Technical Supplement

• 1. Elementary Theorems of Probability Theory
• 2. The Raven Paradox
• 3. Foundationalism
• 4. Epistemic Logic
• 5. The Meaning of ‘If …then …’

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1. Elementary Theorems of Probability Theory

Theorem. (No Chance for Contradictions). When \(A\) is a contradiction, \(p(A) = 0\).

Proof: Let \(A\) be any contradiction, and let \(B\) be some tautology. Then \(A \vee B\) is also a tautology, and by axiom (2) of probability theory: \[ p(A \vee B) = 1\] Since \(A\) and \(B\) are logically incompatible, axiom (3) also tells us that: \[ p(A \vee B) = p(A) + p(B)\] Combining these two equations: \[ p(A) + p(B) = 1\] But axiom (2) also tells us that \(p(B)=1\). So: \[ p(A) + 1 = 1\] So \(p(A)=0\). \(\qed\)

Theorem (Complementarity for Contradictories). For any \(A\), \(p(A) = 1 - p(\neg A)\).

Proof: \(A \vee \neg A\) is always a tautology, so axiom (2) tells us: \[ p(A \vee \neg A) = 1\]

Since \(A\) and \(\neg A\) are logically incompatible, axiom (3) tells us: \[ p(A \vee \neg A) = p(A) + p(\neg A)\]

These two equations together yield: \[ p(A) + p(\neg A) = 1\]

Thus \(p(A) = 1-p(\neg A)\). \(\qed\)

Theorem (Equality for Equivalents). When \(A\) and \(B\) are logically equivalent, \(p(A) = p(B)\).

Proof: Suppose \(A\) and \(B\) are logically equivalent. Then \(\neg A\) and \(B\) are incompatible. So axiom (3) tells us: \[ p(\neg A \vee B) = p(\neg A) + p(B)\]

By the previous theorem this becomes: \[ p(\neg A \vee B) = 1 - p(A) + p(B)\]

But \(p(\neg A \vee B)=1\), since \(\neg A \vee B\) is a tautology. Thus: \[ 1 = 1 - p(A) + p(B)\]

Which, with a little algebra, yields \(p(A)=p(B)\). \(\qed\)

Theorem (Conditional Certainty for Logical Consequences). When \(A\) logically entails \(B\), \(p(B\mid A)=1\).

Proof: Suppose \(A\) logically entails \(B\). By the definition of conditional probability: \[ p(B\mid A) = \frac{p(B \wedge A)}{p(A)}\]

So we just need to show that \(p(B \wedge A)=p(A)\).

For any \(A\) and \(B\), \(A\) is logically equivalent to \((A \wedge B) \vee (A \wedge \neg B)\). By the previous theorem and axiom (3) then: \[\begin{align} p(A) &= p((A \wedge B) \vee (A \wedge \neg B))\\ &= p(A \wedge B) + p(A \wedge \neg B)\end{align}\]

Because \(A\) logically entails \(B\), \(A \wedge \neg B\) is a contradiction, and thus: \[ p(A \wedge \neg B) = 0\]

Combining the previous two equations yields \(p(A) = p(A \wedge B)\). \(\qed\)

Theorem (Conjunction Costs Probability). For any \(A\) and \(B\), \(p(A) > p(A \wedge B)\), unless \(p(A \wedge \neg B)=0\), in which case \(p(A) = p(A \wedge B)\).

Proof: As we saw in the previous proof, for any \(A\) and \(B\): \[ p(A) = p(A \wedge B) + p(A \wedge \neg B)\]

Thus when \(p(A \wedge \neg B)>0\), \(p(A)>p(A \wedge B)\). If instead \(p(A \wedge \neg B)=0\), then \(p(A)=p(A \wedge B)\). \(\qed\)

Theorem (The Conjunction Rule). For any \(A\) and \(B\) where \(p(B) \neq 0\), \(p(A \wedge B) = p(A\mid B)p(B)\).

Proof: \[\begin{align} p(A \wedge B) &= \frac{p(A \wedge B)p(B)}{p(B)}\\ &= p(A\mid B)p(B). \end{align}\] \(\qed\)

Theorem (The Law of Total Probability). For any \(A\), and any \(B\) whose probability is neither 0 nor 1 : \[ p(A) = p(A\mid B)p(B) + p(A\mid \neg B)p(\neg B).\]

Proof: As in the proof of Conjunction Costs Probability: \[ p(A) = p(A \wedge B) + p(A \wedge \neg B)\]

Applying the Conjunction Rule to each summand yields:

\[ p(A) = p(A\mid B)p(B) + p(A\mid \neg B)p(\neg B)\]

\(\qed\)

Theorem (Bayes’ Theorem). For any propositions \(H\) and \(E\) with non-zero probability, \[ p(H\mid E) = p(H)\frac{p(E\mid H)}{p(E)}.\]

Proof: By the definition of conditional probability: \[ p(H\mid E) = \frac{p(H \wedge E)}{p(E)}\]

Given the equivalence of \(H \wedge E\) and \(E \wedge H\): \[ p(H\mid E) = \frac{p(E \wedge H)}{p(E)}\]

Multiplying the right-hand side by 1 in the form of \(p(H)/p(H)\): \[ p(H\mid E) = p(H)\frac{p(E \wedge H)}{p(E)p(H)}\]

Applying the definition of conditional probability again, this time for \(p(E\mid H)\):

\[ p(H\mid E) = p(H)\frac{p(E\mid H)}{p(E)}\]

\(\qed\)

2. The Raven Paradox

Theorem (The Raven Theorem). If (i) \(p(\neg R \mid \neg B)\) is very high and (ii) \(p(\neg B\mid H)=p(\neg B)\), then \(p(H\mid \neg R \wedge \neg B)\) is just slightly larger than \(p(H)\).

Proof: Recall, Bayes’ theorem tells us that \(p(H\mid \neg R \wedge \neg B)\) can be obtained from \(p(H)\) by multiplying \(p(H)\) by the factor: \[ \frac{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)\mid H)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)}\]

So we need to show that this factor is only slightly larger than 1.

We begin by applying the Conjunction Rule in the numerator: \[ \frac{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B\mid H)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)} = \frac{p(\neg R \mid \neg B \wedge H)p(\neg B \mid H)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)}\]

Next, notice that \(H \wedge \neg B\) logically entails \(\neg R\): if all ravens are black, this non-black thing must not be a raven. So, by Conditional Certainty for Logical Consequences, the left term in the numerator is just 1, and hence can be removed: \[ \frac{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)\mid H)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)} = \frac{p(\neg B \mid H)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)}\]

Then we apply assumption (ii) of the theorem in the numerator: \[ \frac{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)\mid H)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)} = \frac{p(\neg B)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)}\]

By the definition of conditional probability (applied upside down) then: \[ \frac{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)\mid H)}{p(\neg R \wedge \neg B)} = \frac{1}{p(\neg R \mid \neg B)}\]

And by assumption (i) of our theorem, the denominator here is very close to 1. So the whole ratio is just slightly larger than 1, as desired. \(\qed\)

3. Foundationalism

In the main text we relied on an assumption of the form \(p(B\mid A) \leq p(\neg (A \wedge \neg B))\). Since \(\neg (A \wedge \neg B)\) is logically equivalent to \(A \supset B\), the following theorem will suffice:

Theorem (The Horseshoe Upper Bound Theorem). For any \(A\) and \(B\) such that \(p(A)>0\), \(p(B\mid A) \leq p(A \supset B)\).

Proof: Begin by noting that \(A \supset B\) is logically equivalent to \(\neg A \vee (B \wedge A)\), so: \[\begin{align} p(A \supset B) &= p(\neg A \vee (B \wedge A))\\ &= p(\neg A) + p(B \wedge A)\end{align}\]

Then, because \(p(B \wedge A) = p(B\mid A)p(A)\): \[ p(A \supset B) = p(\neg A) + p(B\mid A)p(A)\]

Then, because multiplying by \(p(B\mid A)\) is multiplying a number that’s 1 or smaller:

\begin{align} p(A \supset B) &\geq p(B\mid A)p(\neg A) + p(B\mid A)p(A)\\ &= p(B\mid A)[p(\neg A) + p(A)]\\ &= p(B\mid A) \end{align}

\(\qed\)

4. Epistemic Logic

Theorem (\(\bwedge\)-distribution). \(K(\phi \wedge \psi) \supset (K \phi \wedge K \psi).\)

Proof: For clarity, we omit some of the more verbose steps in the derivations of lines 4, 5 and 6.

\begin{array}{rll} 1.& (\phi \wedge \psi) \supset \phi& \mathbf{P}\\ 2.& (\phi \wedge \psi) \supset \psi& \mathbf{P}\\ 3.& K[(\phi \wedge \psi) \supset \phi]& 1, \mathbf{NEC}\\ 4.& K[(\phi \wedge \psi) \supset \psi]& 2, \mathbf{NEC}\\ 5.& K(\phi \wedge \psi) \supset K\phi& 3, \mathbf{K}\\ 6.& K(\phi \wedge \psi) \supset K\psi& 4, \mathbf{K}\\ 7.& K(\phi \wedge \psi) \supset (K\phi \wedge K\psi)& 5,6, \mathbf{P}\\ \end{array}

\(\qed\)

Lemma (Unknowns are Unknowable). \(\neg \Diamond K(\phi \wedge \neg K \phi).\)

Proof: Again, we omit some of the more verbose steps:

\begin{array}{rll} 1.& K(\phi \wedge \neg K\phi) \supset (K\phi \wedge K\neg K\phi)& \bwedge\textbf{-distribution}\\ 2.& K\neg K\phi \supset \neg K \phi& \mathbf{T}\\ 3.& K(\phi \wedge \neg K\phi) \supset (K\phi \wedge \neg K\phi)& 1, 2, \mathbf{P}, \mathbf{MP}\\ 4.& \neg (K\phi \wedge \neg K\phi)& \mathbf{P}\\ 5.& \neg K(\phi \wedge \neg K\phi)& 3, 4, \mathbf{P}, \mathbf{MP}\\ 6.& \Box \neg K(\phi \wedge \neg K\phi)& 5, \mathbf{NEC}\\ 7.& \neg \neg \Box \neg K(\phi \wedge \neg K\phi)& 6, \mathbf{P}\\ 8.& \neg \Diamond K(\phi \wedge \neg K\phi)& 7, \textrm{Defn. of }\Diamond\\ \end{array}

\(\qed\)

5. The Meaning of ‘If …then …’

Theorem (Lewis’ Triviality Theorem). If Stalnaker’s Hypothesis is true, then \(p(B\mid A)=p(B)\) for all propositions \(A\) and \(B\) such that \(p(A) \neq 0\) and \(1 \gt p(B) \gt 0\).

Proof: We start by applying the Law of Total Probability to the conditional \(A \rightarrow B\): \[ p(A \rightarrow B) = p(A \rightarrow B\mid B)p(B) + p(A \rightarrow B\mid \neg B)p(\neg B)\]

Next let’s introduce \(p_B\) as a name for the probability function we get from \(p\) by conditionalizing on \(B\), i.e., \(p_B(A)=p(A\mid B)\) for every proposition \(A\). Likewise, \(p_{\neg B}\) is obtained by conditionalizing \(p\) on \(\neg B\). Then: \[ p(A \rightarrow B) = p_B(A \rightarrow B)p(B) + p_{\neg B}(A \rightarrow B)p(\neg B)\]

Now, assuming Stalnaker’s Hypothesis: \[ p(A \rightarrow B) = p_B(B\mid A)p(B) + p_{\neg B}(B\mid A)p(\neg B)\]

But \(p_B\) automatically assigns probability 1 to \(B\), while \(p_{\neg B}\) assigns 0. So:

\begin{align} p(A \rightarrow B) &= 1 \times p(B) + 0 \times p(\neg B)\\ &= p(B) \end{align}

And since \(p(A \rightarrow B)=p(B\mid A)\) by Stalnaker’s Hypothesis, \(p(B\mid A)=p(B)\) too. \(\qed\)

Theorem (Gärdenfors’ Triviality Theorem). As long as there are two propositions \(A\) and \(B\) such that \(K\) is agnostic about \(A\), \(A \supset B\), and \(A \supset \neg B\), the Ramsey Test cannot hold.

Proof: The gist of the argument is that adding \(\neg A\) to \(K\) would, via the Ramsey Test, bring contradictory conditionals with it: \(A \rightarrow B\) and \(\neg (A \rightarrow B)\). But this would mean that \(K\) wasn’t really agnostic about \(A\); its contents would already contradict \(\neg A\), so \(K\) would have to already contain \(A\), contra the stipulation that \(K\) is agnostic about \(A\).

Why would adding \(\neg A\) to \(K\) also add these contradictory conditionals, given the Ramsey Test? Let’s proceed in three steps:

First, notice that adding \(A \supset B\) to \(K\) would bring \(A \rightarrow B\) with it via the Ramsey test, since further adding \(A\) would also add \(B\) via modus ponens. By parallel reasoning, adding \(A \supset \neg B\) to \(K\) would bring \(\neg (A \rightarrow B)\) with it via the Ramsey Test.

Second, notice that \(\neg A\) logically entails \(A \supset B\) (but not vice versa). Similarly, \(\neg A\) entails \(A \supset \neg B\) (but not vice versa). \(\neg A\) is logically stronger than both these \(\supset\)-statements.

Third and finally, because \(\neg A\) is logically stronger, adding \(\neg A\) to \(K\) brings with it everything that adding either \(\supset\)-statement would. The logically stronger the added information, the more logically follows from it. But as we saw, adding \(A \supset B\) to \(K\) adds \(A \rightarrow B\), and adding \(A \supset \neg B\) adds \(\neg (A \rightarrow B)\). So adding the stronger statement \(\neg A\) adds both these contradictory sentences to \(K\). \(\qed\)