Ottobah Cugoano

First published Mon Mar 9, 2026

Recent years have seen a surge of philosophical interest in Cugoano’s Thoughts and Sentiments on the Evil of Slavery.[1] This is a response to canon-expansion movements, the growth of scholarship in Africana philosophy, and the text’s important contributions on a number of issues. On the face of it an abolitionist text, Thoughts and Sentiments also intervenes in debates concerning freedom, responsibility, punishment, moral epistemology, and more.

1. Historical and biographical background

We know relatively little about Cugoano’s life and intellectual formation. This section outlines what we do know and lays out the publication history of Thoughts and Sentiments. Readers interested in understanding the broader context may consult the very large body of literature on the abolition debate in late-18th-century Britain.

1.1 Cugoano’s life

Our knowledge of Cugoano’s early life comes almost entirely from the brief autobiographical section of Thoughts and Sentiments. There, Cugoano explains that he was born to a well-connected Fante family in Ajumako in present-day Ghana, in the region he calls Guinea; that at 13 he was kidnapped while playing in the woods at his uncle’s house; that he was taken to Granada in the British West Indies, where he was enslaved on a sugar plantation; and that two years later, in 1772, he was brought to England, where he gained his freedom shortly after the Mansfield decision (12–17). He then he had himself baptized, on the advice of “some good people” that this might prevent re-enslavement (7).

Cugoano’s autobiography is very short, in contrast with the detailed freedom narratives provided by other Black abolitionists (see e.g. Equiano 1789). Still, it serves multiple functions. It made Fante society legible to 18th century Britons by describing it in terms of familiar hierarchies and patronage relations. It shows that Fante society was politically and materially sophisticated, thus undermining two common proslavery claims: that Africans were better off enslaved in the West Indies than free at home, and that Africans were incapable of self-government and thus naturally suited to enslavement. It shows that Fante society was founded on strong family bonds, thus undermining the common claim that Guinean parents sold their children into slavery—a crucial part of alienation of rights arguments. Finally, it serves to undermine the common proslavery claim that Atlantic slavery was war slavery and hence justified.[2] Cugoano describes himself as the beloved child of a happy family, abducted while playing in the woods with his friends: there was no crime or unjust aggression on his part, indeed no aggression at all.

Once free, Cugoano worked as a servant in the house of the artists Richard and Maria Cosway in central London. He became an activist and helped found the Sons of Africa, an influential group of Black British abolitionists. He was also involved in projects to start a school for free Black Britons and to re-settle some of London’s free Black inhabitants in Sierra Leone, neither of which ultimately came to fruition. He disappeared from the historical record after 1791.

1.2 The context

Thoughts and Sentiments is in part a rebuttal of a recent proslavery work, James Tobin’s Cursory Remarks upon the Reverend Mr. Ramsay’s Essay on the Treatment and Conversion of African Slaves in the Sugar Colonies (Tobin 1785), a reply to (Ramsay 1784). Following Thomas Clarkson (1788), Cugoano refers to Tobin as “the Cursory Remarker”. In writing against Tobin and Atlantic slavery, Cugoano draws on a number of other sources as well, including Anthony Benezet (1968), Granville Sharp (e.g. 1776b and 1776a), and John Wesley (1774). Scholars have pointed out that Cugoano’s historiography borrows liberally from earlier authors (see e.g. Sandiford 1988, 96–97; Brown 2012, 296–297; and Wheelock 2016, 31). But as these scholars have also emphasized, Cugoano goes well beyond those sources, both in his proposals and in his underlying theoretical framework. For example, he denounces the role of Parliament, the King, and the Church of England in continuing Atlantic slavery, something earlier White abolitionists typically took care to avoid.[3] His suggestions on what should be done after abolition also go well beyond earlier abolitionists—as does his account of the collective moral responsibility of the people of Britain.

Our limited knowledge of Cugoano’s life makes it difficult to say much about his formation. He clearly had extensive knowledge of the Bible. It seems safe to assume that he had read the major proslavery and antislavery works of the day, and he was certainly aware of Edmund Burke’s work. Beyond this, it is hard to say anything definitive. It has been suggested that Thoughts and Sentiments is a reply to Locke’s views on slavery, liberty, and natural law (see Dahl 2020a and Bernasconi 2019). This is a tempting and generative suggestion, but there is no evidence that Cugoano actually read Locke. (Of course, he could be responding to Lockean ideas without having actually read Locke.) It has also been suggested that we can see Rousseau’s influence in Cugoano, as for instance in the discussion of how avarice corrupts our sentiments (21, 49, 93). Given how widely read Rousseau was in the late 18th century, this is extremely plausible, even if there may not be any direct evidence.

1.3 The text

The two editions of Thoughts and Sentiments differ significantly. The first, 1787 edition has the full title Thoughts and Sentiments on the Evil and Wicked Traffic of the Slavery and Commerce of the Human Species, Humbly Submitted to The Inhabitants of Great-Britain, by Ottobah Cugoano, a Native of Africa. The second, 1791 edition is Thoughts and Sentiments on the Evil of Slavery; or, the Nature of Servitude as Admited by the Law of God, Compared to the Modern Slavery of the Africans in the West-Indies; In an Answer to the Advocates for Slavery and Oppression. Addressed to the Sons of Africa, by a Native. As the title change suggests, the two editions are aimed at different audiences, “the inhabitants of Great Britain” and “the Sons of Africa” respectively. (Presumably, “the sons of Africa”, i.e. all Black Britons, rather than the members of the Sons of Africa.) The second edition, an abridged re-publication of the first, focuses on rebutting the claim that Atlantic slavery has Biblical justification.

Thoughts and Sentiments is Cugoano’s only published work, and aside from it, we have only a few letters (see Cugoano [TAS]), pp. 183–196). From those letters we know that Cugoano sent copies of Thoughts and Sentiments to King George III, the Prince of Wales, and Edmund Burke. He proposed that Burke might give him “a trifle towards the printing” (184), which suggests that the book was published by subscription. We also have letters from Cugoano to various members of the British government who might have been sympathetic to his cause, including William Pitt, then Prime Minister. Finally, we have a letter to Granville Sharp where Cugoano is expressing interest in the Sierra Leone project.

The first edition of Thoughts and Sentiments was translated into French and published as Réflexions Sur La Traite et l’esclavage Des Nègres (Cugoano 1788).

2. What does the evil of Atlantic slavery consist in?

From today’s perspective, why slavery is evil may seem too obvious to need discussion. From the point of view of late 18th century Britain, things looked very different, and Cugoano provides an extensive account of what the evil of Atlantic slavery consists in.

2.1 Robbery and piracy

Cugoano often describes the wrongness of slavery in terms of robbery. He calls planters and slave-traders “robbers” (11, 25, 62) and—referencing Deuteronomy 24:7—“stealers of men” (62) or “men-stealers” (71). He also describes them as committing the related crime of piracy: “the European depredators and pirates have … robbed and pillaged the people of Africa” (72). But if enslavement is theft, what exactly is stolen?

Cugoano answers that liberty is what’s stolen: “taking away the natural liberties of men, and compelling them to any involuntary slavery or compulsory service, is an injury and robbery” (51). Some scholars read this as treating the right to liberty as a sort of Lockean property right (Bogues 2003, 45). Other scholars dispute that reading (see, e.g., Dahl 2020b). Certainly, Cugoano is sensitive to the way that property rights had been invoked in discussions of Atlantic slavery. He emphasizes both that Atlantic slavery involved treating persons as literal property and that such treatment was historically unprecedented: speaking of the 1781 Zong massacre, he writes that British enslavers have “a very shocking, peculiar, and almost unheard of conception” of enslaved Africans “as their own property, that they may do with as they please” (85). So, it is reasonably clear that Cugoano sees the right to liberty as a form of property rights. And it is also clear that he denies that you can be the property of someone else. But it is not entirely clear what the relationship between these two claims is supposed to be. To deny that you can be owned by someone else is not thereby to assert that you own yourself, let alone to assert that self-ownership is the foundation of the right to liberty. Cugoano may think the right to liberty has nothing to do with self-ownership.

At any rate, the comparison between slavery and theft is not intended to make an abstract theoretical claim about liberty and property. It has an urgent practical purpose, namely to show that Atlantic slavery, properly understood, is forbidden by the portion of natural law that Britons have already grasped. Since Britons already see that theft in general is wrong, once they see that slavery is theft, they will see that slavery is impermissible too. The same thing applies with respect to existing British law: if Atlantic slavery is theft, then existing British law, properly understood, forbids enslavement.

Moreover, if slavery is theft, then planters who buy human beings have purchased stolen goods. Indeed, Cugoano argues, they have knowingly purchased stolen goods, or at least goods that they should have known were stolen. And “according to the laws of England, when such connivers are discovered, and the property of others unlawfully found in their possession, the right owners thereof can oblige the connivers to restore back their property, and to punish them for their trespass”: “the slave-holders, universally are those connivers” (86). A number of abolitionist proposals involved compensating planters for the losses incurred by abolition, as ultimately happened in the British West Indies. Cugoano’s claim that planters have knowingly purchased stolen goods serves to counter such proposals.

In a reversal of proslavery tropes about the alleged bestiality of Africans, Cugoano argues that those who profit from Atlantic slavery are like beasts, outside the scope of the law of nature. He describes the American colonists as “the barbarous inhuman Europeans” and as “men of the most brutish and depraved nature” (71). He writes that “the bold and ostensive enslavers of men” have “forsaken the amiable virtues of men” and “acquired the cruel ferocity of tygers and wild beasts” (108).[4] And he emphasizes that enslavers have made themselves the “brutish enemies of mankind” (95). Like the pirate to whom Cugoano compares him, the enslaver is hostis humani generis, the enemy of humankind. He is not only outside the bounds of any state but also outside the bounds of the moral community. We have no duties to him under natural law.[5]

Cugoano’s equation of Atlantic slavery with piracy plays an important philosophical and rhetorical role in his argument, as conceptions of slave-trading as piracy did in 19th century efforts at abolition.[6] Piracy was very common in the early modern world, and early modern writers used the language of piracy for many different purposes. Equating Atlantic slavery with piracy would have pushed his readers to see it as parallel to the widely deplored enslavement of European sailors by Barbary Coast pirates. Moreover, Cugoano’s comparison of enslavers to pirates is supposed to show that the power to punish enslavers is something like the executive power of the law of nature rather than the power of the state. If enslavement is piracy, everyone has the authority to stop enslavement and punish enslavers—and every nation has the authority to do this, even outside its own borders.

2.2 Liberty

Some insight into how Cugoano understands liberty is provided by his description of west African society. He says that the people of Guinea “are born as free, and are brought up with as great a predilection for their own … freedom … as … the sons and daughters of fair Britain” (27). Indeed, he says, “we may boast of some more essential liberties than any of the civilized nations in Europe enjoy; for the poorest among us are never in distress for want, unless some general and universal calamity happen to us” (103). The underlying claim is that “liberty and freedom, where people may starve for want, can do them but little good” (103). Moreover, Cugoano insists that the “several kingdoms and principalities” of Africa are “absolutely maintained by their free subjects” (25), who serve “not so much by the desire of their chief, as by their own voluntary inclination” (27). This is quite a thick conception of liberty. The right to liberty is substantive rather than merely formal—the people of Guinea are freer than the people of Britain because in Guinea the poor don’t starve—and involves a form of political participation. In section 5, we’ll see how Cugoano relates this to the existence of slavery in Guinea.

The claim that natural liberty is recognized far more clearly in Guinea than in Britain is not found in the earlier, White abolitionists from whom Cugoano drew his historiography, and it has important implications. Cugoano uses the language of universal natural rights and assumes that his readers accept the natural right to liberty, at least at a sufficiently high level of abstraction. He tries to make them see that this abstract commitment to liberty is incompatible with Atlantic slavery. Writing of the recent American Revolution, for instance, he remarks that “some mitigation of slavery has been obtained in some respective districts of America, though not in proportion to their own vaunted claims of freedom” (10).[7] Thus scholars such as Bogues (2003), Gunn (2010), and Peters (2017) read Cugoano as universalizing the concept of natural liberty found in the European tradition. However, Cugoano’s description of Guinea shows that he himself is concerned to deny that natural liberty is a uniquely European ideal.

Moreover, the claim that natural liberty is better understood in Guinea than in Britain may have significant implications for the relationship between moral knowledge and religion. Cugoano demonstrates a great deal of Scriptural knowledge. He claims, as was standard in freedom narratives, that his abduction and captivity was consistent with divine goodness because he thereby came “to know something of him who is that God whose providence rules over all” (17). He does not say explicitly whether his ignorance of God was peculiar to him or reflected the condition of his society as a whole. However, the most natural reading may be that the people of Guinea lack not only knowledge of Scripture but also the knowledge of God that early modern philosophers typically thought could be obtained through reason alone. If this is indeed what Cugoano is claiming, then—given the additional claim that the people of Guinea have superior moral knowledge—moral knowledge cannot require knowledge of God.

Adam Dahl (2020a) argues that Cugoano has a creolized conception of natural liberty, based on both European Enlightenment concepts and a romanticized Africana conception of natural liberty. Iziah Topete (2024) argues that Cugoano has a social conception of liberty: to be free is to be free to enter into society, so that even in principle you cannot be free in a state of nature. Indeed, another role of Cugoano’s description of Guinean society is to counter depictions of Guinea as a state of nature. Such depictions were common on both sides of the debate, with proslavery writers depicting life in Africa as a sort of Hobbesian war of all against all, while some antislavery writers depicted Africans as more like Rousseau’s noble savages. Cugoano’s description of Guinean society is intended to counteract both.

2.3 Harm to Guinea and Britain

That Atlantic slavery harms the individuals enslaved is obvious. Cugoano delineates a wide range of harms, including death (85), torture (90), dehumanization[8] (20)—“the slaves were to be considered the same as horses” (85)—and forced Sunday labor, which compelled enslaved people to violate their duty to worship God (37). Cugoano also argues both that Atlantic slavery harms Guinean society in general and that Atlantic slavery harms British society in general. He spends far more time on harm to Britain than harm to Guinea, presumably because he thinks that his readers will care more about harm to themselves than about harm to distant others.

The harm Cugoano has in mind is both eschatological and economic. The eschatological harm is that Atlantic slavery makes Britain as a nation—and Britons as individuals—liable to divine punishment:

While ever such a horrible business as the slavery and oppression of the Africans is carried on, there is not one man in all Great Britain and her colonies, that knoweth anything of it, can be innocent and safe, unless he speedily riseth up with abhorrence of it in his own judgment, and … declare himself against it (79).

Cugoano’s argument here relies on the claim that individual Britons are morally responsible for Atlantic slavery (see section 6.1 for more on this).

The case for economic harm is a bit more complicated. Cugoano, of course, understands that Atlantic slavery made many people immensely rich, including not only slave-traders and planters but also merchants, bankers, and investors in Britain itself. But while proslavery writers like Tobin argued that such wealth trickles down to each individual Briton, Cugoano argues the contrary: the wealthy profit while the rest of Britain suffers. On his view, government support of Atlantic slavery is the result of a sort of elite capture. He explains that “men of activity and affluence … are always preferred to take the lead in matters of government, so that the greatest depredators, warriors, contracting companies of merchants, and rich slaveholders, always endeavour to push themselves on to get power and interest in their favour” (70). Thus, the people who “have acquired great riches by some insidious traffic or illegal gain … become often leading men in governments” (71). Asking “what advantages Great-Britain has gained by all its extensive territories abroad, the devastations committed, and the abominable slavery and oppression carried on its colonies,” Cugoano replies that the country as a whole has gained no advantage. Rather, he argues, Britain has “sunk into a world of debt” (68), which “casts a sluggish deadness over the whole realm, greatly stops ingenuity and improvements, promotes idleness and wickedness, clogs all the wheels of commerce, and drains the money out of the nation.”[9] As a result, ordinary Britons, who are taxed heavily to support the colonial enterprise, suffer (69).

3. Refutations of common proslavery arguments

One goal of Thoughts and Sentiments is to refute the numerous proslavery arguments common at the time. These include claims that Blacks are Aristotelian natural slaves; claims that Atlantic slavery is licensed by rights forfeiture or the ius gentium; and arguments from historical and Biblical precedent. These are discussed in the next three sections. Cugoano’s refutation of one more proslavery argument also deserves a brief mention. Tobin argued that enslaved Africans in the West Indies were better off than the poor in Britain. To this, Cugoano gives a two-part reply. First, he points out that the empirical claim is simply false. Second, he argues that if the British poor were in fact worse off than enslaved Africans in the West Indies, this would not justify Atlantic slavery. Rather, it would show that the British poor were also urgently in need of assistance.

3.1 Race and natural slavery

Proponents of racialized natural slavery claim, in Cugoano’s words, that “nature designed [the African] for some inferior link in the chain, fitted only to be a slave” (11)—a claim that Cugoano understatedly remarks is “very discouraging to a man of [his] complexion” (11). Against this, he argues that “there is nothing in nature, reason, and scripture … to warrant the enslaving of black people more than others” (45). The context does not make clear what exactly ‘in nature’ means, but Jorati (2024, 183) suggests that this is a way of saying that there are no innate racial differences: nothing in the nature of enslaved Africans warrants their enslavement.

The claim that “Africans are peculiarly marked out by some signal prediction in nature and complexion” (28) for enslavement is an important target of Thoughts and Sentiments, although not its main target. One way in which proslavery writers argued for that claim was by appeal to Scripture, typically citing passages about the curse of Ham (Genesis 9:24–25) or the mark of Cain (Genesis 4:15). Cugoano holds that all such arguments hang on gross misreadings.[10] They are “a strange perversion of reason, and a wrong use … of the sacred writings” (29), indeed “a grand pretense for the supporters of slavery” (31). The terms ‘pretence’ and ‘perversion’ are noteworthy: Cugoano is suggesting that Scriptural justifications for Atlantic slavery were initially made in bad faith, and only later came to be believed. In section 6.2 we’ll see that Cugoano thinks this applies to all proslavery arguments.

In fact, Cugoano argues, “the scriptures … afford us this information: ‘That all mankind did spring from one original, and that there are no different species among men. For God who made the world, hath made of one blood all the nations of men that dwell on all the face of the earth’” (29). Here, as in the very title of the book, Thoughts … on … the Slavery … of the Human Species, Cugoano is asserting monogenesis. Far from Blacks and Whites being different species, the racial differences between them are relatively superficial: “the difference of colour among men is only incidental, and equally natural to all, and agreeable to the place of their habitation” (30). Thus, he argues, “when a man comes to die, it makes no difference whether he was black or white, whether he was male or female, whether he was great or small, or whether he was old or young; none of these differences alter the essentiality of the man, any more than had he wore a black or a white coat and thrown it off for ever” (41). If the body is an inessential add-on to the immaterial soul, then differences in what Cugoano calls ‘complexion’ are morally irrelevant.

Proslavery arguments based on innate racial differences often hinged on alleged intellectual differences, typically claiming that Africans are less intelligent than Europeans. Presumably, Cugoano would place the intellect with the immaterial soul and thus find it impossible for there to be intellectual differences between races. Certainly, he thinks that there is no evidence of racial differences in intellect. In fact, he argues, there is significant evidence that “the Africans, though not so learned, are just as wise as the Europeans” (28). One key piece of evidence is the existence of a philosophically, rhetorically, and hermeneutically sophisticated book by an African author, namely Thoughts and Sentiments.

3.2 War slavery: rights forfeiture and the ius gentium

Eighteenth-century writers defended the legitimacy of war slavery using two distinct theoretical frameworks. One involved rights forfeiture: the natural right to liberty possessed by all human beings could be forfeited under natural law by initiating and waging unjust war. The other framework involved the ius gentium or law of nations. The precise relationship between natural law and the ius gentium was disputed, with some philosophers subsuming the ius gentium under natural law and others giving it partial independence. And although the two frameworks are in principle distinct, proslavery writers often attempted to justify Atlantic slavery as a form of war slavery without making clear which of the two they had in mind.[11] The planter Gordon Turnbull, for instance, simply insisted that Atlantic slavery was “not altogether incompatible either with justice or humanity” because enslaved people were “saved from the most shocking and horrid deaths” after being captured (Turnbull 1786, 10–11). The abolitionists Anthony Benezet and Abbé Grégoire describe war slavery as the dominant pro-slavery argument (Benezet 1968, xv, 70). Clarkson agrees, arguing in response that “slavery cannot be defended even in the most equitable wars” (Clarkson 1788, 67) and that even if war slavery is in principle legitimate, this would not justify Atlantic slavery. For, Clarkson argues, the vast majority of enslaved Africans were victims of kidnapping rather than prisoners of war (Clarkson 1788, 33)—and those who were prisoners of war had been captured in wars “that have been made solely for the purpose of obtaining them” (Clarkson 1788, 41).

Cugoano’s approach is importantly different.[12] He agrees that human beings have a natural right to liberty and that this right can be forfeited under natural law by committing certain wrongful actions. Hence, he does not rule out war slavery based on rights forfeiture in principle. Instead, he suggests a new way of applying it to “the modern barbarous and cruel West-India slavery” (40). If we accept that the right to liberty can be forfeited by unjust aggression but deny that Atlantic slavery involved this kind of rights forfeiture, where does that leave us? What does it tell us about the moral status of those who enslaved other human beings? Cugoano’s answer is worth quoting at length:

[T]aking away the natural liberties of men, and compelling them to any involuntary slavery or compulsory service, is an injury and robbery contrary to all law, civilization, reason, justice, equity, and humanity: therefore when men break through the laws of God, and the rules of civilization among men, and go forth to steal, to rob, to plunder, to oppress and to enslave, and to destroy their fellow-creatures, the laws of God and man require that they should be suppressed, and deprived of their liberty, or perhaps their lives (51).

A few pages later, there’s an apparent caveat. Such thefts ought to be punished with death only “if the person so robbed and stole should die in consequence thereof” (54). But this—as Cugoano, who was enslaved on a sugar plantation in Granada, well knew—excluded no actual cases.

Cugoano’s discussion of war slavery does not pay much attention to the distinction between natural law and the ius gentium. This is partly because his opponents paid little attention to it. But also, Cugoano seems to see all law as deriving its normative force from God. For instance, he refers to “God and his … laws of nature and nations” (89), suggesting that the ius gentium is part of the law of nature, and he insists that “the reason why a man suffers death for breaking the laws of his country is, because he transgresseth the law of God in that community he belongs to” (55).

Rights forfeiture theorists often accepted penal slavery as well as (or, in some cases, instead of) war slavery.[13] Roughly, penal slavery is in response to violations of civil law and war slavery is in response to violations of the law of nature or the law of nations. As a result, in penal slavery the punishment must be inflicted by the state. In war slavery, the right to punish may be part of the executive power of the law of nature, as in Locke.[14] Cugoano treats penal slavery in much the same way as war slavery: he argues that the Africans enslaved in the West Indies had not committed crimes, without saying explicitly whether he thinks that in principle penal slavery may be justified. We return to this issue in section 5.

3.3 Historical and Biblical precedent

Many proslavery writers argued that slavery is a widespread feature of human civilizations, describing its occurrence in contemporary Africa, the ancient world, and Scripture. Against this, Cugoano argues that Atlantic slavery is historically unprecedented: there is a clear and morally significant difference between Atlantic slavery and other forms of forced labor and “lawful servitude”.

Cugoano holds that slavery in Guinea is completely different in kind from Atlantic slavery. One difference is that people enslaved in Guinea faced far better material conditions (16). More important, the origins and alleged justifications of their enslavement differ. Cugoano explains that “some of the Africans in my country keep slaves, which they take in war, or for debt” (16) but that in Africa, “very few nations make slaves of any of those under their government; but such as are taken prisoners of war from their neighbours, are generally kept in that state, until they can exchange and dispose of them otherwise” (26). Slavery in Guinea, then, is either debt bondage, war slavery, or penal slavery. Thus the existence of Guinean slavery is, on Cugoano’s view, compatible with Guinean recognition of universal liberty rights.

Atlantic slavery cannot be understood as debt bondage, war, slavery, or penal slavery, as Cugoano’s autobiography—according to which he was kidnapped while playing in the woods as a child—is intended to show. Along similar lines, Cugoano argues that Atlantic slavery is categorically different from slavery in the ancient world. For instance, he argues, much of what was called slavery in the ancient world was actually a form of voluntary servitude—a contractual, time-limited agreement. In addition, Cugoano says that it “must be granted” that slavery was “the prevalent and universal practice of many different barbarous nations for ages”, but “not because it was right, or any thing like right and equity” (34). A similar claim is found in Clarkson (1788, 21).

Cugoano treats claims of Biblical precedent a bit differently, because he agrees that Biblical precedent could in principle justify a form of bondage. His case against the alleged Biblical justification of Atlantic slavery hinges on the existence of a sharp difference in kind between Atlantic slavery and Mosaic bondage. Speaking of “that kind of servitude which was admitted into the law of Moses,” he says:

There was no harm in buying a man who was in a state of captivity and bondage by others, and keeping him in servitude till such time as his purchase was redeemed by his labour and service. And there could be no harm in paying a man’s debts, and keeping him in servitude until such time as an equitable agreement of composition was paid by him. And so, in general, whether they had been bought or sold in order to pay their just debts when they became poor, or were bought from such as held them in an unlawful captivity, the state of bondage which they and their children fell under, among the Israelites … rather might be termed a deliverance from debt and captivity, than a state of slavery (36).

Notice that Mosaic bondage, as Cugoano describes it, may be involuntary, as when the enslaved person was “bought from such as held [him] in an unlawful captivity”.[15] Nevertheless, Cugoano insists that Mosaic bondage is not a form of slavery, properly speaking. This claim is embedded in the subtitle of the second edition of Thoughts and Sentiments, “the nature of servitude as admitted by the Law of God compared to the modern slavery of the Africans in the West-Indies.” It is not entirely clear why Cugoano thinks that Mosaic bondage is justified. Olsthoorn argues that what makes Mosaic bondage legitimate for Cugoano is that it is relatively humane and time-limited (Olsthoorn 2024, 15–16). But while this might diminish its wrongness, it does not seem sufficient to justify the theft of liberty in Cugoano’s framework.

4. Abolition

Cugoano represents himself as arguing for “total abolition, and an universal emancipation of slaves … without any hesitation, or delay for a moment” (91). This has contributed to descriptions of Cugoano as rejecting the gradualism of his predecessors. Such descriptions are not entirely accurate.

4.1 Emancipation

This becomes clear as soon as Cugoano lays out the details of his proposal: immediate emancipation is only for people “who had been above seven years in the islands or elsewhere … had obtained any competent degree of knowledge of the Christian religion … and had behaved themselves honestly and decently” (99). Those who have not yet met all those conditions will undergo an involuntary transitional period of “lawful servitude” (99). Cugoano explains that the seven years requirement is so that “they would have sufficiently paid their owners by their labour, both for their first purpose, and for the expences attending their education” (99).

This justification is difficult to square with Cugoano’s repeated characterization of planters as robbers and pirates. In general, when stolen goods are returned to their rightful owner, there is no obligation for the rightful owner to compensate the person who knowingly purchased the stolen goods. For this and other reasons, the seven years requirement is often seen as a pragmatic concession, with Cugoano outlining the proposal he thinks his audience will accept rather than the one he finds morally appropriate. Section 5 will return to this issue.

4.2 Other post-abolition proposals

Cugoano insists that there is nothing we can do now to make up for the harms done to individual Africans and to African communities. Even the strongest possible response will be merely “a just commutation for what cannot be fully restored” (102).[16] It is striking, then, that Cugoano’s proposed responses go well beyond what earlier, White abolitionists suggested—and well beyond what ultimately happened. Four such responses deserve mention here.

First, Cugoano proposes a public acknowledgement of the evil of slavery and an apology (to God, not to the actual victims) for Britain’s role in it: “there ought to be days of mourning and fasting appointed, to make enquiry into that great and pre-eminent evil for many years past carried on … and that you might seek grace and repentance, and find mercy and forgiveness before God Omnipotent” (98). Second, he proposes that once slavery is abolished in the British empire, the British navy should intervene to stop the international slave trade (100). Third, he suggests that the people of Britain should provide “kind instruction” and says that he looks forward to Britain “establishing religion, justice, and equity to the Africans” (101). This is a common theme in earlier antislavery works, but it is hard to believe Cugoano is entirely sincere. He may well believe that the people of Guinea would benefit from knowledge of true religion. However, he certainly does not think that Britain—which, he has argued, is in danger of damnation for its support of Atlantic slavery—is in any position to serve as an example of justice and equity.

Finally, Cugoano writes that “Those who break the laws of civilization, in any flagrant manner, are the only species of men that others have a right to enslave” (58). This group of people includes “the insidious merchants and pirates that gladen their oars with the carnage and captivity of men,” people who have “oppos[ed] all the obligations of civilization among men, and [broken] through all the laws of justice and equity” (46). This is a striking and radical claim, particularly given how widely Cugoano assigns responsibility for the evil of slavery. However, he downplays the suggestion almost as soon as he makes it, remarking, without explanation, that such punishment “cannot now extend to the West-India slavery” (54).

Why did Cugoano back away from his suggestion that enslavers should be enslaved? Presumably he recognized that punishing the planters was not a real political option at the time. He probably also worried about distracting the reader from his main focus, namely making the case that individual Britons are morally responsible for Atlantic slavery. But he also appears to have a more principled reason. He is worried that when punishing those responsible for Atlantic slavery, it would be far too easy to go “beyond the bounds of a just retaliation” and begin “falling into the same crimes of the oppressors” (60). Thus, he argues that the demands of justice must be balanced with the demands of mercy:

The just law of God requires an equal retaliation and restoration for every injury that men do to others … but the law of forbearance righteousness and forgiveness, forbids the retaliation to be sought after, when it would be doing as great an injury to them, without any reparation or benefit to ourselves (52).

The priority of the law of forbearance or mercy is supposed to follow from the role of reparations in punishment. If an ordinary case of theft is punished by measures including the confiscation of the stolen goods, punishment both responds to the thief’s deserts and makes reparations possible. In the case of an eye for an eye, however, the punishment does nothing to enable reparations, no matter how well it is deserved. Similarly, “When a man is carried captive and enslaved … it would make no adequate reparation and restitution for the injuries he had received, if he was even to get the person who had ensnared him … treated in the same manner” (52). Nothing done to Cugoano’s kidnappers could return to him the years of his life that had been stolen.[17]

5. “Every free community might keep slaves”

Readers often see Cugoano’s talk of enslaving the enslavers as a reductio of rights forfeiture arguments. On such readings, Cugoano is saying that even if some form of rights forfeiture could in principle justify enslavement, only “the vile negociators and enslavers of the human species” (46) could justifiably be enslaved. This is a natural reading, but we should not be too quick to embrace it. It relies on the assumption that no committed abolitionist, or at least no committed abolitionist who had been enslaved himself, could find any form of slavery justifiable. But a number of 18th century abolitionists in fact supported penal slavery, including Cugoano’s fellow Son of Africa, Olaudah Equiano (1789 [2018, 22]).[18] Thus we should ask, does Cugoano think that penal slavery is justified? Or is he merely saying that even if penal slavery is justified, this would not justify Atlantic slavery?

We could also ask a broader question. Penal slavery, Mosaic bondage, and Guinean slavery are all forms of forced labor. Does Cugoano hold that some or all of these forms of forced labor are justified? Or is he merely saying that even if all these forms of forced labor are justified, Atlantic slavery would not be justified? Most readers have seen Cugoano as arguing for the second, weaker claim. Recently, Johan Olsthoorn has argued for the stronger claim, that Cugoano accepts both Mosaic bondage and penal slavery (albeit for different reasons in the two cases). He also holds that we should take the seven years requirement seriously because it relies on the same principles that Mosaic bondage relies on. This offers a picture of Cugoano that 21st century readers may find less attractive. That, of course, does not constitute evidence of its falsity.

6. Moral responsibility

One of Cugoano’s most striking claims is that responsibility for the evil of slavery extends to virtually all Britons. By the time he published Thoughts and Sentiments, many Britons had come to find the institution of slavery in general, and the West Indian planters in particular, distasteful. He aims to convince such readers that their high-minded disapproval is not sufficient and that they must act.

6.1 How widely does responsibility for slavery extend?

Cugoano’s primary goal in Thoughts and Sentiments is to demonstrate that responsibility for the evil of slavery extends far beyond the West Indies. It extends to everyone in Britain who is not doing their best to bring about an end to Atlantic slavery.

The ground of such responsibility is not economic benefit: we’ll see in a moment that Cugoano thinks only the wealthy of Britain benefit from Atlantic slavery, while everyone else is harmed. Rather, he argues that all Britons are responsible for the evil of slavery because they have “admitted, tolerated and supported it” (62). They have “given it a sanction by [their] passive obedience” (95). In other words, all Britons are responsible for the evil of Atlantic slavery because their failure to act is a necessary condition of its continued existence. The general principle seems to be that we are responsible not only for what we do, but also for what we allow to happen: “Every man … becomes not only guilty in doing evil himself, but in letting others rob and oppress their fellow-creatures with impunity, or in not delivering the oppressed when he has it in his power to help them” (87). Thus, Cugoano aims to convince his readers that it is their “incumbent duty” as “men of enlightened understanding” (103) to do whatever they can to stop Atlantic slavery.

This general principle is very strong, and 21st century readers have attempted to identify the underlying justification. Adam Dahl (2020b) sees it in the context of a broader reply to Lockean political theory, in which Cugoano requires bystander intervention where Locke merely permits it. This reading fits well with Cugoano’s use of the parable of the thief. But ultimately, Cugoano’s point is that the people of Britan are not innocent bystanders in relationship to Atlantic slavery. They are both causally and morally responsible for it.

The causal responsibility claim may seem implausible, since it is not immediately obvious that any one ordinary person’s inaction was even a sine qua non cause of Atlantic slavery. Perhaps to deal with this sort of worry, Cugoano suggests that inaction in the face of evil makes you responsible for that evil even if you could not actually have stopped it. He explains that “kings and governors … have power to prevent their subjects and people from enslaving and oppressing others, if they will; but if they do not endeavour to do it, even if they could not effect that good purpose, they must then be responsible for their crimes” (81). The general principle seems to be that you are responsible for evils you witness and do not attempt to prevent, even if you have good reason to believe that such attempts are in vain. This principle has obvious pragmatic justification, since it’s very easy for people to convince themselves that their attempts will be in vain. It also has a theoretical justification. Cugoano cares a great deal about what our actions express as well as what they actually accomplish, and it is only by trying to abolish Atlantic slavery, even unsuccessfully, that individual Britons could express the appropriate condemnation of it.

6.2 “The advocates and favorers of slavery … deceive themselves and mislead others”

Cugoano says that it is “evident” (10) that the slave trade is wrong. He says that it “must appear evident” that trafficking in human beings is “a crime of the greatest magnitude” (61). He says that “all men of enlightened understanding” can see that Atlantic slavery must be abolished. He says that the institution of slavery “may easily appear … to be wholly and totally inimical to every idea of justice, equity, reason and humanity” (10). He says that “every man of any sensibility” must see that Atlantic slavery is wrong (25). He says that the wrongness of Atlantic slavery “is obvious from the Scriptures of Divine Truth, or such arguments as are chiefly deduced from thence” (10–11). He says that “the light of nature, and the dictates of reason … teach that no man ought to enslave another” (28). And so on.

In claiming that the wrongness of Atlantic slavery is evident, Cugoano is not making a descriptive claim. He is, of course, aware that the vast majority of Britons failed to recognize the evil of slavery. But he holds that all Britons should have recognized the wrongness of Atlantic slavery, because they had all the epistemic resources necessary. They had the benefit of reason, Scripture, and their moral sentiments. Thus, we should understand Cugoano’s claim that the wrongness of slavery is “evident” as a normative claim. He is, in effect, saying that every Briton should already have realized that Atlantic slavery is wrong.

This claim has both a rhetorical dimension and a philosophical one. Rhetorically, Cugoano is trying to take the moral status of slavery out of the sphere of reasonable disagreement. Philosophically, the evident wrongness of Atlantic slavery plays an important role in Cugoano’s case for moral responsibility. Britons can only be held responsible for the evil of slavery because they should have known that it was wrong, even though they in fact failed to recognize its evident wrongness.

How does such widespread failure of moral knowledge occur? If the people of Britain had the benefit of reason, Scripture, and moral sentiments—three distinct sources that each, on Cugoano’s view, make the evil of Atlantic slavery abundantly clear—how could they have failed to recognize that evil? Cugoano’s answer is that the people of Britain have either deceived themselves or allowed themselves to be deceived by others. When the “supporters and favourers of slavery,” who were motivated by “the idol of cursed avarice,” initially advanced proslavery arguments, they did so as “a pretence and an excuse” (28). But as time went on, the planters and other profiteers came to believe their own pretences. For “when ambitious and wicked men are bent upon avarice … their hearts become hardened in wickedness; so that even their enormous crimes sink in their own estimation, and soften into trivial matters” (71). Thus, the planters and profiteers fell into a state of “infatuation” (54). They began to “deceive themselves and mislead others” (28). And as a result, the ordinary people of Britain “have been … shamefully beguiled and betrayed by the vile instigations of wicked, profligate, inhuman men” (83).

Cugoano is striking a delicate balance here. He does not want to say that Britons were fully aware of the evil of slavery and just couldn’t be bothered to do anything about it. Starting out with the claim that your readers are a bunch of moral monsters is unlikely to help you convince them of anything. At the same time, his case that all Britons are morally responsible for the evil of slavery requires that Britons were in a position to know the evil of slavery all along—even though they did not actually know this because they failed to believe it. For you can only be morally responsible for a wrong if you knew or should have known it to be wrong. Thus, Cugoano aims to make his readers see that they have been deceived by the wealthy and, at the same time, to recognize their own culpability.

How exactly you understand the mechanism of deceit here will depend on your interpretation of Cugoano’s moral philosophy—our next topic. If, for instance, you think of Cugoano as primarily a kind of natural lawyer, then there must be some cognitive mechanism. If you follow (Hasan-Birdwell 2024b), who sees Cugoano’s moral philosophy in sentimentalist terms, you might instead think that it is a matter of the corruption of the moral sense.

7. Cugoano’s moral philosophy

Cugoano does not portray himself as a moral philosopher, or indeed as a philosopher at all. Neither do any of the other abolitionists then writing in Britain. This is surprising. The fundamental issues underlying the abolition debate—personhood, liberty, moral responsibility, and more—are central topics of philosophical discussion. Recent historians of philosophy have emphasized that early modern philosophy had extremely broad scope, including all of what we would now call the theoretical sciences. Looking at the abolition debate shows that in another respect, the scope of early modern philosophy was quite narrow. For authors and readers did not see philosophically grounded interventions in current affairs as philosophy.

Scholars have read Cugoano’s moral philosophy in very different ways. Some see him as a natural lawyer or a natural rights theorist. Others see him as articulating a sort of theocentric ethics—a voluntarist moral theory. Still others read Cugoano as a sentimentalist. Finally, some scholars see his moral philosophy through the lens of Africana political thought.

7.1 Natural law and natural rights

Very many readings of Cugoano see him as a natural rights theorist, perhaps in combination with other ingredients.[19] Natural rights readings fit well with Cugoano’s language. He speaks of “the common rights of nature” (9), the “natural rights and common liberties of men” (38, 61), the “natural rights of mankind” (71), the “natural right to liberty” (97), and so on. In using such language, Cugoano is self-consciously locating himself within a tradition that many of his readers would have been familiar with and, at least in broad outline, sympathetic to.

Like many early modern moral philosophers, Cugoano gestures at integrating natural rights into a theocentric framework. He derives the right to liberty from the fact that human beings are divinely created: “God made of one blood all the nations and children of men, and … gave to all equally a natural right to liberty” (128). He emphasizes that the people of Britain should try to abolish Atlantic slavery because so doing is the only way for them to avoid divine punishment. This could be construed as evidence that Cugonao thinks that only divine reward and punishment can provide reasons for doing what morality requires. More likely, it is evidence that he thinks that his readers are less motivated by the intrinsic force of morality than they should be.

Cugoano has also been read as part of the natural law tradition. Such readings are often combined with natural rights readings, since natural law and natural rights are often mixed together in the period. Such readings seem reasonable, but it is worth noting that Cugoano never actually uses the phrase “natural law”. He uses the phrase “law of nature” only once—“God and his … laws of nature and nations” (89)—and although he refers to divine law repeatedly, we should not simply assume that he has in mind natural law rather than divine positive law.

7.2 Theocentric ethics

Johan Olsthoorn argues that “Cugoano’s theory of law and punishment … rests squarely upon a divine law theory of ethics” (Olsthoorn 2025, 9). This reading involves three claims. First, Cugoano is a voluntarist, in that he holds that divine lawgiving has created morality (Olsthoorn 2025, 8). Second, Cugoano holds that moral truths such as “the injustice of slavery can be known … through natural reason alone” (Olsthoorn 2025, 11). Third, the law is “a revealed one, laid down in the Bible” (Olsthoorn 2025, 9).[20] There is an apparent tension between the claim that the moral law is known by revelation and the claim that the injustice of slavery is known through natural reason—but a merely apparent one.

We see the combination of voluntarism with natural law in earlier philosophers. Locke, for instance, holds that we know the natural law exists because we know that God exists and wants the best for humanity, and infer that God has decreed the set of laws most conducive to the good of humanity. We can then use our knowledge of human nature to figure out the content of the law, so that both the existence of the law and the content of the law can be known through natural reason.

If Olsthoorn is right that for Cugoano the divine law is revealed law, then Cugoano cannot hold that we know the existence of the law through reason—but he might still hold that we know the content of the law through reason. We might use reason to figure out which set of rules is most conducive to the good of humanity, even though we require revelation to know that these are not mere rules of prudence but genuine moral laws.

We saw in section 2.3 that Cugoano seems to think the people of Guinea have moral knowledge without knowledge of God. His evidence is that the people of Guinea obey basic moral principles. We may now want to add some nuance. Perhaps what the people of Guinea know is simply a set of prudential rules, without knowing that violating these rules is genuinely immoral or, in Cugoano’s terms, “criminal”.

7.3 The moral sentiments

A third interpretation of Cugoano’s moral philosophy sees it as a version of moral sense theory. Philosophers have invoked the moral sentiments in moral psychology, moral epistemology, meta-ethics, the theory of moral language, and more. Eighteenth-century theorists like Hume, Hutcheson, Shaftesbury, and Smith used the moral sentiments in explain why we praise or blame certain actions and how moral knowledge is possible. These moral psychology and moral epistemology forms of sentimentalism are the context in which we should understand Cugoano’s talk of sentiment.

As the title suggests, Thoughts and Sentiments makes extensive appeal to sentiment. Most scholars have assumed that such appeal is purely rhetorical: that Cugoano is appealing to the sentiments of the reader in order to motivate action, but that sentiment is doing no real philosophical work. In contrast, Jeffrey Hole (2017) reads Cugoano as integrating moral sense theory with natural rights, and Aminah Hasan-Birdwell (2024b) develops a detailed reading of Cugoano’s moral psychology and moral epistemology in sentimentalist terms.

Hasan-Birdwell reads Thoughts and Sentiments as posing a central moral question: how can people commit evil but think it is just? She argues that Cugoano explains this phenomenon in terms of the moral sense and its corruption. Anyone with an uncorrupted moral sense would see immediately that Atlantic slavery is wrong. Our “natural feelings” (93) make this clear. However, those who stand to gain from Atlantic slavery have willfully corrupted their own imaginations and those of their fellow Britons, in order to pursue their own self-interest without experiencing any inconvenient emotions. By doing so, they “resign their … claim to any degree of sensibility” (10). Their natural feelings cease to be effective, and they are no longer able to see the obvious wrongness of Atlantic slavery.

The sentimentalist interpretation sees the moral sentiments as a source of moral knowledge, independent from reason and revelation. It also sees the moral sentiments as a source of moral motivation, independent of the fear of divine judgment. Because the moral sentiments of Cugoano’s readers have been corrupted, they lack both moral knowledge and moral motivation. Cugoano aims to repair the imaginations of his readers. But at the same time, he provides alternate sources of moral knowledge and motivation that can be used by the insensible, including the testimony of Scripture and the fear of damnation.

7.4 Africana political thought

A final view of Cugoano’s underlying moral philosophy has been suggested by Adam Dahl and Chike Jeffers, who see Cugoano’s system as a “creolization” (Dahl 2020a, 908) or “hybrid” (Jeffers 2017, 138) of Africana and European thought. For Dahl, who develops the point at greater length, the key element is Cugoano’s conception of natural liberty, which he sees as based on both European Enlightenment concepts and a romanticized Africana conception of natural liberty.

Such readings face one major difficulty. As noted earlier, our knowledge of Cugoano’s intellectual formation is extremely limited. Still, it does not seem possible for him to have had much knowledge of Guinean political thought. He was kidnapped at 13, and we know no sources he could have encountered as an adult.

Presumably, Dahl’s remark about a “romanticized” conception of African political thought is intended to address this difficulty. In the background here is an ongoing debate about how to locate non-canonical figures such as Cugoano. To Dahl, the creolization reading is helpful because it lets us avoid saying that “while black abolitionists may have applied European political ideas such as natural rights to keen political effect … they did not make theoretical innovations recognizable as original political theory” (2020a, 908). To other scholars, the creolization reading may seem unhelpful, even misleading, because it takes Cugoano out of the context of 18th century European philosophy and thereby reinscribes the false whiteness of Enlightenment thought.

In this context, there is no need to choose between reading Cugoano as merely applying existing European ideas like natural rights and reading Cugoano as also applying African ideas. We can instead simply read him as an innovative thinker in his own right—someone inserting his own original philosophical ideas into the conversation just as predecessors like Locke and Rousseau did. This helps us to see that the history of early modern European philosophy includes philosophers who originated from across the entire empire, not just the metropole.

8. Conclusion

There is significant debate over the nature of Cugoano’s moral philosophy. Four different lines of interpretation were outlined above. It’s worth noting that they are not all answering precisely the same questions. The Africana political thought interpretation asks how we think about the sources of Cugoano’s moral philosophy and how we should conceive of his project. The natural law/natural rights interpretation and the theocentric ethics interpretation concern Cugoano’s meta-ethics and moral epistemology while putting moral psychology aside. The moral sense reading, as Hasan-Birdwell develops it, is meta-ethically neutral, instead addressing questions in moral psychology and moral epistemology.

One topic is central to the natural law/natural rights interpretation, the theocentric ethics interpretation, and the moral sense interpretation: how does Cugoano think we know moral truths? The three interpretations offer three different answers: through reason, through revelation, or through the moral sentiments respectively. Each of these readings has significant textual evidence. Cugoano claims that the wrongness of Atlantic slavery is “obvious from the Scriptures” (28), “known by the light of nature, and the dictates of reason” (28), and clear to “every man of any sensibility” (25). Thus, it is possible to see Cugoano as adopting a pluralist moral epistemology in which reason, Scripture, and the moral sense are three separate avenues to knowledge of the evil of Atlantic slavery. This fits well with the programmatic intentions of Thoughts and Sentiments. Cugoano’s over-arching goal is to convince his readers that Atlantic slavery is wrong, that they are responsible for it, and that they must act now to attempt to end it. If he can do this in a way that is consistent with any of the moral epistemologies common at the time, so much the better.

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Acknowledgments

I would like to thank Aaron Garrett, Aminah Hasan-Birdwell, Julia Jorati, Johan Olsthoorn, and two anonymous referees for the SEP for invaluable comments on a previous draft of this article.

Copyright © 2026 by
Antonia LoLordo <lolordo@virginia.edu>

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