1. Two editions of this, Cugoano 1787 and Cugoano 1791, were published. The significance of their differences is discussed in section 1.3 below. Both editions can be found in Cugoano [TAS]: the first edition is pp. 1–112 and the second is pp. 113–150.

2. The term ‘Atlantic slavery’ is used throughout, to contrast the 18^th century form of racialized chattel slavery with other forms. Cugoano calls it “the West-India slavery” (35), but although he focuses on the West Indies because he is writing for a British audience, he recognizes that essentially the same form of slavery was present in the new United States and the Spanish colonies (10).

3. One exception is the anonymous 1760 Two Dialogues on the Man-Trade (Anon. 1760).

4. This echoes Locke’s description of the criminal who has “declared war against all mankind, and therefore may be destroyed as a lion or a tyger, one of those wild savage beasts” (Locke 1689, §2.11). It also echoes earlier anticolonial strategies: Las Casas, for instance, describes the Spanish in the West Indies as resembling “savage Tigers, Wolves, and Lions” (Casas 1699, 3).

5. See e.g. Cicero, De officiis (DO 3.107); Jean Bodin, Six Books (Bodin 1606, 1–2); and Alberico Gentili, De jure belli 1.4 (Gentili 1588–1589 [1933, 35]).

6. See Martinez (2012, 114).

7. Note, however, that Cugoano is following Clarkson very closely here Smith (2010, 63). This should make us cautious of taking the claim as evidence of Cugoano’s deep commitments.

8. See Olsthoorn (2024) for more on what this involves.

9. See Shanafelt (2021), Shanafelt (2024), and (Garrett, n.d. – see Other Internet Resources) for more on the role of debt in Cugoano’s anti-slavery arguments.

10. Schipper (2024) argues Cugoano invokes the mark of Cain for something positive as well, namely, to explain white propensity to violence.

11. See Glover (2017) for more.

12. See Hasan-Birdwell (2024a) for more on the contrast between Clarkson and Cugoano.

13. See Grotius 1625 [2005], §2.5.32 for a well-known discussion of penal slavery.

14. See Locke 1689, §2.12–13.

15. See Olsthoorn (2024, 14–15). This claim is disputed: see e.g. Bogues (2003, 38); Gunn (2010, 648); Dahl (2021, 288); Hasan-Birdwell (2024a, 476–477); and Sandiford (1988, 101).

16. See Best & Hartman (2005) for the significance of this phrasing.

17. See Olsthoorn (2025) for a slightly different explanation, on which the “reparation or benefit to ourselves” (52) that the law of mercy requires should be understood more broadly, so that it may include deterrence or moral education as well as reparations.

18. Granville Sharp concurs (Sharp 1776b, 177). See Glover (2017, 525–526) for discussion.

19. See e.g. Bogues (2003); Dahl (2020a), who reads Cugoano as mixing natural rights with Africana political thought; Hasan-Birdwell (2024a); Hole (2017), who sees Cugoano as mixing natural rights with sentimentalism; and Jeffers (2017).

20. Revealed law is typically contrasted with natural law, but Olsthoorn does not discuss Cugoano’s theory in terms of natural law at all—perhaps because, as we saw in section 7.2, Cugoano himself does not speak of natural law. I’ve portrayed Olsthoorn’s interpretation as an alternative to the natural law interpretation, but perhaps it could be better understood as a way of making the natural law interpretation more precise.