for commitments, it is plausible that commitment implies belief by default.
• With the same proviso, it may be argued that mutual commitment implies mutual belief by default.

Admittedly, these arguments stand in need of further development, but to the extent that they are sound, they invite the hypothesis that, within certain practical limits, mutual belief and mutual commitment tend to be concordant by default, notwithstanding the fact that beliefs and commitments are fundamentally different things.

Having discussed some of the ways different views on common ground may hang together, let us now ask which one(s) are actually needed. The short answer to that question is that only time will tell. I have a longer answer, too, but it is more tentative. It starts with the observation that, broadly speaking, there are two major approaches to pragmatics, one mentalist, the other normative. These approaches are associated with distinct views on common ground, and as several of these views seem to be viable, we were led to surmise that some or all of them are complementary. Now, it seems highly likely that mentalist and normative approaches to pragmatics are complementary, too. To see why, consider Fred’s promise to Wilma one last time: “I’ll mow the lawn”. It is agreed on all hands that, in the normal run of things, Fred thereby conveys his intention to mow the lawn and that he thereby commits himself to mowing the lawn. Neither observation is controversial, but whereas mentalist theories focus their attention on the former at the expense of the latter, normative theories do the opposite. Clearly, some sort of synthesis is called for, and once we have a unified framework, we will also know which views on common ground matter most for pragmatics.

To conclude this section, we return to the question raised at the outset: what is common ground, and in particular, what distinguishes it from mere information sharing? Despite the fact that there is no consensus on what common ground is and several accounts seem viable, all these accounts agree that mutuality is key. For they all define common ground as “mutual  …”, while disagreeing on how the dots should be filled in. This agreement across a range of otherwise very different accounts may seem remarkable, but considering the kind of creatures that humans are, it shouldn’t be too surprising. We are an intensely social species with exceptional cogitative powers, which enable us to relate to each other in complex ways, including ways that are responsive to ways we relate to one another. Recursive patterns are to be expected, and it shouldn’t come as a surprise that some special form of recursion has come to be associated with various forms of sharing.

However, even if mutuality is a feature of all modes of common ground, it isn’t restricted to common ground. For example, we can be mutually happy that such-and-such is the case, where mutual happiness is defined in the same way as bounded mutual belief:

Mutual happiness has the same logical structure as mutual belief, and although it may be rarer, it can hardly be doubted that we are capable of being mutually happy. But surely that doesn’t make it a form of common ground. Apparently, mutuality is a more general feature of the human condition and not restricted to common ground.

6. Outside Face-to-Face Settings

Even though language is used in myriad ways, it is widely agreed that face-to-face discourse is the primal and predominant form of language use (Clark 1996; Seyfarth & Cheney 2018; Bavelas 2022). This consensus is supported by several observations: face-to-face discourse is a common practice in all human societies, it doesn’t require any special skills, and it is the setting in which children acquire their first language (Clark 1996: 8–11). Moreover, face-to-face communication is attested in many non-human species, which indicates that it has deep evolutionary roots (Seyfarth & Cheney 2018; Geurts 2022).

The paradigm of face-to-face discourse is a dyad who know each other before the exchange starts, or at least are acquainted in the sense that they are physically close during the exchange. Face-to-face interlocutors share the same physical environment, can see and hear each other without effort, and perceive each other’s actions instantaneously. As a rule, this is the kind of setting that pragmatic theories are primarily concerned with, and it obviously excludes many forms of language use: telephone calls, public speeches, classroom teaching, email, newspaper articles, textbooks, novels, and so on. In general, discussions of common ground are similarly restricted.

According to Fillmore,

the language of face-to-face conversation is the basic and primary use of language, all others being best described in terms of their manner of deviation from that base. (1981: 152; cf. Clark 1996; Bavelas, Hutchinson, Kenwood, & Matheson 1997; Bavelas 2022)

Taking our lead from Fillmore, we will briefly touch on a number of ways in which forms of language use deviate from the face-to-face base, considering potential issues related to common ground as we proceed. Since we are entering mostly uncharted territory, this section is not about well-established problems and worked-out solutions. Rather, it merely explores some issues that emerge when language is used outside face-to-face settings.

One of the leitmotifs in the following is acquaintance. Acquaintance is a relation, or family of relations, between individuals, which has qualitative as well as quantitative aspects. For example, Fred and Barney know each other as middle-aged men, speakers of English, neighbours, friends, colleagues, and football fans, and some of these modes of acquaintance give them more to agree about than others. Informally, the idea is that common ground co-varies with the ways in which participants are acquainted with one another, both qualitatively and quantitatively.

More formally, acquaintance figures prominently in Semeijn’s (2021) discussion of various conceptions of common ground, which hinges on the distinction between de re and de dicto beliefs. Betty’s belief that one of her colleagues is a thief is de re if she has a particular colleague in mind whom she believes to be a thief; it is de dicto if she merely believes that there is a thief amongst her colleagues. With the help of this distinction, Semeijn defines several notions of mutual belief, adopting Kaplan’s (1969) proposal that de re belief is a special case of de dicto belief, which crucially involves acquaintance: \(x\) has a de re belief about \(y\) if \(x\) is acquainted with \(y\) as “the A”, for some A, and \(x\) has a de dicto belief of the form “The A is such that …” Since the de re/de dicto distinction is not confined to beliefs, Semeijn’s discussion carries over to mutual knowledge, mutual acceptance, and mutual commitment.

Physically speaking, face-to-face discourse consists of bursts of sound and gesture which leave no material trace unless they are recorded. Writing is a durable medium, which in evolutionary terms is a recent technology that started to evolve a mere 5.000 years ago; other durable media, like voice recordings, film, and video, are significantly younger still. Durable media, but especially writing, are a potent factor in enabling non-face-to-face exchanges, as several of the following points will illustrate.

6.1 Bigger audiences

Size matters. Whereas the primal face-to-face setting involves two participants, though a few more may be allowed for, a public announcement in a football stadium may be heard by thousands of people at once, and radio and television broadcasts reach even larger audiences. In these settings, the sheer size of the audience makes it a practical certainty that most members are unacquainted with most others. As a consequence, there is bound to be less common ground than in face-to-face discourse, and it is much harder for broadcasters and their audiences to decide what can safely be taken to be common ground. Indeed, the very notions of “audience” and “addressee” become problematic. There may be a sense in which a TV newsreader is speaking to me, provided I listen to her and understand what she is saying; but clearly, this is a diluted form of addressing compared to the bona fide, face-to-face form.

6.2 Anonymity

In face-to-face settings it is common ground who are the parties to the exchange; if this is not a given, some parties are anonymous to others, and common ground will be de dicto rather than de re; for example, to the readers of an anonymous pamphlet the author may be just “whoever wrote this” and his audience may be just “whoever reads this”. While anonymity is primarily associated with larger audiences, it is a feature of some smaller settings, too. Semeijn (2021) discusses several cases, one of which is anonymous fan mail. While the addressee of an anonymous fan letter is known to the sender (though seldom personally), the sender is anonymous. Compare this with a TV news report read by a famous anchorperson, where it is the other way round. Other examples discussed by Semeijn are double-blind reviews and messages in bottles. In all these cases, at least one of the parties to the exchange is unknown to at least some of the others, which not only makes it harder to decide what is common ground between whom, but also prompts the question in what sense there is common ground at all. For further discussion of anonymity, see Goldberg (2013) and Marsili (forthcoming).

6.3 Asynchrony

Although there will always elapse some time between speaking and understanding, such delays are negligible in face-to-face discourse, and are duly ignored by theories of common ground. However, outside face-to-face settings, transmission latencies can become significantly longer, and when they do they create hairy issues, both practical and theoretical. For example, what (if anything) is the common ground between myself and Darwin when I’m reading his Origin of species? Since Darwin doesn’t exist anymore, there cannot be common ground between two extant individuals. However, since I can believe in the present what Darwin believed in 1859, perhaps we can have mutual beliefs across time. If so, my share of our mutual belief might be de re (assuming that I’m properly acquainted with Darwin), while Darwin’s would have to be de dicto. Technically, it seems feasible to develop an asynchronous notion of common ground in terms of mutual belief, though it remains to be seen whether such a notion makes conceptual sense. Commitment is another matter, for, even if it is obviously possible to have temporally restricted commitments, it seems doubtful that Darwin in his time can share commitments with me in mine, if commitment sharing is understood as in §4.2.

6.4 Reduced interactivity

According to the traditional picture of discourse, the hearer is a more or less passive receptacle for information dispensed by the speaker, which means that the communicative effort falls mainly on the speaker; all the hearer has to do is understand what the speaker is trying to say. However, this picture has been losing ground for quite some time, and it is now widely, though by no means universally, appreciated that face-to-face discourse is highly interactive (Clark 1996; Bavelas, Coates, & Johnson 2000; Enfield 2017). Clark and Wilkes-Gibbs (1986: 6) report the following exchange:

A:

That tree has, uh, uh, …

B:

tentworms.

A:

Yeah.

B:

Yeah.

Somewhat paradoxically (on the traditional view, that is), B’s first contribution is to help A making his statement. Then A says “Yeah” to acknowledge that he accepts B’s help, and only then does B respond. This case is not exceptional; as discussed in §4.2, addressees actively contribute to the discourse even as they don’t have the floor. This interactivity is essential, and it is impaired and even lost entirely outside face-to-face dialogue. As a consequence, the reader of a letter, for example, has a highly reduced repertoire of responses to signal her understanding or lack thereof, her agreement or disagreement, and so on. Moreover, her feedback will necessarily arrive with a significant delay, if she is able and willing to respond in the first place. In short, outside face-to-face discourse, the basic mechanisms for establishing common ground are curtailed to a large extent.

6.5 Limits of common ground

Let’s sum up. First, even if an exact measure is not in the offing, it seems safe to say that there is more common ground in some situations than in others, and that, generally speaking, there is more common ground within face-to-face contexts than without. Secondly, outside face-to-face contexts there will often be more uncertainty about what is common ground and what is not, and thirdly, in some such contexts it may be doubtful that there is any common ground at all. The last point may be less obvious than the first two, so let’s develop it a bit.

All viable accounts of common ground reviewed in this entry rely on the same form of mutuality, and I conjecture that, outside face-to-face settings, this form isn’t always achievable. To support this conjecture, I propose to revisit the mentalist view on common ground, and consider how an assertion may change the interlocutors’ mutual beliefs, as discussed in §3.1, but now in a scenario involving an anonymous pamphlet. Since, as we defined it, the notion of mutual belief is atemporal, it needs to be amended so as to accommodate the delay between the writing and reading of a text. Let’s agree that this can be done somehow and not fret about the details.

Suppose that \(y\) picks up a pamphlet which claims that \(p\), and suppose furthermore that, unbeknown to \(y\), the pamphlet was written by \(x\) at time \(t\), which was two years before it is read by \(y\) at \(t'\). Then, in order for \(p\) to become mutual belief between \(x\) at \(t\) and \(y\) at \(t'\), the following must be mutual belief between \(x\) at \(t\) and \(y\) at \(t'\):

(1)

\(x\) believed \(p\) at \(t\) (i.e., it is mutual belief that \(x\)’s claim was sincere).

(2)

\(y\) believes \(p\) at \(t'\) (i.e., it is mutual belief that \(y\) trusts \(x\)’s claim to be true).

In this case, a double-blind version of mutual belief is called for, which allows two individuals to have beliefs about the other’s beliefs without having any idea who that other might be. How might \(x\) and \(y\) be related to another in a way that enables each to have beliefs about the other’s beliefs? Does the mere fact that one reads a text written by the other suffice as a basis for mutual belief between the two? Wouldn’t that make it too easy to have mutual beliefs? Wouldn’t it stretch the concept too far? It is significantly less than obvious that the notion of double-blind mutual belief is a viable one.

Setting this general concern aside, let’s ask ourselves what are the odds that, at \(t'\), \(y\) believes that \(x\) believed \(p\) at \(t\). Clearly, it depends on the details of the case. All that \(y\) has to go by is the pamphlet. If its general content and \(p\) in particular seem reasonable by y’s own lights, then she might come to believe that \(x\) believed \(p\) at \(t\); but if \(y\) finds \(p\) dubious, she might be reluctant to believe that \(x\) believed \(p\) at \(t\). Turning to \(x\), what are the odds that, at \(t\), \(x\) believes that \(y\) will believe at \(t'\) that \(x\) believed \(p\) at \(t\)? That depends on \(x\)’s estimate of how reasonable his pamphlet and \(p\) in particular are by \(y\)’s lights. But what could that estimate be based on, given that \(x\) has no pertinent knowledge about \(y\)? So, even if we are prepared to grant that double-blind mutual belief is viable, condition (1) doesn’t seem to be met; for similar reasons, the same holds for condition (2). Therefore, while there seems to be some sense in which \(x\) managed to communicate to \(y\) that \(p\), it is doubtful that this feat involved mutual belief.

The same kind of reasoning applies to other forms of mutuality, and in each case the conclusion is the same: there are scenarios in which linguistic communication seems to be possible without common ground. This conclusion is not too surprising. After all, language is used in such multifarious ways that it would be highly surprising if pragmatic processes turned out to be the same throughout. In the foregoing, we have been contrasting two quite disparate forms of communication: real-time, face-to-face discourse versus a protracted sequence of events to which the term “interaction” is marginally applicable, at best. Small wonder that the recursive structures associated with the former are not found with the latter.

However, if correct, this conclusion provides food for a lot of thought. Pragmatic theorising has come a long way using made-up examples like this:

Even if it is unclear who Pedro might be, this fragment is intelligible, and it is clear, for example, that the pronouns “he” and “it” likely refer to Pedro and his donkey, respectively. How do we achieve sensible interpretations in such cases without being able to rely on common ground in any of the senses discussed in the foregoing? I don’t know, but I’m sure that the issue concerns not only common ground, but pragmatics in general.

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assertion | belief | common knowledge | descriptions | logic: epistemic | presupposition | promises

Acknowledgments

For comments, questions, and discussions I’m indebted to Josh Armstrong, Matej Drobn̆ák, Guido Löhr, Neri Marsili, Antonio Scarafone, Merel Semeijn, Xavier Villalba, and Huub Vromen, as well as to audiences at the University of Tübingen and Pompeu Fabra University, Barcelona.