1. This was the first account of common ground that Stalnaker proposed. He changed his mind considerably in more recent work, which is discussed in the next section (Stalnaker 2002, 2014)

2. The notion of unbounded common ground was already articulated by C.S. Peirce at the beginning of the last century. Having listed a number of things that both of us would take for granted “if we were to meet in the flesh”, Peirce writes: “I should know that it was so, and know that you knew it, and knew that I knew that you knew it; and so on, ad infinitum and vice versa” (MS 612, as quoted by Pietarinen 2004: 303).

3. In doxastic logic, this principle goes under the name of “positive introspection”. I’m introducing a different label here, because the same principle will recur in the context of theories in which “introspection” is inappropriate (§4).

4. Greco (2023) provides perhaps the most thorough philosophical discussion of unbounded mutual knowledge, but his agenda is an epistemological one, and it remains to be seen whether his arguments have any bearing on the issues raised here.

5. There are other ways of defining commitment sharing that may be useful and that don’t entail that shared and mutual commitment are equivalent, for example, by stipulating that \(x\) and \(y\) share a commitment to \(p\) iff \(Cxz(p)\) and \(Cyz(p)\), for some \(z\).